Notes to Christian Wolff
1. For information concerning Wolff’s life, the reader can consult, among other sources, Wolff’s own autobiography (published in Wuttke 1841) and the recent biography by Kertscher (2018).
2. A German professor of philosophy typically lectured on several sub-disciplines, such as logic, metaphysics, ethics, as well as physics, politics, economics, grammar and rhetoric. For a general discussion, see Paulsen 1902 [1906].
3. For a brief account of the philosophy of Tschirnhaus, see Beck 1969: 189–195. For details concerning Wolff’s relationship with Tschirnhaus, see Dyck 2021a.
4. Other commentators who mention the interactive quality of Wolff’s atomic elements include: Beck (1969: 271); Johann Erdmann, (1866 [1890: 224–226]); and Burns (1966: 99).
5. Here, and throughout this section, passages from Wolff’s Cosmologia generalis are taken from Burns 1966.