1. The tradition of Asaṅga and Vasubandhu is sometimes called the “followers of scripture” (Sanskrit: *āgamānusārin; Tibetan: lung gi rjes ’brangs), which refers primarily to the Yogācārabhūmi, the representative text of the tradition. The logico-epistemological tradition of Dignāga and Dharmakīrti is also called the “followers of reasoning” (Sanskrit: *nyāyānusārin; Tibetan: rigs pa’i rjes ’brangs). See Hopkins 1996: 174‒176; Deleanu 2012: 4, n. 4.

2. The term “Yogācārin”, which we often find in the secondary literature, has no textual support (Silk 2000: 267).

3. Such an interpretation has been proposed, for instance, by Mukai (for a brief summary, see Silk 2000: 273, n. 31). Lusthaus (2004: 914) also mentions that the school is named after the Yogācārabhūmi.

4. Some scholars (Williams 2009: 87) have raised concerns about whether the Abhisamayālaṃkāra and the Ratnagotravibhāga were authored by the same person as the other three works.

5. As Kritzer (2005) points out, many of Vasubandhu’s arguments in the Abhidharmakośa(bhāṣya) are nonetheless deeply influenced by the Yogācārabhūmi. For a list of works that can reasonably be attributed to (the same) Vasubandhu, see Schmithausen 1987: 262–263, n. 101 or Skilling 2000: 299.

6. In addition to these treatises, the tradition also ascribes to Vasubandhu several commentaries on the works of Asaṅga and Maitreya. Whether these commentaries were composed by the same person as the treatises mentioned above is uncertain, see Schmithausen 1987: 262–263, n. 101.

7. Again, it is doubtful that these commentaries are all by the same author, see Kramer 2016a.

8. The study of Paramārtha’s views is also burdened by uncertainties regarding the authorship of the works traditionally attributed to him (Radich 2008; Keng & Radich 2019).

9. The other four works attributed to Dharmakīrti are the Nyāyabindu (“Drop of Reasoning”), the Hetubindu (“Drop of Reasons”), the Sambandhaparīkṣā (“Analysis of Relations”) and the Vādanyāya (“Logic of Argumentation”).

10. Attempts to harmonise Madhyamaka and Yogācāra teachings can already be found in a work by Kambala (c. 5^th-early 6^th century CE), the Ālokamālā (Garland of Light), see Williams 2009: 88.

11. On the objects of mental consciousness and related issues in various Buddhist philosophical traditions, see Yao 2021.

12. We find different stages of development of this model in the various strata of Yogācāra literature. In this entry, the terms “cognition” and “consciousness” are used interchangeably to refer to the broadest category of object-oriented or intentional states of mind. For an explanation of the terms vijñapti or vijñāna, see Hall 1986; Salvini 2015: 32–43; Kellner 2017: 321, n. 2.

13. It is noteworthy that the various Yogācāra sources differ slightly with regard to the objects of the ālayavijñāna (Griffiths 1986: 95–96; Schmithausen 1987: 88–107; Waldron 1995: 17).

14. Various texts list slightly different defilements, see, e.g., Schmithausen 1987: 442, n. 943; or Waldron 2003: 116.

15. For an alternative theory of the origin of the kliṣṭamanas (and the ālayavijñāna) by Suguro, see the summary in Schmithausen 1987: 144–145. According to Suguro, the ālayavijñāna and the kliṣṭamanas were not originally regarded as separate entities. The manas later took over from the ālayavijñāna the function of clinging to the self, allowing for a more neutral characterisation of the latter as the existential and biological foundation of the individual.

16. On the concept of āśraya in Abhidharma, see Szanyi 2021.

17. Kramer (2016b: 158) claims that the idea that the manas is a simultaneously present mental faculty was disregarded in the Abhidharmic context probably due to its apparent similarity to the concept of a substantial and enduring self.

18. The Mahāyānasaṃgraha contains “proofs” for the existence of the kliṣṭamanas, see Kramer 2016b: 162–163.

19. There is no obvious way to translate the term ālayavijñāna. Even in the Yogācāra works themselves we find different etymological interpretations, for which see Schmithausen 1987: 15, 22–29.

20. The ālayavijñāna is frequently characterised in the Yogācāra works as “possessing all the seeds” (sarvabījaka). The terms bīja and vāsanā are often used interchangeably in the Yogācāra context. For an etymological analysis of the term vāsanā, referring to something that (i) remains (from the Sanskrit root vas) unconsciously in the mind, e.g., an impression of a past action or experience, or (ii) perfumes or permeates (from the Sanskrit root vās) the mind, see Waldron 2003: 21, n. 15. The Yogācāra theory of seeds can be traced back to Sautrāntika thought, see, e.g., Griffiths 1986: 92–93; Waldron 1994 and 1995; Westerhoff 2018: 201–202. On the Sautrāntika bīja-theory in detail, see Jaini 1959 or Park 2014.

21. Buescher (2008) disagrees with Schmithausen, claiming that the introduction of the ālayavijñāna only became inevitable within the idealist ontological model of the Saṃdhinirmocana Sūtra. Buescher argues that the Sautrāntika “bi-polar bīja model” was already available to solve the problems caused by nirodhasamāpatti.

22. In these contexts, the term ālaya is best interpreted etymologically as a form of mind that “sticks to” or “dwells in” the body.

23. For an alternative theory of the origin of the ālayavijñāna, see Yamabe (2018), who claims that the introduction of the ālayavijñāna was based directly on meditative experience and not the result of theoretical speculations about nirodhasamāpatti.

24. The ālayavijñāna shows some interesting (dis)similarities with the Theravāda conception of the bhavaṅgacitta, see, e.g., Collins 1982: 225–261; Waldron 1994: 216–218.

25. On intersubjectivity, see Waldron 2003: 160–169; Schmithausen 2005a; Tzohar 2017 and 2018: 190–201.

26. For further discussion of this issue, see Griffiths 1986: 95, who is somewhat sceptical about the philosophical potential of reconciling the concept of ālayavijñāna with the doctrine of anātman.

27. The possibility or even necessity of getting rid of the ālayavijñāna is particularly emphasised in texts where it is assessed negatively, for instance as the source of pollution or defilement, and the cause of future rebirths, see Schmithausen 1987: 66–84, Delhey 2016: 21–22. The radical transformation of the ālayavijñāna from the state of affliction to the state of enlightenment is called āśrayaparāvṛtti or āśrayaparivṛtti, i.e., the transformation or reversal of the basis (in this context the term “basis” refers to the ālayavijñāna). As for the moral nature of the ālayavijñāna, in certain texts its negative evaluation is less emphatic or completely marginal, see Schmithausen 1987, 75, 82–83. Note also that, as many Yogācāra sources suggest, the cessation of the ālayavijñāna does not entail that there remains no consciousness in the state of enlightenment, see Williams 2009, 99–100.

28. The eight proofs of the Yogācārabhūmi are discussed in more detail in Griffiths 1986: 96–104 and 130–138; Schmithausen 1987: 194–196; Waldron 1995: 16–18 and 2003: 102–107; Kramer 2016b, and (in a meditative context) Yamabe 2015. This entry gives only a general overview of the main categories of proofs and their relevance. We find a more concise but partially overlapping list of six proofs in the Mahāyānasaṃgraha and of four proofs in Vasubandhu’s Pañcaskandhaka and Sthiramati’s Pañcaskandhakavibhāṣā. For a detailed exposition of these lists, see Kramer 2016b.

29. Schmithausen (1987: 195) describes these as the “somatic” aspects of the ālayavijñāna. Note, however, that Buddhists also accept the existence of formless or immaterial realms (ārūpyadhātu), where, according to some Yogācāra sources, the ālayavijñāna performs very similar functions (e.g., taking possession of a new existence or maintaining the continuity of the individual), even though there is no physical body (see, e.g., Schmithausen 1987: 48–51). The last proof mentioned in this group is understood differently by Griffiths (1986: 102–103). On his interpretation, it refers to the fact that one can have varying physical experiences at any given time. This variation, however, presupposes the ālayavijñāna and its seeds as the origin of these different sensations. Read in this way, the argument shows similarities with the proofs discussed later, especially the one arguing that different manifesting consciousnesses cannot be each other’s seeds.

30. Despite the multisensory account of perception outlined in the Proof Portion of the Yogācārabhūmi, certain Yogācāra authors and texts (e.g., Sthiramati’s Pañcaskandhakavibhāṣā or Vasubandhu’s “time-lag argument” in the Viṃśikā) assume that the manovijñāna arises subsequent to the sense perception of the same object, see Kramer 2016b: 152–155. We return to the time-lag argument in section 3.3.

31. For a discussion of the flip side of the argument, namely that our entanglement in the cycle of existence would also be inexplicable if there were no ālayavijñāna, see Kramer 2014: 318–319.

32. While this is a common distinction in the Western philosophical tradition, some argue that a systematic separation of epistemology from ontology would have made little sense in ancient India in any case (Williams 2009: 306, n. 24).

33. On the distinction between “immaterialism”—the view that there are no material or external objects—and “idealism”—the view that sensible objects are merely ideas in the mind—in Berkeley scholarship, see Stoneham 2002: 31–38; Rickless 2013: 1; or Bartha 2020: 1074–1075. Ontological (or immaterialist) idealism is also often labelled as “anti-realism” insofar as it denies “reality” in the sense of mind-independent existence. However, the terms realism and anti-realism have other applications as well. One of these is particularly relevant to the interpretation of Yogācāra idealism, as it concerns the question of whether, and, if so, to what extent, the mind’s own conceptual activity contributes to the construction of the sensible world. A comparison with a Kantian sort of idealism or anti-realism might suggest that, also for the Yogācāras, the sensible world is the product of our minds, not only in the sense that it exists only when a mind cognises it, but also in the sense that the content of our perceptions is essentially determined by the (innate) conceptual structure of our minds. On certain readings (Siderits 2016: 63, 95–96), however, Yogācāras want to maintain the “realist” view that there is a non-conceptual content given to us through conscious experience, which—even if mentally cognised and caused—can be regarded as a “reality” immune to the conceptual activity of our minds.

34. It should be noted that Dasgupta 1933 and Chatterjee 1975 proposed an absolute idealist reading of Yogācāra idealism, but this has been compellingly refuted by scholars (e.g., Kochumuttom 1982). While this interpretation is implausible for various reasons, the attempt to interpret ultimate consciousness in absolute terms has some obvious benefits in explaining our intersubjective experiences of a “shared world”.

35. In different Yogācāra sources, however, we find divergent accounts of whether the dependent nature belongs to the level of conventional or ultimate truth. On this question, and more generally on how the three natures overlap with the two truths theory, widely considered to be a core element of the Buddha’s philosophical teachings, see D’Amato 2005; Williams 2009: 88–92; Thakchöe 2015 and the entry on the theory of two truths in India.

36. Yamabe (1998: 19, n. 8) suggests that Vasubandhu’s Viṃśikā also oscillates between epistemological and ontological idealist positions.

37. The early Mahāyāna Pratyutpannabuddhasaṃmukhāvasthitasamādhi Sūtra, which is presumably the first (pre-Yogācāra) sūtra to use the term cittamātra in an idealist sense, also seems to point in this direction (Schmithausen 2005b: 249–250; Williams 2009: 89). For an overview of the meditative factors that influenced the development of Yogācāra teachings, see Westerhoff 2018: 194‒199. As for the origins of Yogācāra idealism, Buescher (2008) also traces it back to the Saṃdhinirmocana Sūtra.

38. On the idea that meditative experience is superior to other epistemic instruments (ordinary perception, reasoning, or testimony/scriptural authority), because it reveals the way things really are, see Westerhoff 2018: 196‒197. The idealist philosophical stance of the Saṃdhinirmocana Sūtra is also reflected in its narrative framework, as the work is set in a magnificent palace considered to be the manifestation of the Buddha’s pure mind (Powers 1995: 5, 313, n. 3.; Westerhoff 2018: 149). The text also likens the perception of ordinary beings to the vision of magical performances that the audience mistakenly believes to be real (Powers 1993: 43‒45d; Westerhoff 2018: 150).

39. Bronkhorst 2000: 62‒76 and Franco 2009 take a similar approach to that of Sharf.

40. That the Yogācāra tradition takes up and develops various themes from Sautrāntika Abhidharma is often emphasised in the literature, see for instance note 20 of this entry on bīja theory. As to their theory of perception specifically, Arnold (2008) argues that Dharmakīrti’s Yogācāra idealism is ultimately based on the same epistemology as Sautrāntika representationalism.

41. Note that we should not consider Sautrāntika as a unified doctrinal system at the time of Vasubandhu, see Kellner 2014: 277‒278.

42. The work’s argumentation has been analysed in detail in the literature on various occasions (for example in Kochumuttom 1982; Tola & Dragonetti 2004; Siderits 2007; Carpenter 2014: 137‒168; Kellner & Taber 2014; Gold 2015 and 2011 [2022]; Kachru 2021).

43. For an analysis of the hungry ghost analogy in Vasubandhu’s Twenty Verses, as well as Asaṅga’s Mahāyānasaṃgraha and the Madhyāntavibhāgaṭīkā traditionally attributed to Sthiramati, see Tzohar 2017. Tzohar argues that the analogy is meant to show not only that intersubjective agreement is consistent with Yogācāra idealism, but also that intersubjectivity cannot be explained by appealing to external objects of perception in the light of perceptual discrepancies. On the concern that within the Yogācāra framework we can only get “parallel subjectivities” rather than genuine intersubjectivity, see Garfield 2019.

44. It is worth noting that the third objection and reply seem to assume that causation necessarily involves a mind-independent effect, with Vasubandhu’s appeal to wet dreams only showing that the cause need not be external. But it is clear that Vasubandhu’s reply does not want to imply the former, and he merely offers his counterexample as an ad hominem argument against the realist objection. See Finnigan 2017: 183, for offering a not question-begging reading of both the objection and the reply. For a detailed analysis of Vasubandhu’s use of dreams in the Twenty Verses, see Kachru 2021: 43‒84.

45. For a detailed analysis of these verses, see Kapstein 1988; Tola & Dragonetti 2004: 94‒110; Siderits 2007: 159‒167; and Carpenter 2014: 147‒150. For a discussion of Vasubandhu’s anti-atomist argument from contact in the Viṃśikā, and the Abhidharmic antecedents of the problem of atomic contact and aggregation, see Carpenter and Ngaserin 2021.

46. Some have suggested that the reason Vasubandhu begins the Twenty Verses with the epistemological arguments of the first cluster is because he realises that his subsequent metaphysical arguments, though stronger in terms of their conclusion, have less dialectical force insofar as they rely on controversial claims about atomism (see Perrett 2017). One might also question whether the material accounts of objects that Vasubandhu rejects exhaust all possible alternatives, and, hence, his eliminative argument for the mind-only view as the only viable one is, in fact, valid.

47. Such claims can be found in Siderits 2007: 157‒158; Perrett 2017: 62‒63; Westerhoff 2018: 177; and Gold 2011 [2022]. However, given the complexity of the subliminal workings of the ālayavijñāna, with its various seeds and causal mechanisms, one might wonder whether Yogācāra idealism also amounts to a more elegant or syntactically simpler theory.

48. As Kellner and Taber (2014: 733‒734) argue, while often seen as a logical fallacy, the argument from ignorance can also be taken as an abductive inference, showing that since all available methods have failed to substantiate something, its non-existence is rather probable.

49. That genuine perception has a similar object-cause was not unkown to the Ābhidharmikas (e.g., it is present in chapter 9 of Vasubandhu’s Abhidharmakośabhāṣya (473.25‒474.2)), but Dignāga’s Ālambanaparīkṣā is often credited with identifying the roles objects play in perception more clearly than his predecessors. For a more detailed discussion of Dignāga’s conception of the object-condition of perception, see Chu 2006 or Kellner 2014, 281‒282.

50. For an analysis of Dignāga’s arguments, see Tola and Dragonetti 2004: 14‒28; Duckworth et al. 2016; Finnigan 2017. Dignāga’s work was commented on by various commentators, including Dignāga himself. For studies and translations of these, see Duckworth et al. 2016. It is worth noting that Sthiramati’s Triṃśikāvijñaptibhāṣya also presents arguments against the realist attempt to identify the objects of our perceptions with material objects composed of atoms, on the grounds that they cannot fulfil the criteria mentioned by Dignāga. His argumentation combines the metaphysical arguments of Vasubandhu’s Viṃśikā and Dignāga’s epistemological arguments from the Ālambanaparīkṣāvṛtti.

51. The argument can be found in both the Pramāṇavārttika (3.335 and 3.387‒397) and the Pramāṇaviniścaya (1.54‒58). For a helpful overview of the argument, see, for instance, Kellner 2017; Finnigan 2017: 188‒191; Arnold 2008: 13‒14; or Taber 2020.

52. Depending on how one understands the notion of svasaṃvedana, either as requiring only first-order consciousness of the object of perception or second-order consciousness of the cognition of the object, the argument can be read in two different ways (but with a similar conclusion). On the two readings, see Finnigan 2017: 188‒190. On the concept of svasaṃvedana, see, e.g., Ganeri 1999 and 2012; Kellner 2010 and 2011; Coseru 2012: 235‒273. The reader might find Dharmakīrti’s argument reminiscent of Berkeley’s so-called “master-argument” (see Berkeley [PHK, § 22‒23]), especially if one believes that Dharmakīrti also wanted to prove the impossibility of external objects. For an analysis of Berkeley’s argument, see, e.g., Rickless 2013: 127‒137.

53. More generally, as we have seen, Yogācāra authors propose that our common world of perception is created by an interplay between seeds in multiple (substratum) consciousnesses, resulting in part from our past mind-mind interactions.