Zhuangzi

First published Wed Dec 17, 2014; substantive revision Sun Mar 24, 2024

Zhuangzi (Chuang-tzu 莊子 “Master Zhuang” late 4th century BC) is the pivotal figure in Classical Philosophical Daoism. The Zhuangzi is a compilation of his and others’ writings at the pinnacle of the philosophically subtle Classical period in China (5th–3rd century BC). The period was marked by humanist and naturalist reflections on normativity shaped by the metaphor of a dào (道)—a social or a natural path. Traditional orthodoxy understood Zhuangzi as an anti-rational, credulous follower of a mystical Laozi. That traditional view dominated mainstream readings of the text. Recent archaeological discoveries have largely laid that ancient orthodoxy to rest.

Six centuries later, elements of Zhuangzi’s naturalism, along with themes found in the text attributed to Laozi helped shape Chan Buddhism (Japanese Zen)—a distinctively Chinese, naturalist blend of Daoism and Buddhism with its emphasis on focused engagement in our everyday ways of life.

This wide range of views of Zhuangzi stem from the style of the text. Zhuangzi’s prose style is its own distinctive literary treasure. The central feature is the parable, typified as a discussion between imaginary or real interlocutors. Typically short, pithy, and amusing, his tales are both accessible and philosophically seductive—they both entertain and make you think. A respite from the dry moralizing of Confucians, the text was always a favorite of the Chinese intellectual, literati class. The Zhuangzi also attracts modern Western readers with its thoroughgoing naturalism, philosophical subtlety, and sophisticated humor, all set in a strikingly different conceptual scheme and its distant, exotic context.

Philosophically, Zhuangzi strikes us as more the Hume of his tradition than a system builder like Plato, Aristotle, or Kant. He drew skeptical and relativist implications from his naturalist approach to normative guidance. His treatment of natural dàos focused on the norms governing correct use of language. His ethical relativism grew out of his indexical understanding of the norms of word use.

This indexical linguistic approach focused on the key evaluative terms used in choosing among natural paths of behavior (dàos), 是非 shì-fēi this-not that. These normative terms also guide language use, the choices of words, and the objects words pick out as topics. Zhuangzi’s foils were credulous and dogmatic Confucian humanists, particularly the innate intuitionist absolutism of a type familiar from the Mencius. He also took his linguistic insights to undermine Mozi’s pragmatic utilitarian alternative to Confucianism. He engaged seriously with later Mohist, realist, linguistic theories, both acknowledging their challenge to primitive quietism (the anti-language view familiar in The Laozi) and yet remaining skeptical of the realist conclusion. His most frequent co-discussant in the text was Hui Shi, a rival linguistic relativist.

The following topics highlight some central interpretive controversies. The bulk of the article proposes a philosophical interpretation that both fits the Zhuangzi into the classical philosophical dialogue and explains his modern relevance.

1. Zhuangzi’s Life and Times

Zhuangzi flourished through the latter half of the fourth century BC, roughly contemporary with Mencius and with the “linguistic turn” in the classical period that included the later Mohists and the figures historians later labeled as the School of Names (名家 ming-jia). Zhuangzi demonstrates mastery of this Classical Chinese terminology of pragmatics and semantics and makes his own theoretical contributions to ancient Chinese theory of language. The traditionally recognized figures in this school included Gongsun Longzi along with Hui Shi—Zhuangzi’s close friend, perhaps mentor, his interlocutor, and occasionally his foil. Zhuangzi is followed in this mature phase of Classical linguistic thought by some chapters in the later Confucian text, The Xunzi. Though The Xunzi elsewhere targets Zhuangzi for criticism, his sections incorporating and developing this linguistic turn embellish the linguistic theory shared between the later Mohists and Zhuangzi.

Most of what we infer about Zhuangzi’s life, we draw from evidence within the Zhuangzi, although the Han biographers did speculate about his place of origin (the state of Meng), his personal name (Zhou), and the official posts he held (minor posts in Qiyuan, his home state) and period he lived (during the reign of Prince Wei over Chu—which ended about 327 BC). Scholars have found it hard to confirm any details of his life from outside this text and from his being discussed by later thinkers. The text itself contains scattered stories about Zhuangzi, but given its frequent use of fantasy, even these we must season with the salt of textual skepticism. We attribute a large chunk of the extant text of the Zhuangzi to “students of Zhuangzi” but we have little hint of who his students were or if he even had students in any formal sense.

2. Evolving Text Theory

Guo Xiang (d. 312 CE), a scholar working around 600 years later after the fall of the Han, edited and reduced what he saw as a haphazardly accumulated cluster of apocryphal and possibly authentic texts. He concluded that many were added after the time Zhuangzi lived. Guo reports compressing that prior collection of writings from fifty-two chapters to thirty-three. This is the extant text on which our knowledge is based. Guo divided the chapters he had chosen into three sections: the “Inner Chapters” (1–7), the “Outer Chapters” (8–22) and the “Miscellaneous Chapters” (23–33). He attributed only the first section to the period dating from Zhuangzi’s lifetime—hence possibly originating from Zhuangzi’s teachings. The second grouping may have included writings of a “School of Zhuangzi”. Modern scholarship assigns various sources of other influences found in both the second “outer” and final “miscellaneous” chapters. A.C. Graham, drawing on work of the Chinese theorist, Kuan Feng (Graham 1979), and followed with some variation by Liu Xiaogan (Liu 1994) and Harold Roth (Roth 1991, 2003), divides these influences into roughly four variously named groups:

  • Zhuangzi’s students or the School of Zhuangzi credited with those later writings committed most closely to the views expressed in the “inner chapters”.
  • Authors with egoist views associated with Yang Zhu (4th century BC). The Mencius presented Yang’s thought as a version of an ethical egoism that rejected conventional altruistic social dàos.
  • The third group Graham dubbed the “primitivists”. Primitivists share Yang Zhu’s antipathy to social, historical or conventional dàos—typically those supporting social norms extending beyond agricultural village life—in favor of more natural ways. This group shares attitudes with the text of the Laozi (Dàodé Jing) mixed with Yangist themes.
  • The final group, dominated the “miscellaneous” sections, Graham called them syncretists (eclectics) who seemingly attempted comprehensiveness by combining all points of view into a single complete dào.

However widely assumed, Zhuangzi’s direct responsibility for any of the “inner” chapters remains a hypothesis, subject to skeptical doubts (Klein 2010). Guo’s original assessment that Zhuangzi did not author any of the remaining sections remains conventional scholarly wisdom. When we attribute something to Zhuangzi, we are attributing it to the text and, where relevant, to the “Inner Chapters”, particularly Ch. 2.

Combining the different elements into a single volume reflects a familiar Classical pattern of embellishing the teachings of a zi (master), adapting the additions to the namesake’s writing style and expanding on his themes and insights in distinctive ways. The four schools contributing to the extant text shared an emphasis on natural—as opposed to social-cultural—dàos. Yangism or egoism rejected social or moral dàos on the apparent assumption that natural guiding dàos recommend self-preserving behavior. Its paradigm is the anti-social hermit. Yangists treat motivation by self-interest as normatively prior to conventional dàos. They preserved their natural purity from social corruption by rejecting society’s conventional mores.

Primitivism similarly rejected social and conventional dàos (mores), but has its own conception of natural, pre-social, typically intuitive, ways of life that supports rustic, agricultural, small village existence. It inspires populist and anarchist political tendencies. Syncretism does not reject social dàos per se but does reject any particular dào as biased and narrow in contrast to a more, “rounded”, idealized, or comprehensive dào. This is often expressed in an ideal observer form (the sage, perfect human, or nature:sky (天 tian) dào). These views tend toward epistemic supernaturalism—claims to cognitive access to some transcendently correct dào not available to ordinary people. Both syncretism and primitivism also tend to deny that their transcendent dàos can be explained in language form.

The discussions in the “Inner Chapters”, particularly in the second chapter, by contrast, treat both language and social-conventional dàos as natural dàos of natural creatures. This undermines Primitivist and Yangist contrast of natural vs. conventional, nurtured dàos. Humans are naturally social animals and enact natural causal processes when they walk or talk—or write and exchange money for vegetables. Human social practices leave marks in nature, (like a trail or a text) which become physically accessible to later walkers as history (stored in memory, legend, writings, or footprints etc.). These tracks or traces guide others by supplying them with opportunities to use their know-how.

The pivotal second chapter draws relativist and skeptical conclusions from its normative naturalism. It rejects the traditionalism of Confucianism and the implicit Gaia-hypothesis in Mozi’s attempt to recruit tiān (天 sky:nature) as an authority recommending utilitarian social daos. Nature provides us with many ways to behave, but does not judge or care which choices we make among those naturally possible. Shì-fēi (是非 this (way)/not-that) judgments are made by living creatures in nature, not by tiān itself. We can find guiding structures, dàos, in nature but not a favored or dictated dào of nature.

Like the “Miscellaneous Chapters”, the “Inner Chapters” Zhuangists accept that social dàos are continuous with natural ones, but they do not endorse any imagined or alleged, comprehensive judgments from the cosmos, from all-natural points of view. The cosmic judgment from nowhere is a non-judgment. Zhuangists are not committed to Laozi’s exclusive distinction of natural (tiān) vs. social (人 ren “human”) dàos. They are skeptical of claims to have special access to context-free, guiding know-how by alleged or self-styled “sages”, “ideal observers”, or perfect exemplars of epistemic virtues. Ziporyn (2012) interpretively treats allusions to transcendently perfect guidance or know-how as “ironic”. Moeller (2022), Moeller and D’Ambrosio (2017), D’Ambrosio (2020a) see poking fun at such pretense as the point of Zhuangzi’s formulating these passages. Zhuangists both accept language and accept our natural capacity and inclination to toy with it, alter it, and mould it to our use in various situations of practical choice.

Zhuangzi’s exemplars are butchers, musicians, cicada catchers, wheelmakers—exemplars of mundane and focused behavior guidance. Each is an exemplar of one of the many ways of life (dàos). They execute their particular specialties in a highly cultivated, precise, and smooth manner with ease and a sense of flow. The imagined eclectic synthesis of all the numerous ways of life into some total-comprehensive dào is no more than de facto restatement of their co-existence in a single natural world as optional ways of life. The cosmos makes no judgment that they should exist—though it combines them into a cosmic dào that is the history of everything. That the cosmos has this outcome does not mean it makes a human-like choice which humans could or should execute. We are ill advised to strive for such skill at everything.

The eclectics were the last community working with the text, adding to it and carrying it into later periods. The Laozi had become enmeshed with a ruler cult worship of The Yellow Emperor. Laozi became the far more influential figure during the Confucian orthodoxy of the Han (206–220 BC).

3. Competing Interpretive Narratives

The wide range of views of Zhuangzi stem from the style of the text and the ways it has figured in China’s intellectual history as well as the ways it was caught up in the interaction between China and the modern, scientific West.

Zhuangzi’s style is the philosophical parable, typically a brief discussion or exchange between two points of view. There is slight plurality of humans among the discussants joined by natural and imaginary creatures. Its fictional characters are usually cleverly named; some are Confucian icons (Confucius or his alleged teacher, Lao Dan). Some discussants are animals (real and fictional fish, birds, snakes), a talking skull, the wind, musicians, debaters, tigers, trainers, butchers, butterflies, burglars, and the myriad other “pipes of nature”. Expressive brevity and subtlety of detail enhance the impact of the often complex and elusive point of the parables—they seldom explicitly formulate the moral or point explicitly. Most commonly, the author(s) end discussions in a doubting tone, a double rhetorical question, or some pithy enigmatic parting shot. They may make their point by having the two parties walking away shaking their heads, agreeing only to disagree; both appreciating that they barely understand one another, and yet feeling that something has been learned from the exchange.

Translation into Western languages invites biases that are hard to avoid. The main effect is loss of the conceptual cohesion of the original, but the parables still engage our Western philosophical curiosity. We get the exhilaration of immersion in an independent philosophical tradition of comparable antiquity and richness. Readers in and out of China invariably suspect that the Zhuangzi’s appealing style is infused with philosophical genius, even as they disagree about its philosophical upshot. Indeed, much of the Zhuangzi’s philosophical appeal may stem from its deliberate open-ended texture, the interpretive malleability of its dialogues which invites, even perhaps requires, us to join the author(s) in their philosophical reflection.

This appeal stems only partly from the quality and sophistication of his episodes, each illuminating a patch of philosophical territory ending with a question for further pondering—like Nietzsche or the Later Wittgenstein. Each exchange presents or illustrates shards of insight with open-textured conclusions—all laced with Zhuangzi’s obvious joy in exploring deep divergence in point of view—particularly on linguistic matters. Each is a natural, but difficult to access, alternative way of life. The frequent enigmatic conclusions “the answer is X” leaves interpreters arguing centuries later, Fermat-like, how X can be an answer—or what X is (e.g., “free and easy wandering”, “walking two paths”, “goblet words”, “clarity”, and so forth). Each seems to fit easily into a range of puzzles familiar to thinkers in both Chinese and Western traditions. One suspects that we find the correct interpretation by finding our way, like Wittgenstein’s fly, out of some philosophical bottle. Solving the philosophical conundrum gives one the correct interpretation of Zhuangzi.

The religious view of Zhuangzi starts a century after Zhuangzi lived (4th century BC). (See Religious Daoism.) Philosophical schools were closed, books burned and thought repressed during the superstitious Qin dynasty (221–206 BC) which followed the classical period. This initiated China’s philosophical “Dark Age”. The more orthodox Confucian Han Dynasty (206 BC to 220) followed. Over two decades (109–91 BC) the Han emperor’s hereditary Grand Historians, Sima Tan and Sima Qian (a father and son team), wrote an official history from the mythical Yellow Emperor (c. 3rd Millennium BC) to the Han. The Simas’ intellectual history fabricated four “schools” (家 jiā families) to cluster groups of Classical thinkers who focused on certain concepts. The concepts were dào (paths), fǎ (法 performance:standards [a.k.a. “Legalist”]), míng (名 names) and Yin-Yang. Counting the various schools of Confucianism and Mohism as two, this classification reduced the “hundred schools” of the period to six.

As the name suggests, the “schools” (家 jiā family, home) began as something more like “in-house” zi (master)-apprentice arrangements where the jiào (教 teachings) were crafts, skills, and arts. Learning was mastering a method to be exercised well in a context. A central skill for Confucius, the first zi (master), was reading, writing, and speaking effectively in social-political roles. Confucius’s students launched the practice of teaching and learning from the “master’s book”. Mohist schools followed, with students constructing several versions of Master-Mo’s teachings and the practice of reading, copying, editing, and even updating a master’s text became the mechanism for the Classical evolution of thought—the spread and competition of teachings (jiào).

Drawing on this insight, Graham (1989) demurred from the traditional Laozi-as-master, Zhuangzi-as-student reading. Writing that “[Zhuangzi] never knew he was a [Daoist]”, Graham averred that “Inner Chapters” Zhuangzi had neither met Laozi nor knew of the Daode Jing text. He speculated that the traditional affiliation stems from the “Outer Chapters”. There, Zhuangzi’s students created clever dialogues between a mythical Lao Dan (a.k.a. Laozi), teacher of Confucius. As teacher, he who could “speak down” to Confucius. The overlap of tropes and thematics suggests some communication between those students of Zhuangzi and the anonymous compilers of the still evolving Classic of Dào and Dé (德 “virtuosity”).

A cult of Huang-Lao, worshipping the Yellow Emperor and Laozi as joint divinities of the ruling fǎjiā (“Legalist”) cult, had grown up to dominate the Qin empire. The father and son Han historians were also students of Huang-Lao masters. At the fall of the Han the narrative of Zhuangzi as a follower/elaborator of a semi-divine Laozi was well entrenched, but the Zhuangzi was neglected by those enamored by the superstitions of Imperial Confucianism. The Huainanzi (Liu An 179–122 BC) was the chief evidence of continuing interest in Zhuangzi’s philosophy.

The post-Han resurgence, known as Neo-Daoism, began with the editing of the received edition of, first, the Laozi (Wang Bi 226–249) tying his text closely to the popular divination text with Confucian commentaries, the Yi Jing or Book of Changes. A generation later, a scholar of the same school of “Dark Learning”, Guo Xiang (d. 312 CE) produced the received version (see above) of the Zhuangzi (described above)—perhaps with heavy borrowing from one of the “Seven Sages of the Bamboo Grove”, Xiang Xiu (3rd C.).

Although the Xiang-Guo Zhuangzi recognized that Zhuangzi’s relativist realism differed from Laozi’s anti-language naturalism, the disagreement was taken to be confined to degrees of emphasis within Daoism—now conceived as a single school of thought. The metaphysical formulations made the difference seem like a chicken vs. egg issue, “which came first, being or non-being?”

Neo-Daoist discussion practices around this metaphysical issue were influential in bringing Buddhist and Chinese thought into interaction with the Chinese conceptual scheme, and Daoism became enmeshed with Buddhism in the popular view (especially Chinese Chan—Japanese Zen—Buddhism). The being-non-being format easily coalesced with Buddhist worries about the reality of Nirvana vs. Samsara, self vs. Buddha-nature. A Daoist institutional “religion”, borrowing models of monasteries, monks, and nuns from Buddhism, influenced the discourse about Daoism throughout the period of Buddhist domination of the Chinese intellectual world (achieved gradually during the Six Dynasties period 220–589 and extending through the Tang 618–907). Neo-Confucians from the medieval period on treated Buddhism and Daoism as essentially similar religions.

4. Modern Philosophical Interpretations

Modern philosophical theory concerning the Zhuangzi grows from two recent discoveries.

  1. The reconstruction of the Later Mohist dialectical works and
  2. Archaeological reconstructions of the text of the Daode Jing.

The following section discusses their twin impact on our view of Zhuangzi.

Developments at the end of the nineteenth and early twentieth century in China led Chinese intellectuals to adopt the European concept of philosophy (哲學) with its implicit distinction from religion. This distinction was seen as pivoting on logic—the theory of proof or argument. They started to segregate their own writings which seemed most like argument, inference, and logic, from those sustained solely by credulity and tradition. They began to sort out the philosophical aspects of their traditional thought from its more religious and superstitious elements. Sun Yirang’s (1848–1908) 1897 reconstruction of the Mohist Canon (Sun 1965) provided convincing evidence that rigorously analytic discourse about linguistics had emerged from the context of normative social-political theory disputes in Classical China. This example encouraged nineteenth century intellectuals like Yan Fu (1854–1921) and Liang Qichao (1873–1929) to see Classical thought as philosophical. They started to emphasize the ancient schools which, along with the Mohist analytic linguists, otherwise recognized the norms of Western philosophy. Many others, notably Hu Shih (1891–1962) and Jin Yuelin (1895–1984) continued this tradition of reconceiving and re-centering Chinese thought away from the Confucian scholasticism that had dominated since the Han.

This early twentieth century logic-inspired reformation eventually influenced the interpretation of especially the Zhuangzi and the Xunzi. In the west, this was largely inspired by Angus Graham who had observed that both ancient texts demonstrated a mastery of the technical vocabulary of Mohist linguistic theory.

Western philosophical appreciation of the Zhuangzi stems from Graham’s 1969 “[Zhuangzi]’s Essay on Seeing Things as Equal” (Graham 1969, predating his work on Mohism). Wryly replying to speculation that Shen Dao, not Zhuangzi, had authored the beloved chapter, Graham allowed that whoever wrote that philosophically rich text is the person we should think of as Zhuangzi. Graham proposed looking at the text’s seemingly conflicting thoughts as analogous to the “inner dialogue” of a reflective thinker who formulates a view, considers it, then rejects it. After his monumental work reconstructing and interpreting the Later Mohists, Graham began to emphasize how much the Zhuangzi and the Xunzi demonstrated engagement with Mohist theory of language. He stressed their apparent mastery of the technical language of Mohist theory and of the advanced issues they were debating.

Graham’s textual arguments were indirectly supported by archaeological discoveries of different Laozi texts. The discoveries in the early 1970s and 1990s together implied a later date for the emergence of the Laozi text. The exact timeline remains unclear, but gives us no reason to doubt Graham’s suggestion that Zhuangzi did not know of the text.

When we abandon the traditional identification of Zhuangzi as disciple of Laozi, it opens the door for speculation about his relation to the relativist, linguistic theorist, Hui Shi, traditionally treated as belonging to the School of Names. Christoph Harbesmeier speculated he may have been either Zhuangzi’s teacher, mentor, or fellow student. If he was a teacher, he came to accept his student as an equal or even as superior in the art of linguistic normativity. The Zhuangzi portrays him as playing a role in the development of Zhuangzi’s philosophical skill. He is repeatedly portrayed as an intimate interlocutor and eventually as a foil for sharpening Zhuangzi’s philosophical analysis. Among those texts that concentrate on míng (名 names), Hui Shi’s ten theses mark his as a relativist response to Mohist realism about the relation of names and “stuff”—focusing particularly on comparative physical terms like “large” and “tall”.

We can read Zhuangzi’s relativism accordingly, as an alternative, more reflectively subtle, indexical relativism (what a term refers to depends on the indexed location of the speaker in space and time) about right and wrong (shì-fēi 是非 this-not that) judgments regarding choices and walkings (xíng 行 walking:behavior) of paths (dàos). Language was a dào of using names (words) as shared guideposts. This can explain both Zhuangzi’s more sophisticated relativism in theory of language and his recognition of valid Mohist (realist) refutations of Hui Shi’s version of name (míng 名 names) relativism. Between the traditional “Daoist” and the analytic philosophical interpretation lies a provocative range of recent interpretive views. There are even views that emphasize “religiosity” around the philosophical interpretive elements: naturalism, oneness, and liberation (Shang 2006). Comparative treatments of this range are themes in several of the articles in the “Further Readings” section of the bibliography below. This article develops and expands on Graham’s philosophical interpretation and emphasizes the relation to Hui Shi and the Later Mohists rather than to the Laozi.

4.1 The Background Dispute about Social Normative Daos

Confucian dàos were broadly humanist. The earliest version (Confucius 551–479 BC) traced normativity to earlier human invention. Metaphorical trails (dàos) are enshrined in social practices emerging from past human xíng (行 walking: behaviors). Language was an example of such an emergent social practice which intertwined with conventional practices (rituals) to yield the “sage-king” inspired way of life—人 rén (human) 道 dào (path). Named status-roles and ritualized learned practices for the role players was the fabric of his dào. A later version (Mencius 372–239 BC) focused on natural human psychology as réndào. The correct path is that to which our natural moral psychology inclines us. Humans have a xīn (心 heart-mind) that is naturally shan (善 good-at) choosing and interpreting dàos.

Mencius was reacting to Mohism. Mozi (470–391 BC) initiated a shift in focus to more natural and objective, less culturally relative Ways of grounding normative language, statuses, and social practices—utility. He argued that tiān (nature:sky) “favored” courses that lead to general human well-being. So humans should use that natural norm, the biàn (辯 distinction) between lì-hài (利害 benefit-harm), in constructing our social dào, including the norms of language.

Mozi’s version of “rectifying names” (correctly using terms) is using them to mark the optimific structure of cooperative social practices—a utilitarian social dào (path) (Fraser 2016; Hansen 1989). He grounded normative authority in tiān rather than the sage kings by attributing a will to nature. Nature intends us to follow its structures in ways that lead to universal human well-being (lì 利 benefit). Ethical questions thus have a single correct answer in an ideally engineered and shared normative linguistic practice. Mozi’s utilitarian metaethics began the turn to natural realism, but it remained human-centered and instrumentalist in his early formulations. The Mohist Canons, however, backed away from instrumentalism on the familiar realist grounds that the most efficient and effective way to use words is to mark real distinctions between thing-kinds that are accessible to ordinary folk’s “eyes and ears”.

Daoist primitivism (represented by the mythical Laozi and the anonymous text known as the Dàodé Jing) was, as noted above, a further trend toward a broader ethical naturalism, but with anti-language, absolutist implications. We should forget or ignore all social norms and practices, including linguistic ones. Utility (perhaps egoistic utility) does motivate our behavior as naturally as water follows the paths created by natural contours of earth. Language should not interfere in any way with this natural guiding interaction between us and the open course(es) of nature.

4.2 The Conceptual Foci of Chinese Daoist Normative Theorizing

Understanding the Zhuangzi is made more difficult by the huge differences not only in the philosophical context, but also in the pervasive metaphors that structure and focus discussions of norms of behavior in the Chinese vs Indo-European classical traditions. His positions invite comparisons with modern metaethical naturalism but he does not focus those positions using concepts linked to grammatical sentences such as “laws” or “rules” (sentences in all form) or “facts” (sentence-sized chunks of reality) or “properties” (realities corresponding to sentence predicates).

Zhuangzi used Confucius’s and Mozi’s metaphor, dào. Choosing and interpreting a social dào shaped Chinese discussions of pragmatic knowing, of knowing how andknowing to, the components of knowing dào and having virtuosity (德 dé)s. Dàos can be social or natural structures that facilitate and guide us in a sequence of actions that constitute the behavior—(xíng 行 walking). We learn and practice the behaviors and the achievement is know-how (zhīdào 知道 knowing), aware and practice-adapted behavior. Knowing-to is timing and context sensitivity to execute the learned behavior. (Mencius, by contrast, opined that context sensitive knowing-to is innate). We find minimal normative linguistic focus on an internal (de dicto) belief state connected to sentences (knowing-that). Learning is physiological.

Dàos answer practical questions: what to do or how to do it. As the core of warring Chinese conceptions of guidance, dào guidance has phases. The metaphorical structure of the character 德 (dé virtuosity) reflects this 3-way relation: the left part the path we walk (notice virtuosity and walk share the left-side semantic marker), the right part consists of the graph for an eye (目mú) and the heart (心 xīn). We first find or notice paths, then choose this path over that (是非 shì-fēi this-not that, right-wrong) and then translate or interpret the selected dào to guide our behavior (xíng 行 walking: behavior, conduct).

Confucian dàos, rituals (lǐ 禮 propriety, custom, manners, courtesy), were tied to named social roles. Learning and practice usually involved the authority of a teacher who had earlier acquired virtuosity (dé 德 excellence, virtue) at that role. This chain of authority stretched back to the sage kings, but could be acquired via a short-cut, an intuitive dé called humanity (rén 仁 charity, humans acting in pairs, reciprocal-altruism). Presumably, that intuition explains how the sage-king originators of the named behavior acquired it and began the chain of transmission.

Confucius rarely emphasized the choice phase of the path metaphor complex (Fingarette 1972). The rival Mohists add the pragmatic terms 是非 (shì-fēi this-not that) and 辯 (biàn distinction). These are pivotal for Zhuangzi and presumably deliberately avoided by the anonymous authors of the Laozi. To use a word, we acquire a capacity, come to know-how to biàn (distinguish):

  • that word from other words, and
  • some part of the world (shì this:right) from the other parts that are fēi (not-that: wrong).

A way of using the word may be permissible (kě 可 permissible, possible) or not.

This cluster of concepts related to the path metaphor was used to shape questions the West would phrase in terms of moral propositions, laws, or principles. Knowing how to use a word in guidance is what constitutes understanding language. Ziporyn (2013) draws further attention to Zhuangzi’s occasional use of another path-like concept, lane (lǐ 理 principle, tendency). Translators most typically render it “principle”. Zhuangzi and his contemporary Mencius treat lǐ (lane) as a kind of internal path that, Ziporyn argues, coheres with outer dàos of possibility. This vaguely physical coherence evokes the constructive interference of waves. It is less a formula than a “know it when you hear it” realization that your performance resonates. Some things (and people) are suited to following certain dàos by their internal resonant structure, their lǐ. Combined with learning and practice, lǐ can overlap with dé, the degree of virtuosity we can acquire at performing (xíng walking) the behaviors to fit the situation.

Both Mohists and Confucians tended to focus more on social dàos and on a narrow concern with human life expressed in their treating benevolence (rén 仁 concern for other-humans) as the single important lane leading to virtuosity (dé virtue, excellence). Mohists advocated guiding reform of conventional social dàos using a natural normative distinction (辯 biàn) of benefit-harm (利害 lì-hài). For Mohists, benefit-harm was a natural (天 tiān) way of finding, choosing, reforming and interpreting social dàos. In contrast to Confucians, Mohists sought to elaborate their natural ways of selecting dào-like social practices as operational, objective, measurement-like standards (fǎ 法 law, principle) accessible to ordinary humans’ “eyes and ears” and minimally subject to prior training and indoctrination.

Chinese linguistic analysis fits naturally into similar language—it concerns ways of using words. The more philosophically inclined schools began to see those norms of word-use as underlying the disagreements among schools about which social dàos to follow and how to follow them. The Mohists couched their discussion of norms of use in choice formulations such as “choose” (取 qǔ), “pick out” (舉 jǔ), “assertible:admissible” (可 kě) , “distinction” (辯 biàn), “point” (指 zhǐ), and “combine” (合hé). The core psychological attitude is wéi (為 deem:do) which may be expressed as a tendency (in speech, both inner and expressed) to express a right-wrong (shì-fēi 是非 this-not that) judgment about how to use a word. To call (wèi 謂 call it) is both phonetically and semantically related. Behaviorally, both describe dealing with something as socially labeled with the name. Conversely, we can shì or fēi the use of a name of some contextual object—wèi (call) or wéi (deem) it properly associated with that name (míng 名 term, word).

To deem-as (wéi 為 act-on) can be either to express the category assignment in one’s behavior—either speech-behavior or behaving toward the object as people would be expected to, given that they assigned the object to that category. The behavior for the category would be found in the social or natural dào (path) they follow. A deeming-as (wéi 為 act-on) state is less a mental picture of a fact (a belief) than a disposition to treat or identify some object as deserving the name. Instead of the western reality vs. appearance dialectic, Chinese discussion revolves around the contrast of natural (tiān nature:sky) dàos and human (rén) or socially constructed, dàos. The human dàos are constructed with the help of names (míng) strung together into language (言 yán).

Mozi, as we noted above, appealed to what he regarded as a natural utility standard to judge the acceptability of language (yán) use and Confucius relied more on past usage ranging back to the mythical sage kings. Mozi had noted the obvious arbitrariness of justifying word usage relying on self-referential indexicals (e.g., this is the way we speak) (Analects 13:19) in justifying his standard of language reform. This led Mencius to appeal to a cultivated, innate seed of universal human moral intuition (rén 仁). Since cultivation typically included learning and practicing conformity to existing social practice, the Zhuangzi (2:4) rejected Mencius’ way out of the problem. The xīn (心 heart (guiding organ)), he argued, matures with the body and typically acquires its inclinations to shì-fēi (this-not that) along the way. Each way of shaping the psychological and physical dispositions to behavior, each actual personal history, is as natural as the others. Nature (tiān) per se is not a normative authority. Norms are dàos that are in nature, but we do not follow “The Dào” of nature. When we make a normative shì-fēi (this-not that) judgment, we depend on one of many local parts of natural dào structure of possible options for our behavior.

In effect, life emerges in nature along with its dào. Normativity, guided choice, emerges naturally among some living things and their daos emerge within life’s dào. Morality emerges among some normative dàos—among some living creatures. By contrast, the craft–inspired Mohists tried to get direct answers from tiān (sky-nature) using operational measurement tools which “let nature decide” the judgment. This natural realism is the most formidable alternative to Zhuangzi’s contextually relativist way of understanding norms of word use.

Normative shì-fēi (是非 this-not that) judgments can concern choice of a dào or the interpretive performances of a given dào. Alternately, both normative issues may be kě (可 assertible:permissible) or not. The dàos, possible guides to behavior, may be natural or social—including, pivotally, dàos of language use. First order disagreement could be addressed by appealing to second-order dàos of choosing or interpreting, e.g., Mozi’s utilitarianism.

4.3 Zhuangzi’s Distinctive Approach

Zhuangzi conforms to the general pre-Han model, using a path metaphor to discuss normativity in general. This fuels the traditional view of him as a Daoist, but he differs from Laozi in blurring the bright line of distinction the Laoists drew between natural and social dàos (Zhuangzi 6:1). Zhuangzi portrays natural and social dàos as deeply entangled processes which emerge from the processes of life (tiānxià the world of living things). Human social dàos are one among the many natural behaviors of natural animals. Human language emerges from processes in nature along with birds tweeting and frogs croaking.

Zhuangzi’s departure from Confucian, Mohist, and primitivist perspectives grounds a more complex view of the structure of natural dàos which shapes his rejection of the Mencian “heart as ruler” model of path choice/interpretation decisions. Humans interact in real contexts to construct ways of behavior. We dispute about many details by issuing judgments (shìfēi this/not-that) that “endure like agreements or covenants”. This web of past commitments builds up as we pass through life hemming us in as we age and our capacity to learn afresh declines. We see things through a web of past commitments (Zhuangzi 2:2).

What looked like a natural teleology to Mozi was the emergence of many natural kinds which find their different ways in the web of natural dào without a natural guiding authority. A species design emerges as natural capacities (dé virtuosity) for exploiting their possibilities. Humans are among these kinds and with our debates and emergent structure of judgments (shìfēi) we coordinate to exploit our possibilities with a language.

Since languages, like species, emerge from a natural process of adapting to possibilities, how can we say some are and some not authentic?

How can dàos be hidden such that some are authentic (zhēn 真 real, true) and others artificial (wěi 偽 deceptive, false)? (Zhuangzi 2:4–5)

Mencius and Mozi give rival higher level accounts of why their proposed social dàos are authentic. Mencius’ response to Mozi’s natural teleology was also speciesist. Tiān supplies humans with a guiding organ, the heart (xīn 心 heart-mind, mind) as a naturally authorized ruler. Zhuangzi replies nature supplies us with:

A hundred joints, nine openings, six viscera all present and complete in me. Is one more related to me than another? Aren’t we pleased with them all? Do we have a selfish part in them? Is it to have the rest as ministers and concubines? Are its ministers and concubines incapable of cooperative rule? They take turns as each other’s ruler and minister. Is there an authentic (zhēn 真) ruler? (Zhuangzi 2:3)

When we walk the paths in real time, we realize (rán 然 thus, real, true) some of the possibilities (kě 可 possible, permissible) the path affords. “Dàos are realized by walking them”. (Zhuangzi 2:6) Human social dàos become map-like aids in finding and choosing behaviors. Our knowledge of dàos is indexical. We learned how, acquired our virtuosity (dé), through practice and know-to realize this behavior here now. We have constructed human ways of following nature’s paths of opportunity. We construct them by our past praxis, but we can also learn from other natural animals. They similarly construct natural dàos which become available for human finding, choosing, and walking.

Zhuangzi uses the notion of dependence (yīn 因 dependent, relative) to discuss this complexity in the structure of natural guidance. When we choose a course of conduct, we implicitly rely on some map as our guide to, our dào of choosing among, available paths. We know how to flip a coin; we consult a desire; we construct a spreadsheet of pros and cons; or we simply continue with some past praxis. Any time we choose a way to go in life, the choosing itself exercises a learned behavior—perhaps by our ancestors or teachers.

Our choices sit atop a complex structure of prior choices by ourselves and others. This illuminates Zhuangzi’s quip that humans interact in dàos as fish interact in water (Zhuangzi 6:6). We are surrounded and dependent on a complex natural and human structure of possibilities (kě 可). Zhuangzi hints that the implicit regress of ways of choosing ways might terminate at some point—or not. We are unlikely, given our limited life spans, to reach such a terminus (Zhuangzi 3:1 & 11:3).

Zhuangzi’s discussion, particularly in the philosophically most sophisticated second chapter, is mainly about the plurality and relativity of this vast web of iterative mesh of dàos, natural and social of dàos and dàos of those dàos, and so on. His skepticism, thus, about anyone’s knowing the moral (yì 義 appropriate, right) choice is not nihilism (that there is no best or right choice). It is natural fallibility since we can only pursue the issue so far given our limited lifetimes.

Zhuangzi’s argument against Mencius’ intuition did not imply that intuition is not a way of choosing. It is a second-level choice so we implicitly depend on a third level way of choosing second ways of choosing when we act on intuition. Zhuangzi follows Song Xing and Laozi in the Zhuangzi’s history of thought (Zhuangzi 33:3 and Confucius Analects 2:4). All note that our heart’s intuitions reflect our past training and practice commitments. This is enough for Zhuangzi not to rely on them when considering Mozi’s proposed moral reform. Mozi argued nature wants us to consider utility as a way of choosing moral convention reform. We don’t get a this/not-that judgment without implicitly depending on some prior judgment behavior.

Having a shì-fei in the heart without it having already been constructed there is like going to Yue today and arriving yesterday. (Zhuangzi 2:4)

Zhuangzi naturalizes dàos less by attending to natural physical guiding structures (e.g., Laozi’s dàos of water) than to the diverse ways of animal life. Each is natural yet different from how humans find and follow dàos. All depend on their different natural organs which coordinate in following a path. Eyes take in its shape; hearts react with motivating moods and attitudes and legs and feet carry us forward. Like other animals, we similarly coordinate with others, but our social dàos mature differently and commit to different trajectories. All of our different societies coordinate in pursuing human dào. This complexity of natural ways of interaction fuels, in turn, both Zhuangzi’s skepticism of absolutes, of authority, of ideal observers, and of social dogmas. His mildly qualified advice is to let each thing work out for itself, 自然 (zìrán self-real-ize), how to find, choose and exploit opportunities in their particular environments as they interact.

The other distinctive feature of Zhuangzi’s approach lies in his extension of this complex relativist orientation to discussing dàos of language. These are social dàos that are akin to a map’s legend. They add further complexity and dependence. Again, this is not to reject them, as much as to remind us of the plethora of possibilities. Graham interpreted a famous Zhuangzi trope (the pipes of tiān [天 nature:sky]) as Zhuangzi’s way of positioning language as tiān (natural) sound. And like social dàos, all of them are natural.

The pipes of earth, these are the hollows everywhere; the pipes of men, these are rows of tubes. Tell me about the pipes of Heaven. Who is it that blows the ten thousand differences, makes them their own, all of them self-chosen? What stirs these processes? (Zhuangzi 2:1)

Graham elaborates:

These are apparently the holes in the heart through which thought courses and the mouths which utter it, so that the breath blown by heaven through the inner formations of different men issues in contradictory utterances. (Graham 1969:149; Ziporyn 2009 surveys five other interpretations)

Zhuangzi thus removes tiān from the role of ultimate normative authority—the role it plays in both Mozi’s and Mencius’s side in the dispute. Tiān cannot settle their dispute since it “blows equally out of both”. All social dàos that are actually available as choices are equally tiān (natural). Tiān (nature) generates dàos as it generates the wù (物 thing-kinds (humans and other animals)) that find and follow them. The cosmos is the playground on which things interact, not the authority that tells them how to act. We self-realize (zìrán) one in the network of naturally possible dàos. Dàos are chosen from the menu found in nature, but none is nature’s choice for us—none of the dàos in nature is the dào of nature.

Dialectically, Zhuangzi’s replacement for tiān’s role as source of normative guidance would be one of many second-level dàos of choice and skilled performance actually possible for us here, now. He situates us at indexed points in this cosmic network of paths forward from here and now to there in the future.

The philosophical advantage of Zhuangzi’s way of discussing dàos, thus, does not leave him suggesting that what is natural is moral (analogous to implying “ought” from “is”). Nature gives us a complex three-dimensional network with levels of guiding structures in which we humans are left to navigate (Zhuangzi 6:6).

Greater knowing is calm and comprehensive; smaller knowing is cramped and contentious. Greater language ignites insight; smaller language dims and diminishes. We sleep and interact with ghosts; Waking we start up our bodies. In interacting, we construct; our guiding-organs contend. We start simply then complexities arise and get more entangled. Our lesser anxieties motivate us, the greater anxieties paralyze us. Like a mechanical bow, we spit out directions, “This! Not that! (shì-fēi)” The ones that dominate lie embedded like sworn oaths as we continue on to our deaths which approach like fall and winter. Gradually we disappear, sink below the surface. We cannot recover the dynamism with which we began to construct the cords which, in our feeble old-age, bring our guiding-organ near death with no way back to its original creativity. (Zhuangzi 2:2)

This metaphorically florid description of the existential worry about the point of our existence reflects the “we” orientation of Classical Chinese conceptions of normativity. The issue of knowing-how and guiding with language replaces the belief-knowledge, appearance-reality dynamics in the West. We participate in a social unit as it constructs its dàos. We contend with each other using our own heart-mind—the organ along with the eye that interacts with natural paths. As our commitments to past agreed norms or directions accumulate, the social guidance in language becomes complex and constricting. The resulting inflexibility in our individual and social old age is symbolic of our intellectual death, our loss of the ability to find and follow new ways.

Zhuangzi’s narrative turns to the individual processes of choosing a direction.

Attitudinal states—happiness, anger, sorrow, delight; concern, admiration, perplexity, resolve; attraction, absorption, excitement, familiarity—arise in turn, like music from hollows, mushrooms from the damp; they confront us day and night, Yet, there is no knowing how to interpret them. Still, never mind. They’re there constantly; they come from somewhere. (Zhuangzi 2:2)

We don’t know what role these states play but they seem central to our choosing activity—indeed, in a twist on Buddhism and Hume, without their role in our choosing, we would not have an indexed perspective, an ‘I’. (The narrator had introduced the above “pipes of heaven” metaphor to describe a gestalt he describes as having “said farewell to my wǒ (I:me)”.) All guidance is from a point, an index in the cosmic network of paths for things. The paths are available to different parts of the cosmos, emergent objects—physical or living, plants or animals, birds, humans, snakes. Like other animals, our paths are entangled with each others’. Individuals are parts of the cosmos, and of their families, clubs, linguistic communities, political units, etc. which are also parts of the cosmos with dàos in the cosmos. Each part has its inner processes of seeking, deciding on, and carrying out some of the dàos that lead from node to node. As each part performs one of its dàos, the structure of dàos changes. Things emerge and disappear.

We can walk the paths we’ve been guided to but still see no sign of their endorsement by authority. We light on paths and react with heart-mind responses. That’s it. Are all lives as pointless as this? Or only mine? (Zhuangzi 2:3)

Appeal to the guiding organ’s (心 xīn heart-mind) inclinations faces the same problem as appeal to nature. All hearts are natural—the sage’s as well as the fool’s. Our bodies and our guiding organs both change as we pursue a trajectory through our lives (Zhuangzi 2:3). The shape that is constructed (成 chéng) by life is implicated in all the decisions we go on to make. Any output from our constructed guiding organ will be a product of our having walked one of a range of possible dàos to this point.

When we view Zhuangzi’s skeptical relativism in the context of his path, learning, and know-how conceptual space, we can see it as metaphorically more like Einstein’s physical relativism than cultural relativism about truth. We choose and enact dàos from a moving frame of reference constructed or matured (成 chéng) from past commitments. Our heart-minds reach a point with a frame of reference—at speed on a path. Our point of view, our perspective, comes complete with prior commitments to dàos (ways) of appreciating and selecting among available paths.

Mozi’s and Mencius’ second-level dàos for choosing and walking dào-like opportunities can themselves be chosen and walked correctly or incorrectly. Choosing an epistemic dào, similarly, depends on other practically available dàos for guiding that meta-choice… and so on. Zhuangzi does not view these as rational or logical constructions, but as complicated, multi-layered natural possibilities. Our languages are unlike mere natural sounds in that they have a scheme of concepts, but any such scheme that in fact emerges in a community of natural beings is a natural one. How we deploy the scheme in real-world behavior is neither fixed nor given. Dàos of interpretation are both natural and socially constructed. We regard constructions that work for us in some situations as zhēn (natural/authentic) and those on which we can elaborate at some length as “this” (是 shì right) and its rivals as “not-that” (Zhuangzi 2:4).

Zhuangzi postulates no homunculus exercising authority over the organs, joints, openings in the body. So, what does the choosing? Despite the earlier linking of choosing to the mysterious moods, Zhuangzi focuses less on the conscious subjective experience of our mental substance or cognitive self and more on the indexical locus of the body in space-time. The I:me (我 wǒ) is analogous to the “this” and “that” within the linguistic dào structure—the grammatical indexical marks a choosing point in the conceptual and space-time structure. Like Hume’s self, without the naturally occurring grab-bag of emotional attitudes, it would not be there to play its choosing role. But it is the whole body, not just those attitudes, that chooses my way of behavior. The wǒ (I:me) is situated in a multi-layered frame of reference with its own complicated chéng (成 commitments)—swimming along in sea of dàos available for its choice.

Humans are the parts of the natural cosmos that engage in extensive teaching and learning of behaviors with a language. The wǒ (I:me) that has learned and knows-how is situated in existing commitments embedded in an indexed here-now in the network of ways to which is has and will assign shì-fēi (this-not that). Each shì-fēi (this-not that) it “shoots out” further commits it to a path. The first level paths have a shape, but the dàos of correct choice and performance are acquired by learning and lodged inside the performer’s body and not always plainly visible.

The trend from Confucius’s socially constructed humanism toward Zhuangzi’s naturalism had been gradual. Mozi’s argument for basing such constructions on a natural distinction of universal benefit and harm was an early step. Mencius developed both his response to Mozi and his account of the role of rén (仁 benevolence) as arguments that Confucian ritual behavior had evolved from natural (tiān) intuitive response patterns in the heart (心 xīn). Mencius’ answer to Mozi drew on Yang Zhu’s naturalism. Mencius portrayed his other dialectical rival as a normative egoist. Graham credits Yang with the primitivist notion of an inborn xíng (性 bio-nature) which is a normative “gift: endowment” from tiān (sky-nature). Thus, all three postulated a natural (tiān) normative authority. Three choices, egoism, utilitarianism, and intuition were the rival second-level sources of natural (tiān) guidance. The target of this choice was Mozi’s social construction of morality.

4.4 Intuitionism and Illumination

Zhuangzi views the paradigm normative debate in Classical China—the rú-mò (Confucian-Mohist) dispute—through his lens of epistemic dependence (yīn). We face all choices with a prior, fixed (chéng) commitment to dàos, to guiding perspectives. He introduces his perspective on perspectives thus:

Where can dào (guides) hide such that there are genuine and artificial? Where can yán (言 language) hide such that there is shì-fēi (是非 this-not that)? Where can dàos hide such that they do not exist? How can a yán (言 language) exist and not be kě (可 assertible)? Dàos hide behind small achievements and language hides behind rhetorical flourishes and elaboration. So, you have the “shì (this) fēi (not that)” of the Confucians and Mohists. Of what one says “this” the other says “not that” and of what the other says “not that” the first says “this”. If you want to “not that” what the other “this’s” and “this” what the other “not that’s”, nothing beats míng (明 illumination). (Zhuangzi 2:4)

This passage and its conclusion have fueled a lively interpretive debate around three positions: absolutism (one, perhaps mystical way), nihilism (no way), and pluralistic relativism (several ways). Zhuangzi’s enigmatic conclusion and the interpretation of his recommendation to use míng (明 illumination) is only part of the issue.

The first concern is whether one should even engage in normative this, not that (shì-fēi right-wrong) discourse. There are many versions of a negative answer. Most mirror the posture of the Primitivists—exemplified by Shen Dao and Laozi. It amounts to a first order “natural” norm that we should not make shì-fēi (this-not that) judgments—period. It follows immediately, we shouldn’t engage in disputes about how to make them (Graham 1989). A second version allows making them, but avers that no dispute can be settled. So, although we may engage, doing so is futile (Lai & Chiu 2014).

Another variation assumes ethical egoism and sees engaging in normative disputes as personally costly by upsetting one’s equilibrium (Kjellberg 1994; Raphals 1994). A sibling social point of view is that such disputes disrupt social equilibrium (Walker 2022; Lai & Chiu 2014; Coutinho 2015). Perhaps engaging in shì-fēi disputes bespeaks an unseemly obsession with being right (Wong 2005). Or, in the extreme, anything that results from engaging in a dispute is wrong or self-contradictory (Coutinho 2015 and Graham 1989). These anti-discursive attitudes fund the nihilistic (“there is no way to know right from wrong”) interpretation of míng.

These lines of defeatist interpretation of míng are helped along by some engaging slogans and metaphors which Zhuangzi uses in various places: fasting the mind (Fraser 2014b), wandering without aim (Fraser 2014a), “goblet” language spilling over (Chiu 2015). Each slogan is made reasonable in the contexts of the parable in which it occurs: a dangerous diplomatic mission to an unstable tyrant, skilled artists engaged in complex performances, puzzles made worse by thinking in ruts. Zhuangzi is particularly known for his attention to know-how (skill-knowledge). The smooth exercise of a complex acquired skill may be hindered by rehearsing coaching slogans. Zhuangzi also advocates open-mindedness and creativity, urges us to find alternative dào solutions which may require letting go of or rethinking commitments (Lai 2022b). Avoiding some commitments can increase options—but motivating the strategy depends on a commitment to access to more options. Fraser contrasts “instrumental” and “moderate” interpretations in context with mystical (Yearly 1983), absolutist, or nihilist/Stoic (Coutinho 2015) versions of Zhuangzi’s views on discursive behavior.

The philosophical objection to this familiar emphasis on the defeatist slogans is the Zhuangzi’s (Ch. 33) repudiation of Shen Dao’s fatalist posture with the familiar, anti-discursive, stoic result. The absolutist, intuitive anti-discursive stance clashes with the extended argument (above) against “you gentlemen’s” intuition—the idea that a natural, neutral immediate judgment exists that does not depend on some acquired, chéng (constructed) dào of judgment.

Talk of Daoist intuition here is befuddled by a translation-interpretation confusion concerning of the Chinese term 辯 biàn (distinction/dispute). It and the Western notion of an argument are ambiguous, but the ambiguities overlap at only the “dispute” end. “Argument” is ambiguous between quarrel and sentences arranged in valid proof structures. 辯 Biàn (distinction) is ambiguous between quarrel and making distinctions, the “this, not that” choice of way of walking here, now.

Although the Later Mohists had started reflecting on matters that might eventually have led them to formulate the concept of sentences arranged in a valid argument structure, they were not close. Their central notion of justification was that of a standard which could yield the correct discrimination—the Mohist 法 fǎ (measurement standard). Zhuangzi was interested in language but in neither syntax nor logical form. He doesn’t reject Western rationalism, but neither does he promote it. For Chinese philosophers, intuition was not the second level opposite of logic. It was immediate judgment without appeal to any other second level way of deciding and interpreting (e.g., flipping a coin, measurement operation).

The Mohists, however, had one important logic-like result—the rejection of self-condemning judgments—of which Shen Dao’s fēi-ing of either fēi-ing or shì-ing is a paradigm. Any judgment condemning all judgment is perverse. The problem with these general anti-discursive strategies is not that they are illogical in Western terms, but that they were known to be defective in China by anyone versed in the Later Mohist dialectic—as we’re assuming Zhuangzi to be. These anti-discursive general strategies do not play well with Graham’s insight that Zhuangzi has mastered the Later Mohists’ technical language and theory and that he successfully constructs an alternative theory of language.

Another strategy suggests Zhuangzi engages in discussions only for entertainment—toying with words (Moeller & D’Ambrosio 2017), speaking ironically (Ziporyn 2012; Walker 2019) and parodying the position he seems to espouse. Some characters in Zhuangzi’s dialogues wonder about exceptional figures who allegedly have abilities that justify that posture—the capacity to transcend our location in points of view and to lecture all of us from a privileged perspective. The Zhuangzi’s response typically reminds them that such idealized points of view are neither intelligible to us nor relevant to what we, ordinary types, should do. Either these exceptional observers have their own naturally chéng (fixed) frames of reference in the natural world, or they are outside of the natural world in some unrealistically unbounded realm. If the latter, then their views are both unintelligible and irrelevant to natural beings. What they would do in our situation does not constitute helpful advice to us. To advocate following the advice of these ideal observers is to speak practical nonsense to non-ideal, actual actors.

In the discussion of skepticism, Zhuangzi’s spokesman says:

“So, you don’t know what is beneficial or harmful, does the ‘fully arrived human’ necessarily not know them?”

Kingsley replied, “the fully arrived person becomes pure sapience, he could be in a blazing forest and not be able to feel any heat, the rivers of our civilization could freeze and he couldn’t feel any chill, devastating lighting could pulverize mountains and the wind raise a tidal wave and he could not experience surprise. Someone like that could ride on clouds and air, straddle the sun and moon, and wander beyond the four oceans. Death and life are not different for him, much less the inclinations of benefit and harm”.

Master Ju Que asked master Zhang Wu, “I’ve heard from my teacher that a sagely man does not find social dealings worth engaging, doesn’t pursue utility, doesn’t avoid harm, doesn’t take delight in striving, doesn’t follow dàos; in silence, he says things and in saying things, is silent. He roams outside the nitty-gritty of the actual world. Master regarded this as romantic fantasy but I deem it the execution of a mysterious dào. My kind sir what do you say of this?”

Zhang Wu replied, “This is something that, were the Yellow Emperor to hear, it would be like buzzing, and so how could the likes of Confucius come to know it? Furthermore, you have jumped to conclusions…. I’ll give you some absurd talk and you absurdly listen”. (Zhuangzi 2:11–12)

As Ziporyn notes, one may read these passages ironically or mystically. Zhuangzi looks to be parodying the idea of a wordless intuition or of guidance from an absolute, cosmic, or transcendent dào. “Where can I find a man who has forgotten language so I can talk with him” (Zhuangzi 26:13). We will revisit the second theme below; in either reading, it practically amounts to not taking passages rejecting discursive activity as expressing Zhuangzi’s serious, general, philosophy of language, decision, know-how and behavior.

Both rivals in the Confucian-Mohist dispute would have accepted the existence of a correct answer—either the distinction made by the higher ranked intuition (the educated or intuitive gentleman or sage) or that obtained by operating measurement-like total-utility standard. Neither would have found the debate process itself as tending toward the right result (as a Western rationalist would). Mozi comes closer, suggesting no one can resist his measurement-based language (Mozi 12a:18) and his analysis of the Confucian second level standard as self-defeating (Mozi 4c:4). For the intuitionist, the issue boils down to whose immediate, intuitive judgment is superior; for the Mohist, it is that a measurement-like operation would settle the matter, not the words expressed in dispute.

Note that their dispute pivots on their second level way of choosing a first level social behavior, e.g., the Confucian elaborate burial and three years of mourning. Zhuangzi’s insight that the heart’s shì-fēis depend on one of many prior, naturally constructed or learned perspectives, illuminates why the dispute persists. If we measured utility, the answer would have been obvious. The Confucian, however, with their cultivated moral attitude about elaborate funerals and three-year mourning period, sees the Mohist appeal to “gain” as morally callous and insensitive to their moral role. The very idea of thinking mathematically about the funeral of your grandfather!! If we decided by our existing instinctive or cultivated normative attitudes, the answer would be equally obvious.

This awareness of the many ways of choosing and interpreting is the alternative constructive candidate for míng (明 illumination). There are many second level standards and our choice among them is as complex as our original choice of first level behaviors. If there were a single naturally possible one, the dispute would not persist. Zhuangzi explicitly rejects intuition—as biased, imperfect, and only one among many ways to choose this and not-that. A cultivated (and even innate) intuition needn’t be ruled out. Nor does he reject utilitarian measurement. He rarely uses the character 法 fǎ (measurement-standards), but when he does, it is coherent with Mohist use. The Zhuangzi history recapitulates the common objection that Mohists measure material well-being but discount the value of music (entertainment or pleasure). One way to account for all of this is coherent with the multiple dependency theme applied to the regress of dàos of choice and evaluation of performance—there are many different conceptions of benefit and many different ways of measuring and points of view where benefit judgments diverge. Zhuangzi’s most beloved example is the usefulness to a tree of its being useless to humans which interestingly wars with his story a goose who is killed for being useless—not being able to honk (Zhuangzi 20:1).

4.5 Relativism: It depends on …

The Zhuangzi emphasizes the plurality of natural stances or points of view from which one may see paths of possible behavior as “natural”. For one of the paths to be available for me will be dependent on where I am galloping and at what speed and direction in my given trajectory in the network. All the appeals to tiān (nature) as an authority are right in insisting their dàos are natural, but mistaken in using that as a reason to deny a similar status to the dàos of rival normative thinkers. Tiān cannot serve as an arbiter of which rival norm is correct since it equally “puffs” all of them out. This allows each to claim their choices are of tiān (natural) dàos but does not allow them the corollary that their rival’s choices violate tiān. They, like us, conform with tiān’s constancies in being committed to their dàos.

Any shì-fēi (this: right) judgment concerning a dào would be a naturally yīn (因 dependent) shì judgment, based on prior or enacted commitments, gestalts orientations, and inner processes. Those past dào commitments bring us to a normative stance here, now, from which successive judgments of shì-fēi and kě (可 permissible) vs. not kě arise. Zhuangzi’s pivotal illustration pairs 是 shì (this) with 彼 bǐ (that) as near and far indexicals. “Any thing can be a ‘this;’ any thing can be a ‘that’”.

Local justifications for having shì-fēi (this-not that) or kě (assertible) are delivered in accordance our chéng (fixed) commitment momentum along the dàos that guided us to this point in time and space. This relativity of normative dependence underpins Zhuangzi’s mildly ironic skepticism of special or extraordinary normative statuses we give to, e.g., sages. We should doubt any transcendent or allegedly perfect, totalistic epistemic access to nature’s inexpressible normative know-how. There are no naturally ideal observers.

Will the eventual result be there is both shì (是 this: right) and (彼 that)? Will the eventual result be there is neither shì nor bǐ? We can call the situation of neither shì nor fēi finding its opposite the “pivot of dào (道 guides)”. The pivot sets the start of the center of a sphere from which there are inexhaustible responses—inexhaustible shì and inexhaustible fēi. Hence the saying “nothing matches míng (明 discernment)”. (Zhuangzi 2:5)

This cautious skepticism undergirds Zhuangzi’s departure from the primitivists’. He neither concludes that we must not issue shì-fēi judgments nor that we must reject or deny our natural, situational inclinations to shì-fēi. We should, instead, adopt an attitude of epistemic modesty, healthy skepticism, while making our perspective-based choices and recommending our interpretations to others. That modesty arises from míng (clarity) that our perspective, like theirs, arise from a complex and complicated natural dào structure. Zhuangzi’s skepticism (below) does not indict our epistemic apparatus; it’s literally about the extent of our lives in the great scheme of being. We are small, short-lived creatures in a vastly complicated structure. Epistemic modesty also undergirds Zhuangzi’s openness and willingness to interact with others. If nature has a point of view, it is one in which all actual dàos of shì-fēi-ing in nature are available as candidate guiding structures. Nature makes no choice; it is not an actor with an absolute or superior normative status on what is right, what to “this”. Nature makes actual dàos as candidates for us to naturally (自然 zìrán self-realize) choose and walk.

Understanding míng (明 illumination) as awareness of this dependence on our history and the multiplicity of such perspectives does not require that the perspectives are impenetrable to each other. While they explain disagreement, they do not require it. Míng provokes us to realize that we may make progress and improve our guiding perspective by incorporating, simulating, and broadening to include the guiding perspectives of others. A rare tale, by contrast, warns us about when the dàos of others do not mesh well with our natural and pre-learned capacities—the boy from Shouling who goes to learn the Handan way of walking which “cripples” his original ability without mastering the Handan walk (Zhuangzi 17:10). Still a third outcome of the interaction, as with violent gangsters and rulers, reminds us simply to keep our distance or if we venture into the situation, to use extreme caution.

A rival interpretation treats Zhuangzi’s discussion of a Pivot or Axis of daos as an invitation to regard míng as a cosmic perspective, the view of Nature, from both everywhere and/or nowhere. Míng is not a limited, modest perspective on perspectives—a simple recognition from here of many other natural perspectives around. This is the kind of passage Ziporyn (2012) and Walker (2019) treat as ironic because the transcendent unity of all things defies coherent expression, or is “boundless”. Like Shen Dao’s Great Dào, it cannot offer meaningful guidance to any proper part of the cosmos.

The “modest” interpretation, by contrast, does not make the Great Dào unintelligible metaphysically. There is an evolving probability structure that is the dào of the universe. What is unintelligible is regarding that Great Dào as prescriptive—as something that guides us absolutely rather than relative to who and where and when we are. It is incoherent to treat great Dào as the guide to our lives but also incoherent to regard the cosmos as following a path. The cosmos (tiān-dì heaven-earth) is not a decider or actor making “this” “not-that” judgments. There are many deciders within nature realizing options from here, now and great Dào results from all those self-realizations. Follow the axis of dàos is ironic advice because it says do what you will do. As Laozi told us, dào follows zìrán (自然 self-so, nature). Normativity and choice emerge as the cosmos unfolds; the dào changes as we choose and enact one of the possible paths nature offers us.

As we saw above, Zhuangzi similarly treats talk about the perfect man, one who has arrived, or sages who judge from the perspective of tiān as ironic. Dào is monistic and includes all perspectives as parts, but no actual being (proper part of the cosmos) makes normative judgments from the perspective of “the One”. Because of this, we don’t try for a perspectiveless perspective, but use the shared, common perspective of our community (Zhuangzi 2:6). We can understand others with whom we interact and find ways to accommodate and cooperate, which Zhuangzi calls “walking two ways”). Learning from others can also help us see how to walk in the natural paths together without getting in the other’s way. (Zhuangzi 2:6).

It must also be ironic to say all paths are right, or all wrong, or all equal. In understanding other’s trajectories along their dàos, we may judge them as correct or incorrect. We do this from some limited, local, present perspective. From any actual perspective, we neither conclude that all are right, wrong, or equal. Certainly, not all are equally worthy of our choice. Nor need we judge that all are the correct choices for those following them. We may míng that their grounds for their choices are different from ours and still find them dogmatic, careless, or unwarranted in their application of those grounds. Nothing about the mere naturalness of such choices arising makes them right. All this is compatible with recognizing others as natural creatures guided by natural inner processes along natural guiding dàos.

We can and do judge that we might gain from being aware of and engaging in open exchanges with different perspectives—as in Zhuangzi’s dialogues. We are more inclined to follow a path, and given our similarities, think we might pursue it with benefit when we know some natural being like us found and followed it. And Zhuangzi clearly does ridicule the political moralists (Confucians and Mohists) as well as Hui Shi for the narrowness of their range of choices—their failure to appreciate the richness and complexity of alternative ways of life.

We learn from openness and exchange because we acquire commitments from simulating others’ path following behavior. That we progress in such exchanges is something we ourselves judge from here, not the cosmos from nowhere. We are naturally influenced by others’ evaluations, their judgments of our choices and their behavioral virtuosity—especially when the others are our parents, perceived superiors, and respected models. These, again, are the yīn (因 dependencies) of our judgments (shì). The back history of our learning-how extends to the emergence of life itself.

This gives Zhuangzi’s indexical relativism a different contour from Hui Shi’s. The latter structures his analysis mainly on comparatives. This leads him to a version of normative “error theory”—the conclusion that we should abandon normative semantic distinctions as all wrong. Since the biàn (辯 distinctions) on which they are based are relative, they are unreal. Ergo, there are no real distinctions and the world is a one with no parts. Any distinction making judgment, any shì-fēi (this-not that), unnaturally divides “The One”. Hui Shih’s Tenth Thesis is:

Flood concern on all the 10,000 thing-kinds; The cosmos is one tí (體 unit-part). (Zhuangzi 33:7)

Graham, relying on his hypothesis that Zhuangzi frequently considers positions which he later rejects, had already targeted this stereotypical view of Zhuangzi as agreeing with Hui Shi’s monism. Graham’s translation reveals the reductio that puts monism in a “considered and rejected” category. It amounts to the self-rebutting anti-language stance targeted by the Later Mohists—the error Zhuangzi’s naturalism of all perspectives (the “pipes of heaven”) was intended to avoid.

“[H]eaven and earth were born together with me and the myriad things and I are one”.

Now that we are one, can I still say anything? Now that I have called us one, did I succeed in not saying something? One and the saying make two, two and one make three. Proceeding from here even an expert calculator cannot get to the end of it, much less a plain man. (Zhuangzi 2:9)

4.6 Zhuangzi on Language

Zhuangzi’s relativism expresses choice, commitment, and interpretive performance on analogy to natural processes involved in following a path. Commitment is setting off along a path. We have momentum and a trajectory. The shape of the path combines with these and commits us to walk on or continue in a way that depends on the discernible shape of the path. Walking a path involves staying mostly within its physical boundaries.

This account allows us to capture the flavor of Zhuangzi’s discussion which differs from the familiar Western sentence-based metaphors of laws, rules, principles with norms of obedience, belief, or propositional desire. If we used the Western idiom, we would add the distinction between a cause and a reason. Zhuangzi’s relativist talk of yīn (因 dependence) on our location, trajectory and momentum on a path of choosing and interpreting courses of behavior guided by our internal dé (德 virtuosity) feedback loop as we “read” and translate external paths into behavior is natural but not fatalistic. Ziporyn (2013) highlighted the physical coherence of our lǐ (internal dào) and growing virtuosity as we become better at choosing and processing natural guidance.

Zhuangzi, thus, would not make his point in terms of deduction from a normative premise or principle. The internal and external paths themselves have a causal and normative relation to our walking behavior. A Western sentential focus would similarly mean describing the outcome as an action rather than an extended course of walking/following behavior. Performing a role in a play or a part in a symphony fits better in Zhuangzi’s metaphorical space. Zhuangzi’s reaction to Shen Dao’s fatalism is not the assertion of Western “free will” but starts from living things zìrán, themselves choosing and realizing a possibility for their behavior.

Zhuangzi’s use of the path metaphor did extend to the understanding of language but, again, not with a focus on sententials. Rather than constructing dàos in sentential form, Zhuangzi construes language itself as a bit of a social dào—an environmental possibility of verbal behavior for a human in that time and place to learn and master. The focus of ancient Chinese theory was on names on the analogy of path markers: “go past the tree, turn right, and then down to the water”. Names take on importance as sign-posts along physical structures. Confucian social versions emphasized the names of social roles and social statuses. Mozi expanded the model to include natural kinds. Primitivist opposition to social dàos led them into the sweeping anti-naming postures that Later Mohists showed to be self-condemning.

Graham’s interpretation of Zhuangzi’s pipes of nature pictured language as natural sound. Zhuangzi’s relativism, however, is more careful than Hui Shi’s. Hui Shi used relativist premises to derive an absolutist monism which collapsed into the familiar self-defeating primitivist anti-language quietism. Hui Shi viewed making everything one as denying (fēi-ing) any biàn (辯 distinctions). That, the Mohists said, was fēi-ing fēi-ing. That was a second example the Later Mohists gave of self-defeating, anti-language formulae. It fēi-s all míng (名 terms) and yán (words: language) itself.

Zhuangzi’s naturalism is anti-dogmatic; it neither denies nor affirms any particular set of distinctions as authentic (zhēn). Distinctions emerge at indexed (here-now) points in the network of real-world of actually possible dào perspectives. We, in our social groups, are travelers on a trajectory along one of the dàos of choosing shì-fēi (是非) from among multiple possible courses of human group behavior afforded by the cosmos. Our group, not the cosmos, selected which way to make the choice.

When Zhuangzi returns to the metaphor later in the chapter, he agrees that language is not merely wind. Those who use language have language. The Later Mohists are right that languages have built-in aboutness. Their mistake is in regarding what language is about as fixed—Mohist semantic realism.

Language is not blowing; those who use language, have language. That which is languages is decidedly not yet fixed. Is the eventual result that they have language? Or there has never been language? Deeming it as different from bird calls: does that mark a distinction? Or is there no distinction? (Zhuangzi 2:4)

The Later Mohists had also argued that when a biàn (辯 distinction) was formulated as a shì-fēi, e.g., one of the disputants calls it “ox” and the other “not-ox”, one of them must shèng (勝 win), i.e., dāng (當 hit on it). Zhuangzi denies that “winning” (shèng) in a relevant social process (game of supporting a way of distinguishing by appealing to a higher-order way of distinguishing) means one is guǒ (果 substantively) shì (correct).

This dào-centered insight resembles the observation that one could “win” the game of giving and asking for reasons for a propositional belief, which could still fail to be true. Even if “winning” consists in constructing the better argument, and although rationalists may view valid reasoning as tending toward truth, Zhuangzi’s analogue of the “norm of truth” entails that one may have the better argument and still be wrong. Zhuangzi does not have the rationalist concept of truth, but he has a conception of “the norm of truth”. (See Fraser 2012 for a related claim about Later Mohists’ concept of dāng—that it plays the expressive role of truth).

Zhuangzi construes winning as one side conceding or getting the approval of a judge (Zhuangzi 2:12). The Later Mohists’ common-sense realism incorporated social conventions. Conventions set out what wù (物 natural-kind) each term “selects out” or biàn (distinguishes) from the rest. They then extend that distinction to select out new realities relying on similarity or difference (being accessible to “eyes and ears” of ordinary people). Hui Shi, however, had argued that between any two wù (物 natural-kinds) there is some similarity and some difference. So, even with a “winning” concept in place, there may be many ways to project it on other realities. So even the agreement of a community could not finally fix the reference of the term.

The Later Mohists had ruled out what they called kuāngjǔ (狂舉 wild picking out), but failed to find an adequate account of what similarities would count as wild and not-wild. The frustrating vagueness and signature indecision in the text’s comparison of language to bird-calls leaves interpreters free to treat this observation as ironic. But it need not be. The analogy with bird calls might be a fortuitous suggestion. We arrange, adapt, and modulate the elements of our language to fit our environment, abilities, and opportunities (e.g., mating). Had Zhuangzi guessed the same about birds? Zhuangzi otherwise accepts our social nature and the social nature of language—but only, he emphasizes, pragmatically.

Only those who “break through” know how to communicate with it as a “one”. Because of this, we don’t use that strategy and instead locate things in the common realm. The common is useful; the useful, communicable, and the communicable achievable. If you hit on the achievable, you are nearly there and dependent shìs end. (Zhuangzi 2:6)

Humans, in finding ways to walk and walking them, initiate the construction of social paths, naturally and perhaps unintentionally, by leaving prints in the natural world. Zhuangzi links the path metaphor to a society’s linguistic practice thus:

That which we treat as kě (可 assertible) is kě (可 assertible); that which we treat as not assertible is not assertible. Dàos are made by walking them; thing-kinds are made rán (然 so) by being called “so”. (Zhuangzi 2:6)

This sense of the immense complexity and the fluid nature of normative commitments to a dào (path) underlie Zhuangzi’s skeptical themes. Míng (明 clear: discerning) seems linked to the gestalt in which we accept ourselves as embedded, along with others similarly situated, in nature’s endlessly complex evolution of guiding structures.

4.7 Skepticism

Zhuangzi’s argument using the warning function of a norm of truth (even when justified by our best available judging standards, we may still be wrong) leads to one of his formulations of skepticism. We cannot finally settle skeptical doubts by winning disputes, particularly not by appeal to a judge or authority.

So, you and I and others cannot know, and in these conditions on what other can we rely? The changing sounds’ mutual dependence is like their conjoint autonomy. Harmonize them with glances at nature and make them dependent on eventual consensus and with that exhaust the years. (Zhuangzi 2:12)

The conclusion is less a solution to the skeptical problem posed than merely a way to cope constructively with the complexity and uncertainty of normative guidance for creatures like us in this vast complicated network of possibility. The prior passages ruled out any appeal to a special authority of any other point of view—while giving a similar role in the construction to all. The construction results from each of our choices from our indexed point of view. However useful and widely shared, this “conventional wisdom” does not have special authority—say, over other creatures. This passage follows Zhuangzi’s notorious toying with the perspectives of animals:

Gap-tooth asked Kingsley, “Do you know that which all natural kinds agree in endorsing (shì this-ing)?”

He answers, “How would I know that?”

“Then, do you know of what you don’t know?”

“And how could I know that?”

“So, does no natural kind know anything?”

“And how would I know that? Nonetheless, let me try to put it in language. How would I know that what I call ‘knowing’ is not ‘not-knowing’? And what I call ‘not-knowing’, ‘knowing’. And let me try a question on you. If people sleep in the damp, they get pains and paralysis; would eels? If in a tree, they tremble in fear; would monkeys? Of the three, does any know the correct place to live? … From where I see it, the origins of goodness and morality, painting things as ‘this/right’ or ‘not-that/wrong’ are, as boundaries, both confused and complicated; how could I know how to distinguish them?” (Zhuangzi 2:11)

The skeptical conclusion about the norms of correct word use makes Zhuangzi’s skepticism Chinese, unlike Western skepticism of beliefs. The Later Mohists divided knowing how to use words into four parts, knowing terms, knowing objects, knowing how to match them, and acting (on that matching). We know-of a term and an object and how to match them in guiding our behavior. Knowing how to use words is something we learn from our different pasts. Linguistic skepticism easily metastasizes to virtually any commitment expressed in terms that distinguish one thing from others. Even given a past practice, it applies to a present alleged conformity to that practice. According to which dào of projecting past practice should we judge this linguistic behavior as conforming to our commitment and that not? Normative skepticism in a use-theory is hard to contain—especially when the model of all judgments is as some indexed shì-fēi (是非 this-not that) assignment of terms to the world. It sweeps in metaphysics, epistemics, and semantics.

A consequence is that Zhuangzi’s skepticism is broad but weak. Broad because it infects so many judgments, but weak in the epistemic sense of denying final certainty but allowing for varying degrees of knowledge. Donald Sturgeon (2015) has helped to clarify this feature of Zhuangzi’s epistemology. He credits the text’s non-ironic reference to greater and lesser knowing and calls Zhuangzi’s a “positive” skepticism. (Other proposed terms for substantive mild skepticism are constructive skepticism [Wong 2022], epistemic modesty [Hansen 2003], and fallibilism [Coutinho 2015].) The true skeptical thesis encourages gaining míng (insight, understanding) into other perspectives to improve our epistemic dé (virtuosity). It reminds us that we are equipped to find our way, given our various natures, around our bit of the natural structure. It does not equip us to fathom the whole, but curiosity, open-mindedness, and understanding (míng) another perspective helps us know more and better.

Positive skepticism, like non-substantive therapeutic skepticism (Raphals, Kjellberg, and Schwitzgebel, in Kjellberg and Ivanhoe (eds) 1996), is a recommendation, but remains true skepticism because it reminds us “our confidence in our own comprehensive view is neither reliable nor unique to us” (Hansen 2003). We are normally inclined to overestimate our knowing. We learn this from past experience of coming to appreciate another perspective—Sturgeon highlights Zhuangzi’s story of the Earl of the river, proud of its massive extent, flowing on and discovering the more impressive perspective of the Lord of the North Sea. Adopting the new perspective, the Earl is immediately tempted to think he now has the correct comprehensive view until reminded by the Lord of the North Sea of its smallness in the great scheme of the universe (Zhuangzi 17:1–2).

Zhuangzi’s skepticism is mild because it does not constitute a reason to abandon what we know nor to avoid acting when we know how. Appreciating other natural perspectives does remind us that our view, even if recently broadened, is still subject to further improvement. It should provoke curiosity, not paralysis. It does not rest on any theory of the probability of an error arising from this dào of knowing. It rests only on the existence of other natural ways of knowing. As such, it neither undermines what we have learned nor give us reason to stop practicing known behaviors . Appreciating that others reach their perspective as naturally as we do only removes our claim to special natural status for making judgments. We are equally situated in natural situations calling for guidance but differently endowed to know and act.

Zhuangzi’s skepticism is supported by our own past experiences of learning, of acquiring new gestalts, of realizing that what we had considered the way, was subject to reconsideration and improvement. It reminds me to remain open to the further possibility of learning. We can benefit from open-minded survey of other natural ways, how other natural creatures, human and not, process and perform in our shared world—we learn there are other dàos.

Gaptooth’s drawing attention to different conceptions of knowing lies at the heart of the famous debate between Zhuangzi and Hui Shi about knowing of fish-pleasure in which Zhuangzi defends a claim to know against Hui Shi’s epistemic challenge. Different concepts of “knowing” underwrite different norms of using it in different contexts of application.

Zhuangzi and Hui Shi wandered over the Hao River bridge. Zhuangzi said, “those mini-fish coming from there and cruising around, relaxed and unhurried, are fish at leisure”. Hui Shi said, “You are not a fish; from whence do you know the leisure of fish?” Zhuangzi retorted, “You are not me, from whence do you know my not knowing fish at leisure?” Hui Shi responds, “I’m not you, of course I don’t know about you; You are not a fish and that’s enough to count as you’re not knowing fish’s leisure”. Zhuangzi concludes, “Let’s return to where we started. When you said, ‘from what perspective do you know fish at leisure’, you clearly knew my knowing it as you asked me. I knew it here above the Hao”. (Zhuangzi 17:13)

Graham drew our attention to the role of perspective in this passage, noting that Hui Shi’s challenge to Zhuangzi’s assertion does not use the normal question form (何 hé how do you know?), but a locative question word (安 ān whence?). This brings the debate into alignment with Zhuangzi’s concern about the various perspectives from which to deploy a dào of word use. Here, as above, the word is zhī (知 know). The norm of asserting, as in English, involves answering the challenge “how do you know?” What normative conditions allow me, here and now, correctly to use the term zhī (know)—hence to make the assertion about these fish below me? Hui Shi both knew Zhuangzi was relying on a dào of using ‘know’ “from Zhuangzi’s here” and Hui Shi knew Zhuangzi’s situation from his own relevantly similar “here-now” and relying on the same dào (道 norm) of claiming to know from a distinct perspective. Hui Shi cannot consistently insist that speakers can only use zhī (知 know) when they occupy the perspective of the object they are aware of.

4.8 Perspectives on Perspectives

The argument about knowing the perspective of fish implies we can have a perspective on the perspectives of others without sharing their subjectivity. Daoist theory of others’ minds would work by seeing from here the paths of behavior available to them and their current direction and speed-commitment along an existing path. Knowing from here would follow different norms from knowing in there. Zhuangzi, here, uses perspective relativism to justify a way of claiming to know.

In other parables, he addresses the kind of knowing that comes after a gestalt shift, especially when we see our own and others’ points of view as similar—see ourselves as others see us. A benefit is our self-recognition as a creature embedded as are others within a natural perspective in a network of perspectives. This picture of ourselves encourages being open-minded, humbling our epistemic pride, mildly disrupting our judgment equilibrium. Without this perspective on ourselves, we too easily fall into exaggerating our epistemic exceptionalism. The reminder that we are intermingled with others in a web of natural perspectives serves as a realistic correction. A Zhuangzi story illustrates such a moment.

Zhuangzi was wandering in Diaoling fields when he glimpsed a weird magpie-like-thing flying in from the south. It had a wingspan of over seven feet and passed so close his forehead, he could feel it. Then it gathered its wings and settled in a chestnut grove. Zhuangzi thought “what bird is that? Massive wings of such power and eyes so large it couldn’t see me”. He hiked up his robe and hurriedly tiptoed closer holding his crossbow at the ready. Then he spotted a cicada settling in the shaded shelter without a worry for itself, but a praying mantis opened its pincers about to grab it, also focused on its gain and ignoring its own bodily danger. The strange magpie burst out and harvested them both—similarly unaware of the natural dangers he faced. But Zhuangzi was suddenly seized with this thought, “We natural kinds are all interconnected! We varied species are mutually seeing things in our own ways”. Suddenly, hearing the game warden running toward him shouting out his crime, he puts away his crossbow and flees. (Zhuangzi 20:8)

This is the more comprehensive perspective on perspectives Zhuangzi urges on us. We experience such gestalt shifts especially when we come to appreciate the limitations of our prior perspective now that we view things differently. We confidently judge now that we have made epistemic progress—our new awareness seems relatively improved to us after the shift. We judge our own former perspective as inferior to our present one. We do not infer that our present perspective is final or privileged. We naturally worry that we have not made the final correction. Sturgeon contrasts Zhuangzi’s epistemic perspective on perspectives (明 míng clarity) with Xunzi’s which simply condemns all “blinkering” by perspectives. That’s the epistemic nihilist posture (philosophical quietism) we could call ironic.

The limitation of the gestalt shift is clear in the above story of the River Earl. The North Sea Lord warns the River Earl not to confuse this insight with having reached an ultimate state of knowledge. He casts doubt on there being a final, ultimately small or large.

The lord of He river said, “So can I consider cosmos ‘large’ and the tip of a hair as ‘small’?” North Sea Ruo replied, “No! Thing-kinds have unlimited ways of measuring; Time has no end; distinctions have no constancy, beginning and ending no inherent base. Because of this great knowing is viewed as a degree of distance and closeness. …We calculate that what humans know is never as great as what they do not know, their temporal extent of life is less than time before life; for the puny to try to comprehend the immense is an invitation to confusion and disorder. There is nothing to be gained there”. (Zhuangzi 17:3)

If Zhuangzi’s míng entails having a sense of our limited perspective, it embodies several sound lessons. There is neither a view from nowhere nor from everywhere. My perspective is not privileged, but neither is any ruler’s or any sage’s. Credulous, dogmatic absolutists by contrast imagine they (or Zhuangzi) can reach a mystical, privileged view that is inaccessible to ordinary beings.

Understanding that no perspective is privileged makes skepticism less threatening. I do not have to abandon my present perspective to be open-minded and curious about others. We are aware of our limitations, but not paralyzed or unable to act on our knowledge. We are still as naturally situated as those with whom we disagree. We mutually appreciate why it is hard for the other to see things from our point of view. Further improvement might come from further exchange of perspectives. We might come to agree, you win me over or vice versa. We might not and still improve our understanding from your “glimpse of nature”. Or we might merely learn to keep our distance from each other. We cannot know perfectly, but we can know better.

The naïve Confucian-Mohist advocates of imposing a single social dào thus disrupts the natural process by which social dàos evolve in real time as they seek harmony. While we cannot help making our own judgments and commitments, Zhuangzi sees tolerance and accommodation as values that follow from appreciating other natural perspectives:

A monkey keeper says (to the monkeys) “I’ll give you three [rations] in the morning and four in the evening”. The monkeys seemed angry. “Ok, I’ll give you four in the morning and three in the evening”. The monkeys were happy. So, with no substantive loss, he could change their anger to happiness. This is an example of a shì judgment being dependent on circumstances. Thus, the sage uses shì-fēi (this-not that) judgments to bring harmony and rests in a natural balance. We can call this walking in pairs. (Zhuangzi 2:6)

We are, as it happens, capable of understanding the perspectives of others well enough to accommodate and cooperate with them, to borrow insights and to reach agreements. These accommodations and agreements are constructed social dàos. Morality is a concept within a social dào as is knowing. The Chinese concept, like the Western one, enshrines a contrast with mores—the moral conception of a particular community at a particular time. The Western contrast is conceptually linked to the core of rationalism—reason, especially pure reason. The Chinese concept is of an imagined community of all “under heaven”. The Zhuangzi’s skepticism questions if we can extrapolate from our ordinary capacity to broaden our perspective to imagine such an “all in” normative structure. While we experience a gestalt broadening of perspective as revealing something real and significant (like waking from a dream), a final such awakening remains a possible, but distant hope—best viewed as a regulative ideal. Like the norm of truth, it prompts epistemic modesty.

Talk of political morality hardly breaks the surface in the Zhuangzi text. His most famous statement on political morality was his refusal to take up a post of honor offered by emissaries from a ruler:

Zhuangzi was fishing in the Pu when two emissaries from the ruler of Chu approached with the message “Please take charge of my kingdom”. Zhuangzi, focused on his fishing pole, did not deign to glance at them. “I’ve heard the Chu king keeps a sapient tortoise, dead for 3000 years, wrapped in a robe in a basket hung high in the imperial temple. Now, would this turtle prefer being dead and having its remains so honored to being alive and dragging its tail in the mud?” The two envoys replied, “He’d prefer being alive and dragging his tail in the mud”. Zhuangzi muttered, “Off you go! I’ll be dragging my tail in the mud”. (Zhuangzi 17:11)

Modern debate about the political implications of Zhuangzi’s philosophy, by contrast, is more than copious. The central issue is whether Zhuangzi’s skeptical relativism applies to morality in a way that would render us indifferent to Hitler’s genocide (Van Norden 2016). This objection to Daoism is an ancient Confucian one—without the anachronistic example. If and how it applies depends very much on how we interpret Zhuangzi’s míng.

In all cases, the interaction results in improvement in knowing as judged by the knower from their prior dào. Each makes the accommodation with their own prior commitment along their way, with the addition of now understanding how the other works in its natural context (and other prior dào commitments). We do naturally judge that we know better after each “awakening” encounter while remaining epistemically modest. We understand the other may have had a different awakening to what they view as greater knowing. The mild skepticism amounts to not knowing if these wakings-up will converge or terminate. Typically, like the keeper and his monkeys, we know how to find a way to co-exist without conflict—walking two paths at once—occasionally agreeing only to stay out of each other’s way.

Zhuangzi’s refusal to take up the rule of a state is consistent with tolerance, given the apparent options in his time and place. The Warring States’ models of government were of either the Confucians or Mohists imposing their favored, single dào on everyone using the apparatus of the state—the monopoly on coercion or control of the educational curriculum. Zhuangzi’s refusal to participate is morally consistent since his natural options did not include a constitutional democracy with a rule of law administered neutrally to allow the widest possible choices of naturally compatible ways of life. It is understandable if his modern followers, like Chen Guying, appeal to his outlook to support a democratic free state. While we cannot credit him with having worked out that political dào, it seems unfair to fault him for not having invented liberal political theory.

His default political outcome is a broadly evolutionary construction of coalitions of the types listed above. The Zhuangzi includes a passage many treat as ironic that (obscurely as usual) envisions this possibility. He lists eight virtuosities (德 dé) which presumably guide the choice of outcomes when two natural ways of life meet.

When dàos haven’t yet guided a territory and language hasn’t yet achieved constancy, we can deem some notional boundaries. Please state these guidelines. There is left and there is right. There or levels and there is morality, there are parts and there are distinctions, there is competition and there is war. These are called the eight virtuosities. (Zhuangzi 2:10)

The proposal here is continuous with Sturgeon’s account of Zhuangzi’s “positive skepticism”, where the openness to other normative perspectives may result in several outcomes. Optimistically one dàoist may adopt part or all of the perspective of the other or, as with the monkey keeper, find accommodation that allows both to choose their own way. Pessimistically we may construct a conception of evil or disgust towards the other and end in war. Positive skeptical relativism, otherwise, minimally impacts our moral behavior.

The understanding that others are moving on different trajectories does change either our moral direction or momentum. It alerts us to alter course to avoid interfering with their movement—metaphorically not to kill or punish or abuse them for peacefully following a different road. It does not give Zhuangzi any further reason not to continue to follow the best path by his lights—now enlightened (míng) by learning how many other ways of life go. Open-minded conversation with others is his way.

Zhuangzi need not abandon the tolerance that motivated him to decline rule in ancient China. His open-minded behavior in seeking better to understand the dàos of thieves and tyrants would help us be sensitive to similar tendencies we display, the genocide of aboriginal populations, rationalizing slavery and segregation, invading other countries, and seek to change their cultures by force and lack of respect for difference. What we learn from the Hitler example is to recognize how we might end up similarly blinkered to our own fallibility.

Near the end of his epistemic reflection, Zhuangzi treats the gestalt shift that accompanies a leap to a more comprehensive perspective, knowing better, on the analogy of dreaming and waking up. At awakening, we immediately appreciate the unreality of the dream, interpreting it as a dream. This awareness of cognitive progress is real, but still subject to mild skepticism. We may dream of having a similar gestalt shift and then, awakening, interpreted that dream.

When we dream, we don’t know it as a dream, and in our dreams, judge something else as a dream. On awakening, we know it was a dream, and there could be another greater awakening in which we know a greater dream. The ignorant too think they are as enlightened as if they had learned it by an investigation. Gentlemen to shepherds inherently do this! (Zhuangzi 2:12)

The skeptical difference from a “final awakening” concerns whether these paths of broadening from different starting points will converge on a single outcome. So, is there an ultimate or final possible such shift in gestalt—some final state of knowing what to do? Zhuangzi’s relativism is mildly skeptical of the relativism itself. Perhaps…

The mild skepticism of our trajectory to greater knowledge is most famously illustrated in the story of Zhuangzi dreaming being a butterfly and/or vice versa. It seems to suggest that the gestalt sense of liberation from error may go both ways. Perhaps our subsequent perspective is one from which most would move to our former perspective. Some adolescents are converted to religion others from it.

Once before, Zhuangzi dreamt of being a butterfly, gaily butterflying and himself embodied in this sense of purpose! He knew nothing of Zhuangzi. Suddenly awakening, he then is rooted in Zhuangzi. He doesn’t know if Zhuangzi dreamt of being a butterfly or a butterfly is dreaming of being Zhuangzi—though there must be a difference. This is called “things change”. (Zhuangzi 2:14)

Finally, consider Zhuangzi’s non-ironic examples of real-life spectacular know-how—the most beautifully and elaborately expressed of which is the passage celebrating Butcher Ding.

Butcher Ding carved an ox for Lord Wen Hui; his point of contact, the way he inclined his torso, his foot position, the angle of his knee … gliding, flowing! The knife sang “whuaa” with nothing out of tune. It was as if he were dancing the Faun Ballet or directing an opera.

Lord Wen Hui exclaimed “Ole! Splendidly done! Can talent extend even to this?”

Butcher Ding gestured with his knife, explaining,

What your servant follows is a dào; that is what skill aims for. When I began to carve oxen, I saw nothing but an ox. After three years, I had ceased seeing oxen as whole, and now my sapience entangles so that I don’t see with my eyes, Sensory know-how ends, and my sapient guidance takes over my performance. I rely on natural guiding structures, separate out the great chunks and steer through empty gaps depending on the anatomy. I evade places where cords and filaments intertwine, much less the large bones.

A good cook gets a new knife every year; he chops! Mediocre cooks change knives monthly; they hack. My knife now has 19 years on it; it’s carved several thousand oxen and the edge is as if I had just taken it from the sharpener.

Those joints have gaps, and the knife’s edge no thickness, to put something infinitesimally thin in an empty space?! Effortless! It even allows the edge wander in with ample room to play. That is why, with 19 years on it, this knife’s edge is grindstone fresh.

(Zhuangzi 3:2)

The Zhuangzi plays several variations on this theme. Sometimes the virtuoso performer catches cicadas on a sticky rod, another crafts chariot wheels; there are musicians, debaters, and thieves. The theme extends to animals, millipedes with their expertise in coordinating their limbs while maintaining a smooth flow, snakes flashing by while slithering on their stomachs. One implicit example is Zhuangzi’s own relation with his relativist rival and buddy, Hui Shi. Bemoaning Hui Shi’s loss while visiting his sidekick’s grave, Zhuangzi spins a tale of a virtuoso ax-thrower who sliced specks off the nose of his crony. He lost his “knack” when his co-performer passed away (Zhuangzi 24:6).

These tales highlight several themes that illustrate the range of second level míng attitudes that accompany learned behavior that skillfully follows a natural path. One is the tranquil state that accompanies behavior that skillfully follows a natural path. The performances look and feel effortless. The spontaneity of the flow along a natural path gives performers the sense that their behavior is “world-guided” rather than internally controlled. These behaviors become second-nature as we real-ize how we are entangled with the objects—knee, knife, and knot. We move beyond anything like sub-vocalizing instructions, deliberating, or reflecting—and yet we are concentrating intently on our performance. The range of his examples reminds us that such satisfying states of performance can be experienced in even the lowest caste and mundane of activities, including butchering and criminal skills, not merely in fine arts and philosophy.

Another theme is the different understandings that accompany stages of learning as one approaches this effortless flow. Finally, this non-ironic praise of sublime achievement in know-how is the observation that such expertise in performance always comes with some kind of limitation—not least that each example is a different person with a different knack. There is no shortcut dào that gives you a knack at every activity. Cook Ding “comes to a hard place”; the cicada catcher warms up by trying to balance two coins on his stick—if he is not calm enough, he will have a bad night. The wheelwright could not teach his son the art; the musician cannot play all the notes and only reaches true perfection when he dwells in silence. The valorization of this kind of specialization in an art pulls in the opposite direction of Zhuangzi’s encouragement to broaden and enlarge our perspectives and scope of appreciation.

This theme of the limits of virtuosity is pursued explicitly in the Zhuangzi’s discussion of the necessary connection between chéng (成 completion:success) and kuī (虧 failure: deficiency). The theme of this weak skeptical relativism plays out smoothly into the classical Chinese focus on paths as the model of normativity and the objects of knowledge. Paths are everywhere but guide natural kinds from particular space-time locations and can guide a wide range of behavior types and normative subject matters. Each leads to subsequent choices among dàos (paths).

Zhuangzi does not ground his skepticism in an account of specifically human epistemic deficiencies. We are one among many natural creatures with different capacities, choosing paths from their indexed point in space and time. The skeptical theme is not the absence of, but the plethora of, different perspectives and perspectives on perspectives. We are limited in two senses:

  1. There is no behavior from the point of view of the whole—there is no omniscient perspective on nature’s path structure.
  2. We will die out before we have discovered and understood all of nature’s dàos (道 paths).

We will always wonder if our judgment about which is the best path will be our later judgment. All we can substitute for a global, eternal perspective is some local consensus.

Substantively, in the end, is there success and defect? Substantively, in the end, is there neither success nor defect? If we can call these successful, then even I am also successful. If they cannot be called successful, then neither I nor any other thing may be called successful. For this reason, sages target the illumination of slippery doubt and for this reason, we do not use it and let things rest in the conventional. (Zhuangzi 2:6)

The weak skeptical conclusion is most strikingly expressed in the observation that introduces the chapter with the story of Cook Ding.

My life is limited and know-how is unlimited. To pursue the unlimited with the limited is dangerous. (Zhuangzi 3:1)

Bibliography

Primary Literature

For the convenience of the internet reader, citations from classical texts are referenced to the chapter and paragraph number in Online Original https://ctext.org. Translations of the Zhuangzi in this article are those of its author. A public domain translation accompanies the Online Original on the site and the reader can easily access a character-by-character standard dictionary translation of the passages by clicking the blue “jump to dictionary” icon. Other tranlsations of the Zhuangzi include:

  • Graham, Angus C. (trans.), 1981, Chuang-tzŭ: The Seven Inner Chapters and Other Writings from the Book Chuang-tzŭ, Boston: Allen and Unwin.
  • ––– (trans.), 1981, Chuang Tzŭ: The Inner Chapters, London: Hackett Publishing Co. Inc.
  • Mair, Victor H. (trans.), 1994, Wandering on the Way: Early Taoist Tales and Parables of Chuang Tzu, New York: Bantam Books.
  • Palmer, Martin, Elizabeth Breuilly, Chang Wai Ming, and Jay Ramsay (trans), 1996, The Book of Chuang Tzu, London: Penguin Books.
  • Watson, Burton (trans.), 1964, Chuang Tzu: Basic Writings, New York: Columbia University Press.
  • ––– (trans.), 1968, The Complete Works of Chuang Tzu, New York: Columbia University Press.
  • Ziporyn, Brook, 2009, Zhuangzi: The Essential Writings (With Selections from Traditional Commentaries), Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing.

Further Reading

The number of philosophical articles published on Zhuangzi’s philosophy has grown exponentially in the years since the discovery of the Chinese philosophical tradition. The wide range of alternative views and approaches can only be hinted at in this bibliography. Particularly helpful are these collections of work dedicated to the understanding of Zhuangzi. They include (in order of publication):

  • Mair, Victor H. (ed.), 1983, Experimental Essays on Chuang-tzu, Honolulu: [published for] Center for Asian and Pacific Studies [by] University of Hawai’i Press.

    [This was one of the earliest focused collections with several seminal papers that were pivotal in initiating the explosion in philosophical interest in the Zhuangzi.]

  • Kjellberg, Paul and Philip J. Ivanhoe (eds), 1996, Essays on Skepticism, Relativism and Ethics in the Zhuangzi, Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.

    [This collection reacted to trend sparked by the Mair collection. Despite the title, the writers share concerns about understanding Zhuangzi in skeptical or relativist terms. Each has a different alternative characterization.]

  • Ames, Roger T. (ed.), 1998, Wandering at Ease in the Zhuangzi, Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.

    [This more diverse collection is inspired by the explosion of philosophically sophisticated treatments of the Zhuangzi.]

  • Cook, Scott (ed.), 2003, Hiding the World in the World: Uneven Discourses on the Zhuangzi, Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.

    [This collection returns to the central themes of skepticism and relativism.]

  • Ames, Roger T. and Takahiro Nakajima (eds), 2015, Zhuangzi and the Happy Fish, Honolulu, HI: University of Hawai‘i Press.

    [This collection focuses on the discussion between Zhuangzi and Hui Shi about whether one can know the fish are happy.]

  • Lai, Karyn and Wai Wai Chiu (eds), 2019, Skill and Mastery: Philosophical Stories from the Zhuangzi, London/Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield.

    [This collection, as the title indicates, focuses on the theme of skill in the Zhuangzi.]

  • Chong, Kim-chong (ed.), 2022, Dao Companion to the Philosophy of the Zhuangzi (Dao companions to Chinese philosophy, 16), Cham: Springer. doi:10.1007/978-3-030-92331-0

    [This massive new collection (34 contributions) ranges from text theory to all of the above and Western comparisons.]

Secondary Literature

  • Ames, Roger T., 1998a, “Knowing in the Zhuangzi: ‘From Here, on the Bridge, over the River Hao’”, in Ames 1998b: 219–230 (ch. 11).
  • ––– (ed.), 1998b, Wandering at Ease in the Zhuangzi, Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Callahan, William A., 1998, “Cook Ding’s Life on the Whetstone: Contingency, Action, and Inertia in the Zhuangzi”, in Ames 1998b: 175–196 (ch. 8).
  • Chen Gu-ying 陳鼓應, 1983, Zhuangzi Jinzhushi 《莊子今註今譯》北京：中華書局.
  • Chiu, Wai Wai. 2015. “Goblet Words and Indeterminacy: A Writing Style that Is Free of Commitment”, Frontiers of Philosophy in China, 10: 255–72.
  • Chong, Kim-chong, 2006, “Zhuangzi and the Nature of Metaphor”, Philosophy East and West, 56(3): 370–391. doi:10.1353/pew.2006.0033
  • –––, 2011, “The Concept of Zhen 真 in the Zhuangzi”, Philosophy East and West, 61(2): 324–346. doi:10.1353/pew.2011.0019
  • ––– (ed.), 2022, Dao Companion to the Philosophy of the Zhuangzi (Dao companions to Chinese philosophy, 16), Cham: Springer. doi:10.1007/978-3-030-92331-0
  • Connolly, Tim, 2011, “Perspectivism as a Way of Knowing in the Zhuangzi”, Dao: A Journal of Comparative Philosophy, 10(4): 487–505. doi:10.1007/s11712-011-9246-x
  • Coutinho, Steve, 2004, Zhuangzi and Early Chinese Philosophy: Vagueness, Transformation, and Paradox, (Ashgate World Philosophies Series), Aldershot: Ashgate.
  • –––, 2015, “Conceptual Analyses of the Zhuangzi”, in Dao Companion to Daoist Philosophy (Dao Companions to Chinese Philosophy 6), Xiaogan Liu (ed.), Dordrecht: Springer, 159–191 (ch. 7). doi:10.1007/978-90-481-2927-0_7
  • D’Ambrosio, Paul J., 2020a, “Reading the Zhuangzi Playfully: Stepping Back from ‘Ancient Chinese Wisdom’”, Asian Philosophy, 30(3): 214–229. doi:10.1080/09552367.2020.1813870
  • –––, 2020b, “The Zhuangzi on Coping with Society: Misreading the ‘Skill’ Stories with Modern (and) Religious Overtones”, Journal of Religious Ethics, 48(3): 474–497. doi:10.1111/jore.12321
  • Fingarete, Herbert, 1972, Confucius—The Secular as Sacred, New York: Harper & Row.
  • Fox, Alan, 1996, “Reflex and Reflectivity: Wuwei in the Zhuangzi”, Asian Philosophy, 6(1): 59–72. doi:10.1080/09552369608575428
  • Fraser, Chris, 2008, “Psychological Emptiness in the Zhuāngzǐ”, Asian Philosophy, 18(2): 123–147. doi:10.1080/09552360802218025
  • –––, 2009, “Skepticism and Value in the Zhuāngzi”, International Philosophical Quarterly, 49(4): 439–457. doi:10.5840/ipq200949462
  • –––, 2012, “The Limitations of Ritual Propriety: Ritual and Language in Xúnzǐ and Zhuāngzǐ”, Sophia, 51(2): 257–282. doi:10.1007/s11841-012-0303-7
  • –––, 2014a, “Wandering the Way: A Eudaimonistic Approach to the Zhuāngzǐ”, Dao: A Journal of Comparative Philosophy, 13(4): 541–565. doi:10.1007/s11712-014-9402-1
  • –––, 2014b. “Heart-Fasting, Forgetting, and Using the Heart Like a Mirror: Applied Emptiness in the Zhuangzi”, in J. Liu and D. Berger (eds.), Nothingness in Asian Philosophy, Routledge: New York.
  • –––, 2016, The Philosophy of the Mòzĭ: The First Consequentialists, New York: Columbia University Press.
  • –––, 2022, “Finding a Way Together: Interpersonal Ethics in the Zhuangzi”, in Chong 2022: 561–580 (ch. 23). doi:10.1007/978-3-030-92331-0_23
  • Fraser, Chris, Dan Robins, and Timothy O’Leary (eds.), 2011, Ethics in Early China: An Anthology, Hong Kong: Hong Kong University Press.
  • Fried, Daniel, 2012, “What’s in a Dao?: Ontology and Semiotics in Laozi and Zhuangzi”, Dao: A Journal of Comparative Philosophy, 11(4): 419–436. doi:10.1007/s11712-012-9290-1
  • Giles, Herbert Allen (trans./ed.), 1889, Chuang Tzŭ: Mystic, Moralist, and Social Reformer, London: Bernard Quaritch, Second revised edition, Shanghai: Kelly & Walsh, 1926. [Giles 1889 available online]
  • ––– (trans./ed.), 1906, Musings of a Chinese Mystic: Selections from the Philosophy of Chuang-Tzŭ (Wisdom of the East Series 3), London: J. Murray. [Giles 1906 available online]
  • –––, 1926 [1961], Chuang Tzu: Taoist Philosopher and Chinese Mystic, second edition, London: Bernard Quaritch. Reprinted, London: Allen and Unwin, 1961.
  • Graham, Angus C., 1969, “Chuang-Tzu’s Essay on Seeing Things as Equal”, History of Religions, 9(2/3): 137–159. doi:10.1086/462602
  • –––, 1983, “Taoist Spontaneity and the Dichotomy of ‘Is’ and ‘Ought’”, in Mair 1983: 3–23.
  • –––, 1989, Disputers of the Tao: Philosophical Argument in Ancient China, La Salle, IL: Open Court.
  • –––, 1990, “How Much of Chuang Tzŭ Did Chuang Tzŭ Write?”, in his Studies in Chinese Philosophy and Philosophical Literature (SUNY Series in Chinese Philosophy and Culture), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press, 283–321. Reprinted in A Companion to Angus C. Graham’s Chuang Tzu, Harold D. Roth (ed.), Honolulu, HI: University of Hawaii Press, 2003, 58–103.
  • Hansen, Chad, 1989, “Mozi: Language Utilitarianism (The Structure of Ethics in Classical China)”, The Journal of Chinese Philosophy, 16(3–4): 355–380. doi:10.1111/j.1540-6253.1989.tb00443.x
  • –––, 1983, “A Tao of Tao in Chuang Tzu”, in Mair 1983: 24–55.
  • –––, 1992, A Daoist Theory of Chinese Thought: A Philosophical Interpretation, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780195134193.001.0001
  • –––, 2003, “Guru or Skeptic? Relativistic Skepticism in the Zhuangzi”, in Hiding the World in the World: Uneven Discourses on the Zhuangzi, Scott Bradley Cook (ed.), (SUNY Series in Chinese Philosophy and Culture), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press, 128–162 (ch. 5).
  • –––, 2011, “Dào as a Naturalistic Focus”, in Fraser, Robins, and O’Leary 2011: 267–295 (ch. 14).
  • Ivanhoe, Philip J., 1991, “Zhuangzi’s Conversion Experience”, Journal of Chinese Religions, 19(1): 13–25. doi:10.1179/073776991805307729
  • Klein, Esther, 2010, “Were there ‘Inner Chapters’ in the Warring States? A New Examination of Evidence about the Zhuangzi”, T’oung Pao, 96(4): 299–369. doi:10.1163/156853210X546509
  • Kjellberg, Paul, 1994, “Skepticism, Truth, and the Good Life: A Comparison of Zhuangzi and Sextus Empiricus”, Philosophy East and West, 44(1): 111–133. doi:10.2307/1399806
  • Kjellberg, Paul and P. J. Ivanhoe, 1996, Essays on Skepticism, Relativism, and Ethics in the Zhuangzi, Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Lai, Karyn L., 2022a, “Freedom and Agency in the Zhuangzi : Navigating Life’s Constraints”, British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 30(1): 3–23. doi:10.1080/09608788.2021.1994366
  • –––, 2022b, “Performance and Agency in the Zhuangzi”, in Chong 2022: 661–682 (ch. 28). doi:10.1007/978-3-030-92331-0_28
  • Lai, Karyn L. and Wai Wai Chiu, 2014, “Ming in the Zhuangzi Neipian: Enlightened Engagement”, Journal of Chinese Philosophy, 40(3–4): 527–543. doi:10.1111/1540-6253.12052
  • Legge, James (trans), 1891, The Sacred Books of China: The Texts of Taoism, 2 volumes, (Sacred Books of the East 39–40), Oxford: Clarendon Press. Reprinted, New York: Dover, 1962. [Legge (trans.) 1891 volume 1 available online] [Legge (trans.) 1891 available online]
  • Liu, X., 1994, Classifying the Zhuangzi Chapters (Michigan Monographs in Chinese Studies: Volume 65), Ann Arbor, MI: University of Michigan Center for Chinese Studies. [Liu 1994 available online]
  • Lo Yuet Keung 勞悅強, 1999, “To Use or Not to Use: The Idea of Ming in the Zhuangzi”, Monumenta Serica, 47(1): 149–168. doi:10.1080/02549948.1999.11731326
  • –––, 2022, “The Authorship of the Zhuangzi”, in Chong 2022: 237–267 (ch. 11). doi.org/10.1007/978-3-030-92331-0_3
  • Mair, Victor H. (ed.), 1983, Experimental Essays on Chuang-tzu, Honolulu: [published for] Center for Asian and Pacific Studies [by] University of Hawai’i Press.
  • Möller [Moeller], Hans-Georg, 1999, “Zhuangzi’s ‘Dream of the Butterfly’: A Daoist Interpretation”, Philosophy East and West, 49(4): 439–450. doi:10.2307/1399947
  • –––, 2022, “Humor and its Philosophical Significance in the Zhuangzi”, in Chong 2022: 287–304 (ch. 13). doi:10.1007/978-3-030-92331-0_13
  • Moeller, Hans-Georg and Paul J. D’Ambrosio, 2017, Genuine Pretending: On the Philosophy of the Zhuangzi, New York: Columbia University Press.
  • Porat, Roy, 2022, “Language in the Zhuangzi”, in Chong 2022: 237–267 (ch. 11). doi:10.1007/978-3-030-92331-0_11
  • Raphals, Lisa, 1994, “Skeptical Strategies in the ‘Zhuangzi’ and ‘Theaetetus’”, Philosophy East and West, 44(3): 501–526. doi:10.2307/1399738
  • –––, 2022, “The Zhuangzi on Ming (命)”, in Chong 2022: 217–233 (ch. 10). doi:10.1007/978-3-030-92331-0_10
  • –––, 2022, “Neuroscientific and Cognitive Perspectives on the Zhuangzi” in Chong 2022: 683–702 (ch. 29). doi:10.1007/978-3-030-92331-0_29
  • Robins, Dan, 2011, “‘It Goes Beyond Skill’”, in Fraser, Robins, and O’Leary 2011: 105–123 (ch. 5).
  • Roth, Harold D., 1991, “Who Compiled the Chuang-Tzu”, in Chinese Texts and Philosophical Contexts: Essays Dedicated to Angus C. Graham, Henry Rosemont (ed.), (Critics and Their Critics 1), La Salle, IL: Open Court, 82–128.
  • Roth, Harold D. (ed.), 2003, A Companion to Angus C. Graham’s Chuang Tzu (Monograph of the Society for Asian and Comparative Philosophy, No. 20), Honolulu: University of Hawai’i Press.
  • Shang, Ge Ling, 2006, Liberation as Affirmation: The Religiosity of Zhuangzi and Nietzsche, (SUNY Series in Chinese Philosophy and Culture), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Soles, Deborah H. and David E. Soles, 1998, “Fish Traps and Rabbit Snares: Zhuangzi on Judgement, Truth and Knowledge”, Asian Philosophy, 8(3): 149–164. doi:10.1080/09552369808575481
  • Stevenson, Frank W., 2006, “Zhuangzi’s Dao as Background Noise”, Philosophy East and West, 56(2): 301–331. doi:10.1353/pew.2006.0025
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