Moral Vegetarianism

Billions of humans eat meat. To provide it, we raise animals. We control, hurt, and kill hundreds of millions of cattle and pigs and tens of billions of chickens each year.

To feed these animals, we raise crops. To raise crops, we deforest and use huge quantities of water. To quench these animals, we use still more water.

In turn, these animals produce staggering amounts of waste, waste that poisons water and soil. These animals produce staggering amounts of greenhouse gasses.

To raise these animals and produce this meat, farmers and slaughterhouse workers labor in conditions from hard to brutal.

If controlling, hurting, or killing animals is wrong or if the production of these environmental effects or effects on people is wrong or if consuming the meat produced is wrong, then a breathtaking level of meat-related wrong-doing goes on daily.

Many fewer than a billion humans are vegetarian, have diets excluding meat. They are vegetarian for various reasons: because it’s healthy, because their parents make them be vegetarian, because they don’t like meat. Porphyry recommended being vegetarian since eating meat produces pleasure and pleasure is a nail attaching one’s soul to one’s body and such attachment interferes with the intellect’s true purpose. Porphyry had other, moral arguments for vegetarianism, too, and some people are vegetarian on moral grounds. Moral vegetarianism is the view that it is morally wrong—henceforth, “wrong”—to eat meat.

The topic of this entry is moral vegetarianism and the arguments for it. Strikingly, most contemporary arguments for moral vegetarianism start with premises about the wrongness of producing meat and move to conclusions about the wrongness of consuming it. They do not fasten on some intrinsic feature of meat and insist that consuming things with that feature is wrong. They do not fasten on some effect of meat-eating on the eater and insist that producing that effect is wrong. Rather, they assert that the production of meat is wrong, that consumption bears a certain relation to production, and that bearing such a relation to wrongdoing is wrong. So this entry gives significant space to food production as well as the tricky business of connecting consumption to production.

§1 introduces relevant terminology and the main positions discussed in the entry. §2 explains meat production, the main moral arguments against it, and some responses to those arguments. That section—like the rest of the entry—homes in on medium-sized birds and mammals. Yet sea creatures and insects are killed in a number that dwarfs the number of land animals killed. Some issues these killings raise are covered in §3.

None of the foregoing is about consuming animals. §4 covers moral arguments from premises about meat production to conclusions about meat consumption. §5 considers some extensions of the arguments in §2. It speculates about which arguments against meat production can, if sound, be extended to show that animal product production or even some plant production is morally wrong. Widespread discussion of this last idea is relatively new. §6 notes some other new issues in the moral vegetarian literature.

• 1. Terminology and Overview of Positions
• 2. Meat Production
  • 2.1 Animal Farming
  • 2.2 The Schematic Case Against Meat Production
    • 2.2.1 Suffering
    • 2.2.2 Killing
    • 2.2.3 Harming the Environment
    • 2.2.4 General Moral Theories
• 3. Sea Creatures and Insects
• 4. From Production to Consumption
  • 4.1 Bridging the Gap
  • 4.2 Against Bridging the Gap
• 5. Extending Moral Vegetarian Arguments: Animal Products and Plants
  • 5.1 Animal Products
    • 5.1.1 Eggs
    • 5.1.2 Dairy
  • 5.2 Plants
    • 5.2.1 Plants Themselves
    • 5.2.2 Plant Production and Animals
    • 5.2.3 Plant Production and the Environment
  • 5.3 Summary of Animal Product and Plant Subsections
• 6. New Directions
• 7. Conclusion
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Terminology and Overview of Positions

Moral vegetarianism is opposed by moral omnivorism, the view according to which it is permissible to consume meat (and also animal products, plants, etc.).

Moral veganism accepts moral vegetarianism and adds to it that consuming animal products is wrong. Whereas in everyday life, “vegetarianism” and “veganism” include claims about what one may eat, in this entry, the claims are simply about what one may not eat. They agree that animals are among those things.

In this entry, “animals” is used to refer to non-human animals. For the most part, the animals discussed are the land animals farmed for food in the West, especially cattle, chicken, and pigs. There will be some discussion of insects and fish but none of dogs, dolphins, or whales.

Primarily, this entry concerns itself with whether moral vegetarians are correct that eating meat is wrong. Secondarily—but at greater length—it concerns itself with whether producing meat is wrong.

This entry concerns itself with eating in times of abundance and abundant choices. Moral vegans need not argue that it is wrong to eat an egg if that is the only way to save your life. Moral vegetarians need not argue it is wrong to eat seal if that is the only food for miles. These cases raise important issues, but the arguments in this entry are not about them.

Almost exclusively, the entry concerns itself with contemporary arguments. Dombrowski 2004 is a short history of vegetarianism and moral vegetarianism. Steiner 2005 and Stuart 2007 are much longer and more thorough. Williams 2003, Kemmerer 2011, and Adamson and Edwards 2018 are wide-ranging surveys of historical traditions on animals and, to a lesser extent, the ethics of killing and eating them. Sorabji 1993, Adamson 2012, Adamson and Ganeri 2016, Goodman 2017 (§5), Adamson and Carpenter 2018, and Adamson and Muratori 2020 are narrower.

Strikingly, many historical arguments and most contemporary arguments against the permissibility of eating meat start with premises about the wrongness of producing meat and move to conclusions about the wrongness of consuming it. That is, they argue that

By first arguing that

The claim about production is the topic of §2.

2. Meat Production

The vast majority of animals humans eat come from industrial animal farms, farms distinguished by their holding large numbers of animals at high stocking density. We raise birds and mammals this way. Increasingly, we raise fish this way, too.

2.1 Animal Farming

Raising large numbers of animals produces huge quantities of waste, greenhouse gas, and, generally, environmental degradation but also enables farmers to take advantage of economies of scale. There is no question of whether to put so many animals on pasture—there is not enough of it. Plus, raising animals indoors, or with limited access to the outdoors, lowers costs and provides animals with protection from weather and predators. Yet when large numbers of animals live indoors, they are invariably tightly packed, and raising them close together risks the development and quick spread of disease. To deal with this risk, farmers intensively use prophylactic antibiotics. Tight-packing also restricts species-typical behaviors, such as rooting (pigs) or dust-bathing (chickens), and makes it so that animals cannot escape each other, leading to stress and to antisocial behaviors like tail-biting in pigs or pecking in chickens. To deal with these, farmers typically dock tails and trim beaks, and typically (in the U.S., at least) do so without anesthesia. Animals are bred to grow fast on a restricted amount of antibiotics, food, and hormones, and the speed of growth saves farmers money, but this breeding causes health problems of its own. Chickens, for example, have been bred in such a way that their bodies become heavier than their bones can support. This generates chronic pain. Animals are killed young—they taste better that way—and are killed in large-scale slaughterhouses operating at speed. Animals that farms have no use for, e.g., male chicks on egg-laying farms, are killed at birth or soon after. Norwood and Lusk 2011, Singer 2023, HSUS 2009 offer significantly more about the mechanics of industrial animal farming. Harrison 1964 is a dated but still timely account of practices. Ritchie, et al. 2023 is closer to state of the art and has a variety of ways of visualizing animal death and suffering on industrial farms.

Raising animals industrially has produced low sticker prices. It enables us to feed our appetite for meat.

Raising animals industrially is also, in various ways, morally fraught.

Industrial animal farming raises concerns about the treatment of animals (Harrison 1964, C. Adams 1990, and Singer 1975 are classics on the topic; newer surveys are Engel 2015, Fischer 2018, McPherson 2018, Crary & Gruen 2022, and numerous articles in Beauchamp & Frey (eds.) 2011 and Rawlinson & Ward (eds.) 2016). Among others, we raise cattle, chickens, and pigs. Evidence from their behavior, their brains, and their evolutionary origins, adduced in Andrews and Monsó 2021 and its extensive bibliography, supports the view that they have mental lives and, importantly, are sentient creatures with likes and dislikes. Chickens and other “birdbrains” have interesting mental lives. Marino 2017 collects evidence that chickens can adopt others’ visual perspectives, communicate deceptively, engage in arithmetic and simple logical reasoning, and keep track of pecking orders and short increments of time. Their personalities vary with respect to boldness, self-control, and vigilance.

We farm billions of these animals industrially each year (Böll Foundation 2014: 15; Ritchie, et al. 2023). We also raise a much smaller number on freerange farms. In this entry “freerange” is not used in its tightly-defined, misleading, legal sense according to which it applies only to poultry and simply requires “access” to the outdoors. Instead, in the entry, freerange farms are farms that that let animals live natural lives while offering some protection from predators and the elements and some healthcare. While they involve control and early death, these farms are designed, in part, to make animal lives go better for them, and their design assumes that a natural life is better, other things equal, than a non-natural life. The animal welfare literature converges on this and also on other components of animal well-being: having good feelings, avoiding bad ones, engaging in species-typical behaviors, and doing so in good health with a normally-functioning, normally-developing body (Fraser 2008: 70–71).

So it is clear why industrial farming seems to do less for animal welfare than freerange farming: The latter enables keeping animals healthy. It enables happy states (“positive affect”) and puts up some safeguards against the infliction of suffering. There is no need, for example, to dock freerange pigs’ tails or to debeak freerange chickens, if they have enough space to stay out of each other’s way. Freerange farming enables animals to socialize and to otherwise lead reasonably natural lives. A freerange’s pig’s life is in those ways better than an industrially-farmed pig’s.

Yet because freerange farming involves being outdoors, it involves various risks: predator- and weather-related risks, for example. These go into the well-being calculus, too.

Animals in the wild are subjected to still greater predator- and weather-related risks and have no health care. Yet they score very highly with regard to expressing natural behavior and are under no one’s control. How well they do with regard to positive and negative affect and normal growth varies from case to case. Some meat is produced by hunting such animals. In practice, hunting involves making animals suffer from the pain of errant shots or the terror of being chased or wounded, but, ideally, it involves neither pain nor confinement. Of course, either way, it involves death.

Freerange farming and, especially, industrial animal farming raise concerns about its effects on humans (Pachirat 2011). Slaughterhouses, processing this huge number of animals at high speed, threaten injury and death to workers. Slaughterhouse work is exploitative; those workers are dominated (Young 1990). The work’s distribution is segmented by class, gender, and race (Eyal 2021). The costs of slaughterhouse work are concentrated in a small number, its benefits more widely distributed.

Industrial meat production poses a threat to public health (Rossi & Garner 2014). It threatens to create and spread pathogens that result from overcrowding animals with weakened immune systems. It threatens humans and animals through the routine use of antibiotics and attendant creation of antibiotic-resistant bacteria. These risks are typically not consented to because not typically even known about.

Industrial meat production directly produces waste in the form of greenhouse gas emissions from animals as well as urine and feces. Waste, concentrated in those quantities, can contaminate water supplies. The Böll Foundation (2014) estimates that farm animals contribute between at least 6% and perhaps as much as 32% of greenhouse gas emissions.

Industrial animal farming raises two concerns about wastefulness (Lappé 1971, PNAS 2013, Poore & Nemeck 2018, and Hayek, et al. 2021). One is that it uses too many resources and produces too much waste for the amount of food it produces. The other is that feeding humans meat typically requires producing crops, feeding them to animals, and then eating the animals. So it typically requires more resources and makes for more emissions than simply growing and feeding ourselves crops.

2.2 The Schematic Case Against Meat Production

Moral vegetarian arguments about these practices follow a pattern: They claim that some activity (X) is wrong and then add that some activity (Y) involves X and then add that if X is wrong and Y involves X, then Y is wrong too. So Y is wrong.

Among the candidate values of X are:

• Causing animals pain for the purpose of producing food when there are readily available alternatives that don’t involve causing that pain or anything else particularly bad.
• Killing animals for the purpose of…
• Controlling animals…
• Treating animals as mere tools…
• Ontologizing animals as food…
• Harming humans….
• Harming the environment…

And among the candidate values of Y are:

• Industrial animal farming
• Freerange farming
• Recreational hunting

Space is limited and cranking through many instances of the schema would be tedious. This section attends to causing animals pain, killing them, and harming the environment in raising them. On control, see Francione 2009, DeGrazia 2011, and Bok 2011. On treating animals as mere tools, see Kant’s Lectures on Ethics, Korsgaard 2018, and Zamir 2007. On ontologizing, see Diamond 1978, Vialles 1987 [1994], and Gruen 2011. On harming humans, see Pachirat 2011, Anomaly 2015, and Doggett & Holmes 2018.

2.2.1 Suffering

Some moral vegetarians argue:

The “while raising them for food when there are readily available alternatives” is crucial. It is sometimes permissible to cause animals pain: You painfully give your cat a shot, inoculating her, or painfully tug your dog’s collar, stopping him from attacking a toddler. The first premise here has it that causing pain is impermissible in certain other situations. The “when there are readily available alternatives” is getting at the point that for some people there are substitutes available that aren’t painful or particularly bad at all. Some of us could let the chickens be and eat rice and kale. For some other people, there might be no such alternatives. The first premise does not rule out industrial animal agriculture that serves those people and so the conclusion might be more limited than the argument states it above.

The argument says nothing about why hurting animals on industrial animal farms is wrong. It could be that it is wrong because it would be wrong to make us suffer to raise us for food and there are no differences between us and animals that would justify making them suffer (Singer 2023). It could, instead, be that it is wrong because it is impious (Scruton 2004) or cruel (Hursthouse 2011).

So long as we accept that animals feel, it is uncontroversial that industrial farms do make animals suffer. No one in the contemporary literature denies that part of the second premise, and Norwood and Lusk go so far as to say that industrial animal agriculture is impossible without quite a bit of pain (2011: 113).

It’s not just physical suffering. Industrial farms make animals suffer psychologically by crowding them and by depriving them of interesting environments. Animals are bred to grow quickly on minimal food. This selective breeding has led to a significant percentage of meat birds walking with painful impairments (see the extensive citations in HSUS 2009).

The argument can be adapted to apply to freerange farming and hunting. Freerange farms ideally do not hurt, but actual approximations of freerange farms do. For one thing, animals typically go to the same slaughterhouses as industrially-produced animals do. Both slaughter and transport can be painful and stressful.

The same goes for hunting: In the ideal, there is no pain, but, really, hunters hit animals with non-lethal and painful shots. These animals are often—but not always—killed for pleasure or for food hunters do not need, food for which there are readily available alternatives. Hunting is given short-shrift in this entry. For more detailed discussion, see Scruton 2006b, Cerulli 2012, and List 2018.

Taken together the arguments allege that all manners of meat production in fact produce suffering for food when we don’t need to do so, when there are readily available alternatives that don’t involve this hurting or anything particularly bad. The arguments then allege that that justification for producing such suffering is insufficient. Against the arguments, one might accept that farms hurt animals but deny that it is even pro tanto wrong to do so (Carruthers 1992 and 2011; Hsiao 2015a and 2015b) on the grounds that animals lack moral status and, because of this, it is not intrinsically wrong to hurt them (or kill or control them or treat them like mere tools). One challenge for such views is to explain what, if anything, is wrong with beating the life out of a pet. Like Kant, Carruthers and Hsiao accept that it might be wrong to hurt animals when and because doing so leads to hurting humans. The view faces two distinct challenges (Regan 1983: Chapter 5). One is that if the only reason it is wrong to hurt animals is because of its effects on humans, then the only reason it is wrong to hurt a pet is because of its effects on humans. So there is nothing wrong with beating pets when that will have no bad effects on humans. This is hard to believe. Another challenge for such views, addressed at some length in Carruthers 1992 and 2011, is to explain whether and why humans with highly limited mental lives have moral status and whether and why it is wrong to make such humans suffer. Although it is not squarely about this, Setiya 2018 bears on it.

2.2.2 Killing

Consider a different argument against meat production:

The second premise is straightforward and uncontroversial. All forms of meat farming require killing animals. There is no form of farming that involves widespread harvesting of old bodies, dead from natural causes. Except in rare farming cases, the meat produced in the industrialized world is meat for which there are ready alternatives. The “most” concedes that some forms of animal farming might involve killing when there are no ready alternatives.

The first premise is more controversial. Among those who endorse it, there is disagreement about why it is true. If it is true, it might be true because killing animals wrongfully violates their rights to life (Regan 1975). It might be true because killing animals deprives them of lives worth living (McPherson 2015). It might be true because it treats animals as mere tools (Korsgaard 2018). It might be true because it interferes with animals’ exercise of their natural capacities (Nussbaum 2023).

There is disagreement about whether the first premise is true. The “readily available alternatives” condition matters: Everyone agrees that it is sometimes all things considered permissible to kill animals, e.g., if doing so is the only way to save your child’s life from a surprise attack by a grizzly bear or if doing so is the only way to prevent your pet cat from a life of unremitting agony. Most would agree it is permissible for you to kill animals for food when you have no alternative food. (Whether it is permissible to kill animals in order to cull them or to preserve biodiversity is a tricky issue that is set aside here. It—and its connection to the permissibility of hunting—is discussed in Scruton 2006b.) At any rate, animal farms are in the business of killing animals simply on the grounds that we want to eat them and are willing to pay for them even though we could, instead, eat plants.

The main objection to the first premise is that animals lack the mental lives to make killing them wrong. In the moral vegetarian literature, some argue that the wrongness of killing animals depends on what sort of mental life they have and that while animals have a mental life that suffices for hurting them being wrong, they lack a mental life that suffices for killing them being wrong (Belshaw 2015 endorses this; McMahan 2008 and Harman 2011 accept the first and reject the second; Velleman 1991 endorses that animal mental lives are such that killing them does not harm them). Animals could lack a mental life that makes killing them wrong because it is a necessary condition for killing a creature being wrong that that creature have long-term goals and animals don’t or that it is a necessary condition that that creature have the capacity to form such goals and animals don’t or that it is a necessary condition that the creature’s life have a narrative structure and animals’ lives don’t or… Bradley 2015 is a reference-rich piece on these topics.

Instead, the first premise might be false and killing animals we raise for food might be permissible because it is part of a deal, a bargain with animals to raise them, to protect them from predators and the elements, and to tend to them, but then, in return, to kill them. Moreover, the bargain renders killing animals permissible (defended in Callicott 2015 and Zangwill 2021 and described in Midgley 1983). Such an argument might render permissible hurting animals, too, or treating them merely as tools: that’s the deal.

Relatedly, even conceding that it is pro tanto wrong to kill animals, it might be all things considered permissible to kill farm animals for food even when there are ready alternatives because and when their well-being is replaced by the well-being of a new batch of farmed animals (Tännsjö 2016). Farms kill one batch of chickens and then bring in a batch of chicks to raise (and then kill) next. The total amount of well-being is fixed though the identities of the receptacles of that well-being frequently changes.

Anyone who endorses the views in the two paragraphs just above needs to explain whether and why their reasoning applies to animals but not humans. It would not be morally permissible to create humans on organ farms and harvest those organs, justifying this with the claim that these humans wouldn’t exist if it weren’t for the plan to take their organs and so part of the “deal” is that those humans are killed for their organs. Neither would it be morally permissible to organ-farm humans, justifying it with the claim that they will be replaced by other happy humans. Delon 2016 is a reference-rich piece on such replaceability arguments.

2.2.3 Harming the Environment

Finally, consider:

We could plausibly replace “harming” with “egregiously harming.” The harms, detailed in Budolfson 2018, Hamerschlag 2011, and Ranganathan et al. 2016, are, indeed, egregious and include deforestation, greenhouse gas emission, soil degradation, water pollution, water and fossil fuel depletion.

The argument commits to it being wrong to harm the environment. Whether this is because those harms are instrumental in harming sentient creatures or whether it is intrinsically wrong to harm the environment or ecosystems or species or living creatures regardless of sentience is left open (Carson 1962, Næss 1973, and, for deeper historical roots and wider contemporary branches, Mulloy & O’Loughlin 2023).

The argument does not commit to whether these harms to the environment are necessary consequences of industrial animal farming. There are important debates, discussed in PNAS 2013, about whether, and how easily, these harms can be stripped off industrial animal production.

There is an additional important debate, discussed in Budolfson 2018, about whether something like this argument applies to freerange animal farming.

Jamieson 2008 and Sandler 2017 are comprehensive introductions to environmental issues. Schlottmann and Sebo 2019 is a comprehensive introduction to environmental issues around farming.

2.2.4 General Moral Theories

Nothing has been said so far about general moral theories and meat production. There is considerable controversy about what those theories imply about meat production. So, for example, utilitarians agree that we are required to maximize happiness. They disagree about which agricultural practices do so. One possibility is that because it brings into existence many trillions of animals that, in the main, have lives worth living and otherwise would not exist, industrial farming maximizes happiness (Tännsjö 2016). Another is that freerange farming maximizes happiness (Hare 1999; Crisp 1988). Instead, it could be that no form of animal agriculture does (Singer 1975 though Singer 1999 seems to agree with Hare).

Kantians agree it is wrong to treat ends in themselves merely as means. They disagree about which agricultural practices do so. Kant (Lectures on Ethics) himself claims that no farming practice does—animals are mere means and so treating them as mere means is fine. Some Kantians, by contrast, claim that animals are ends in themselves and that typically animal farming treats them as mere means and, hence, is wrong (Korsgaard 2018; Regan 1975 and 1983).

Contractualists agree that it is wrong to do anything that a certain group of people would reasonably reject. (They disagree about who is in the group.) They disagree, too, about which agricultural practice contractualism permits. Perhaps it permits any sort of animal farming (Carruthers 2011; Hsiao 2015a). Perhaps it permits none (Rowlands 2009). Intermediate positions are possible.

Virtue ethicists agree that it is wrong to do anything a virtuous person would not do or would not advise. Perhaps this forbids hurting and killing animals, so any sort of animal farming is impermissible and so is hunting (Clark 1984; Hursthouse 2011). Instead, perhaps it merely forbids hurting them, so freerange farming is permissible and so is expert, pain-free hunting (Scruton 2006b).

Divine command ethicists agree that it is wrong to do anything forbidden by God. Perhaps industrial farming, at least, would be (Halteman 2010; Scully 2002). Lipscomb (2015) seems to endorse that freerange farming would not be forbidden by God. A standard Christian view is that no form of farming would be forbidden, that because God gave humans dominion over animals, we may treat them in any old way. Islamic and Jewish arguments are stricter about how animals may be treated though without ruling out even industrial animal farming (Regenstein, et al. 2003).

Rossian pluralists agree it is prima facie wrong to harm. There is room for disagreement about which agricultural practices—controlling, hurting, killing—do harm and so room for disagreement about which farming practices are prima facie wrong. Curnutt (1997) argues that the prima facie wrongness of killing animals is not overridden by typical justifications for doing so.

3. Sea Creatures and Insects

In addition to pork and beef, there are salmon and crickets. In addition to lamb and chicken, there are mussels and shrimp. There is comparatively little in the philosophical literature about insects and sea creatures and their products, and this entry reflects that. For some reference-rich introductions to seafood ethics, see Harris 2016 and Michaelson & Reisner 2018. (Of course “sea creature” and “seafood” should not be taken literally. We eat animals that live in rivers and lakes as well as seas and oceans.) For less scholarly introductions, see Braithwaite 2010 and Wallace 2004. For some discussion of insect ethics, see Meyers 2013, Fischer 2016, and Carruthers 2007.

Yet the topics of sea creatures and insects are important. The organization Fish Count estimates that at least a trillion sea creatures are wild-caught or farmed each year (Mood & Brooke 2010, 2012, in Other Internet Resources). Globally, humans consume more than 20 kg of fish per capita annually (FAO 2016). In the US, we consume 1.5 lbs of honey per capita annually (Bee Culture 2016). Estimates of insect consumption are less sure. The UN FAO estimates that insects are part of the traditional diets of two billion humans though whether they are eaten—whether those diets are adhered to—and in what quantity is unclear (FAO 2013).

Seafood is produced by farming and by fishing. Fishing techniques vary from a person using a line on a riverbank to large trawlers pulling nets across the ocean floor. The arguments for and against seafood production are much like the arguments for and against meat production: Some worry about the effects on humans of these practices. (Some workers, for example, are enslaved on shrimpers.) Some worry about the effects on the environment of these practices. (Some coral reefs, for example, are destroyed by trawlers.) Some worry about the permissibility of killing, hurting, or controlling sea creatures or treating them merely as tools. This last worry should not be undersold: Again, Mood and Brooke (2010, 2012, in Other Internet Resources) estimate that between 970 billion and 2.7 trillion fish are wild-caught yearly and between 37 and 120 billion farmed fish are killed. The Shrimp Welfare Project estimates that over 400 billion shrimp are farmed each year. If killing, hurting, or controlling these creatures or treating them as mere tools is wrong, then the scale of our wrongdoing with regard to sea creatures beggars belief.

Are these actions wrong? Complicating the question is that there is significantly more doubt about which sea creatures have mental lives at all and what those mental lives are like (Andrews and Monsó 2021 and Allen and Trestman 2016). While whether shrimp are sentient is clearly irrelevant to the permissibility of enslaving workers who catch them, it does matter to the permissibility of killing shrimp. This doubt is greater still with regard to insect mental lives. In conversation, people sometimes say that bee mental life is such that nothing wrong is done to bees in raising them. Nothing wrong is done to bees in killing them. Because they are not sentient, there is no hurting them. Because of these facts about bee mental life, the argument goes, “taking” their honey need be no more morally problematic than “taking” apples from an apple tree. (There is little on the environmental impact of honey production or (human) workers and honey. So it is unclear how forceful environment- and human-based worries about honey are.)

This argument supporting honey production hinges on some empirical claims about bee mental life. For an assessment of bee mental life, see Chittka 2022 and Tye 2016, which argues that bees “have a rich perceptual consciousness” and “can feel some emotions” and that “the most plausible hypothesis overall…is that bees feel pain” (2016: 158–159) and see, too, Barron & Klein 2016, which argues that insects, generally, have a capacity for consciousness. The argument supporting honey production might be objected to on those empirical grounds. It might, instead, be objected to on the grounds that we are uncertain what the mental lives of bees are like. It could be that they are much richer than we realize. If so, killing them or taking excessive honey—and thereby causing them significant harms—might well be morally wrong. And, the objection continues, the costs of not doing so, of just letting bees be, would be small. If so, caution requires not taking any honey or killing bees or hurting them. Arguments like this are sometimes applied to larger creatures. For discussion of such arguments, see Guerrero 2007.

4. From Production to Consumption

None of the foregoing is about consumption. The arguments thus far have, at most, established that it is wrong to produce meat in various ways. Assuming that some such argument is sound, how to get from the wrongness of producing meat to the wrongness of consuming that meat?

This question is not always taken seriously. Most classics of the moral vegetarian literature do not give much space to trying to answer it. (C. Adams 1990 is a rare canonical vegetarian text that devotes considerable space to consumption ethics.) Illustratively, James Rachels writes,

Sometimes philosophers explain that [my argument for vegetarianism] is unconvincing because it contains a logical gap. We are all opposed to cruelty, they say, but it does not follow that we must become vegetarians. It only follows that we should favor less cruel methods of meat production. This objection is so feeble it is hard to believe it explains resistance to the basic argument [for vegetarianism]. (2004: 74)

Yet if the objection is that it does not follow from the wrongness of producing meat that consuming meat is wrong, then the objection is not feeble and is clearly correct. In order to derive the vegetarian conclusion, additional premises are needed. Rachels, it turns out, has some, so perhaps it is best to interpret his complaint as that it is obvious what the premises are, obvious how to build the bridge the gap from production to consumption.

Maybe so. But there is quite a bit of disagreement about what those additional premises are and plausible candidates differ greatly from one another.

4.1 Bridging the Gap

Consider an idea about the connection between production and consumption according to which consumption of wrongfully-produced goods is wrong because it produces more wrongful production. The idea issues an argument like this:

Or never mind actual production. A closely related argument runs:

(The main ideas about connecting consumption and production that follow can—but won’t —be put in terms of expectation, too.)

The moral vegetarian might then argue that meat is among the values of both Q and R: consuming meat is reasonably expected to produce production of meat. Or the moral vegetarian might argue that consuming meat produces more normalization of bad attitudes towards animals and that normalization is wrong. There are various possibilities.

Just consider the first, the one about meat consumption producing meat production. It is most plausible with regard to buying. It is buying the wrongfully-produced good that produces more of it. Eating meat produces more production, if it does, by producing more buying. When Grandma buys the wrongfully produced delicacy, the idea goes, she produces more wrongdoing. The company she buys from produces more goods whether you eat the delicacy or throw it out.

Arguments like this hinge on an empirical claim about production and a moral claim about the wrongfulness of producing wrongdoing. The moral claim has far-reaching implications (DeGrazia 2009 and Warfield 2015). Consider this tipping case:

You order a salad at a steakhouse. You tip the server even though you know he will use the money to buy wrongfully-produced meat.

If buying wrongfully-produced meat is wrong because it produces more wrongfully-produced meat, is it wrong to tip the server in the tipping case? Is it wrong to buy a vegetarian meal at the steakhouse in the first place? The steakhouse might well just take your money and use it to buy wrongfully-produced steak. These are questions for the moral claim about producing wrongdoing. There are further, familiar questions about whether it is wrong to produce wrongdoing when one neither intends to nor foresees it and whether it is wrong to produce wrongdoing when one does not intend it but does foresee it and then about whether what is wrong is producing wrongdoing or, rather, simply producing a bad effect (see entries on the doctrine of double effect and doing vs. allowing harm).

A quite different line of questioning is about the empirical claim that consumption produces production. We might just deny it and, instead, accepting that because the food system is so enormous, fed by so many consumers, and so stuffed with money, believe that our eating or buying typically has no effect on production, neither directly nor even, through influencing others, indirectly (Budolfson 2015; Nefsky 2018; and Fischer 2020 endorse this; Isaacs, et al. 2024 responds). The idea is that buying a burger at, say, McDonald’s produces no new death nor any different treatment of live animals. McDonald’s will produce the same amount of meat—and raise its animals in exactly the same way—regardless of whether one buys a burger there. Moreover, the idea goes, one should reasonably expect this. So even if the raising of cows for burgers is wrong, your buying or eating one from McDonald’s is not.

Barrett and Raskoff (2023) argue that in buying that burger, you objectionably freeride on the people who do not. A large enough group could effect change. By refusing to join that group, you wrongfully benefit from their labor. Maybe so. But, like the objection to which they are responding, Barrett and Raskoff assumes that large groups of consumers make changes to production. Even dispensing with that assumption, there is still an important issue about consumption. Consider the enslaved chef case, a modification of a case in McPherson 2015:

Alma runs a restaurant at which the chef is known to be held against his will. It’s a vanity project, and Alma will run the restaurant in the same manner--with the same meals produced in the same way--regardless of how many people come. In fact, Alma just burns the money that comes in. The enslaved chef is superb; the food is delicious.

The idea that it is wrong to consume if doing so produces wrongdoing does not imply it is wrong to buy food from or eat at the enslaved chef restaurant. If you go to this restaurant, you produce no wrongdoing. The same activities are going to happen regardless of what you do. So if patronizing this restaurant is wrong, a different idea needs to explain its wrongness.

So consider an idea according to which consumption of wrongful goods is wrong if and because it is a benefiting from wrongdoing (Barry & Wiens 2016). This idea can explain why it is wrong to eat at the enslaved chef restaurant: when you enjoy a delicious meal there, you benefit from the wrongful captivity of the chef. The idea issues an argument like this:

Moral vegetarians would then urge that meat is among the values of Q (and R). Unlike the first argument, which is more plausible with regard to buying than eating, this second argument is more plausible with regard to eating than buying. It’s the eating, typically, that produces the benefit and not the buying. Unlike the first type of argument, it does not seem to have any trouble explaining what is wrong with eating at the enslaved chef restaurant. Unlike the first type of argument, it doesn’t lead to the conclusion that tipping a server who then uses that money for wrongfully produced food is wrong—tipping is not benefiting from wrongdoing.

Like the first type of argument, the arguments that connect production to consumption through an idea about benefit hinge on an empirical claim and a moral claim. The empirical claim is that consuming something benefits from its production. The moral claim is that it is wrong to benefit from wrongdoing.

The notion of benefiting, however, is obscure. Imagine you go to the enslaved chef restaurant, have a repulsive meal, and become violently ill afterwards. Have you benefitted from wrongdoing? If not, this second type of argument cannot explain what is wrong with going to the restaurant. If, instead, you have benefitted from wrongdoing, it is hard to understand what is meant by that since the visit has left you sicker and poorer. (Don’t think an appeal to expected outcomes will help. If you go to the restaurant knowing the visit will make you sicker and poorer, what should we make of you?)

Also, put so plainly, the moral claim that it is wrong to benefit from wrongdoing seems clearly false. Consider the terror-love case, a modification of a case Barry & Wiens 2016 credits to Garrett Cullity:

A terrorist bomb grievously injures Bob and Cece. They attend a support group for victims, fall in love, and live happily ever after, leaving them significantly better off than they were before the attack.

Bob and Cece seem to benefit from wrongdoing but seem not to be doing anything wrong by being together.

One difference between the enslaved chef case and the terror love case is that Bob and Cece do not reward the terrorists for their wrongdoing whereas Alma’s patrons do reward her for her wrongdoing. An idea in the vegetarian literature is that consuming wrongfully-produced goods is wrong because it rewards wrongdoing. The idea issues an argument like this:

Consuming some product (Q) rewards production of some product (R).

Production of R is wrong.

It is wrong to reward wrongdoing. Hence,

Consuming Q is wrong.

Hereth 2016 discusses an argument like this. Cullity 2018 discusses some ethical issues about reward.

There are some questions to ask about arguments like this, but they are similar to questions asked about the next, more popular line of argument. One way to handle the difference between the terror love case and the enslaved chef case is to claim that whereas patrons of Alma’s restaurant participate in wrongdoing, Bob and Cece, by falling in love, do not. Generally, consuming wrongfully-produced goods is wrong because it cooperates with or participates in or, in Hursthouse’s phrase, is party to wrongdoing (2011). The idea issues an argument like this:

Moral vegetarians might then urge that meat is among the values of Q (and R). The idea seems to as easily cover buying as eating for each is plausibly a form of participating in wrongdoing. It has no trouble explaining why it is wrong to patronize the enslaved chef restaurant and does not imply it is wrong to tip a server who buys wrongfully-produced meat–doing so is not plausibly a way to participate in the server’s wrongdoing. Whether or not you get food poisoning at the enslaved chef restaurant has no moral importance to it–you participate in wrongdoing sick as well as well. It does not falsely imply that the Bob and Cece do wrong in benefiting from wrongdoing—after all, their failing in love is not a way of participating in wrongdoing.

Yet it is not entirely clear what it is to participate in wrongdoing as it is not entirely clear what it is to reward wrongdoing. It is not entirely clear when we participate in wrongdoing or when we reward it. There is a worry that these ideas–the idea about participating and the idea about reward–are not bridging the gap between production and consumption as much as drawing attention to it.

Consider the Jains who commit themselves to lives without himsa (violence) (Adamson & Ganeri 2016). Food production causes himsa. So Jains try to avoid eating those plants that must be uprooted to be eaten. They try to avoid drinking untreated water, filled with microorganisms, to minimize lives taken. Yet Jaina monastics are supported by Jaina laypersons. The monastic can’t boil his own water—that would be violent—but the water needs boiling, so he depends on a layperson to boil. He kills no animals but receives alms, including meat, from a layperson. Is the monastic participating in violence? Is he participating because he is complicit in this violence? Is he part of a group that together does wrong? When Darryl refuses to buy wrongfully-produced meat but does no political work with regard to ending its production is he party to the wrongful production? Does he participate in it or cooperate with its production? Is he a member of a group that does wrong? If so, what are the principles of group selection? Smiley 2022 canvases some possible answers.

As a matter of contingent fact, failing to protest meat production typically is not thought in contemporary US society to exhibit objectionable attitudes. Yet it might be that consuming certain foods insults or otherwise disrespects creatures involved in that food’s production. It might be it expresses a lax or supportive attitude towards that production. Hurka (2003) argues that virtue requires exhibiting the right attitude towards good or evil, and so if consuming exhibits an attitude towards production, it is plausible that eating wrongfully produced foods exhibits the wrong attitude towards them. R.M. Adams (2002) and Hill (1979) argue that some actions exhibit or otherwise express attitudes towards wrongdoing and that such exhibition is wrong. These ideas issue an argument like this:

Moral vegetarians would then urge that meat is among the values of Q (and R). An argument like this is discussed and criticized in Shahar 2021. It explains the wrongness of eating and buying various goods—both are ways of exhibiting attitudes. It has no trouble with the enslaved chef case, the tipping case, the food poisoning case, or the terror-love case. It does hinge on an empirical claim about exhibition—consuming certain products exhibits a certain attitude—and then a moral claim about the impermissibility of that exhibition. One might well wonder about both. One might well wonder why buying meat exhibits support for that enterprise but tipping someone who will buy that meat does not. One might well wonder whether eating wrongfully-produced meat in secret exhibits support and whether such an exhibition is wrong and, in turn, whether it’s the having that is really wrong or the exhibiting. One might well wonder about what is expressed by eating wrongfully-produced leftovers that will otherwise go to waste (Nefsky 2018) or dumpster diving (Singer and Mason 2006). Also, there are attitudes other than attitudes towards production to consider. Failing to offer meat to a guest might exhibit a failure of reverence (Fan 2010). In contemporary India, in light of the “meat murders” committed by Hindus against Muslims nominally for the latter group’s consumption of beef, refusing to eat meat might exhibit support for religious discrimination (Doniger 2017). In Atwood 2003, two characters dispute whether wearing fake leather expresses support for meat-eating.

The main ideas in this subsection are about producing wrongdoing, extracting benefits from wrongdoing, rewarding wrongdoing, participating in wrongdoing, and expressing a certain attitude towards wrongdoing. These ideas are not mutually exclusive. Someone might make use of a number of them. If the production of Chicken McNuggets is wrong, for example, and if consumption of them is thereby also wrong, it will plausibly be wrong for a variety of reasons. The explanation of why it is wrong to consume certain goods might be quite complex.

4.2 Against Bridging the Gap

We have been trying to explain why it is wrong to consume wrongfully-produced goods. Moral vegetarians typically agree that it is wrong to produce meat but then differ about the explanation of why it is wrong to consume it. Yet it could be that there is nothing to explain.

It could be that there is nothing wrong with meat production. According to views like those mentioned in §2.2.1 and §2.2.2, even factory farming might do nothing wrong to animals. Though he does not do it, there is a way of developing Setiya’s (2018) view so it has that consequence. That leaves open that factory farming is pro tanto wrong because of its effects on people and the environment, but perhaps it is all things considered justified by the cheap, yummy food it produces.

It could be there is nothing wrong with meat production because certain forms of it are, in fact, morally required: freerange farming, the idea goes, is a wonderful package deal for animals. They get good lives, but if it weren’t for the farming, they would not exist. Hare (1999) and Zangwill (2021) defend this. As noted in §2.2.2, Callicott (2015) defends the weaker idea that the bargain renders freerange farming permissible. As noted in §2.2.4, Tännsjö (2016) argues that factory farming is morally required.

It could be that certain modes of production are wrong yet consuming their products is permissible. We might assume that there’s only one way to build the bridge and then argue against that sort of building. We might, for example, assume that if consumption of certain goods is wrong, then that wrongness would have to be partly explained in terms of the wrongness of those goods’ production and then argue that there are no sound bridges from a requirement not to produce a food to a requirement not to consume it (Frey 1983; Bruckner 2020; Fischer 2020; Shahar 2021). Podgorski (2020) argues that if consuming is wrong only if it harms animals, then consuming even factory-farmed meat is permissible. The producers harm animals, sure, but the consumers do not. Views like these leave open the possibility that consumers might be required to do something—for example, work for political changes that end the wrongful system—but permitted to eat wrongfully-produced food. It could be, as a matter of tactics, that stopping wrongful production permits, even requires, people to sometimes eat wrongfully-produced meat. May and Kumar (2023) develop this idea.

As §4.1 discusses, skepticism about bridging the gap might derive from the idea that if eating meat is wrong, then so, too, are various other activities. Since the various others are permissible, then so is the meat-eating. For example, if it is wrong to eat meat because doing so produces more meat-production, then that seems to imply that activities like paying rent to meat-eaters or buying salad at a restaurant serving meat are morally wrong. They aren’t, so it isn’t. For another example, if it is wrong to eat meat because doing so benefits from wrongdoing, then that seems to imply that activities like falling in love as a result of terrorism or profiting from reading this entry (which, I assure you, was produced as a result of all sorts of wrongdoing) are morally wrong. They aren’t, so it isn’t. We can run similar arguments against the other attempts to bridge the gap.

Why stop at paying rent or buying salad or falling in love or reading this entry? If the wrongness of producing and wrongness of consuming are connected, what else is connected? If buying meat is wrong because it exhibits the wrong attitude towards animals, is it permissible to be friends with people who buy that meat—or does this, too, evince the wrong attitudes towards animals? If killing animals for food is wrong, is it permissible merely to abstain from consuming them or must one do more work to stop their killing? The implications of various arguments against consuming animals and animal products might be far-reaching. Some will see this as an acknowledgment that something is wrong with moral vegetarian arguments (Mills 2019). As Gruen and Jones (2015) note, the lifestyle some such arguments point to might not be enactable by creatures like us. Yet they see this not as grounds for rejection of the argument but, rather, as acknowledgment that the argument sets out an aspiration that we can orient ourselves towards (Shotwell 2016; Halteman 2024).

A different sort of argument against bridge-building comes from the idea that eating and buying animals actually makes for a great cultural or gustatory good (Lomasky 2013). Even if we accept that the production of those animals is wrong, all things considered wrong, and even if we accept that that builds a pro tanto case against consuming them, it could be that the great good of consuming them justifies doing so. It could be, relatedly, that the bad of refusing to consume justifies some consumption as in a case in which a host has labored over immorally-produced chicken for hours and your refusing to eat it would devastate him. Yet this seems to leave open the possibility that all sorts of awful practices might be permissible because they are essential parts of great cultural goods. It threatens to permit too much. Casal 2003, Kim 2015, and Holland & Linch 2017 discuss the cultural importance of meat and the moral importance of its cultural role.

5. Extending Moral Vegetarian Arguments: Animal Products and Plants

Moral veganism accepts moral vegetarianism, that is, it accepts that consuming meat is wrong, and adds that consuming animal products is wrong. Mere moral vegetarians deny this and add to moral vegetarianism that it is permissible to consume animal products. One question moral veganism poses to mere moral vegetarianism is whether consuming animal products is permissible. Moral veganism also raises a question about production: If it is wrong to produce meat on the grounds adduced in §2, what other foods are wrongfully produced? If it is wrong to hurt chickens for meat, isn’t it wrong to hurt them for eggs? If it is wrong to harm workers in the production of meat, isn’t it wrong to harm workers in the production of animal products? If it is wrong to produce huge quantities of methane for meat, isn’t it wrong to produce it for milk?

Various vegan diets raise their own moral questions: If it is wrong to hurt chickens for meat, isn’t it wrong to hurt mice and moles while harvesting crops? If it is wrong to harm workers in the production of meat, isn’t it wrong to harm workers in the production of tomatoes? If it is wrong to use huge quantities of water for meat, isn’t it wrong to use huge quantities of water for almonds?

5.1 Animal Products

As it might be that meat farming is wrong, it might be that animal product farming is wrong for similar reasons. These reasons stem from concerns about harms to humans, plants, animals, and the environment. This entry will attend mostly to the second, third, and fourth. Keller, Gray, and Harrison 2016 and Mares 2019 cover harms to workers on dairy farms.

5.1.1 Eggs

Like meat birds, egg layers on industrial farms are tightly confined, given on average a letter-sized page of space. Their beaks are seared off. They are given a cocktail of antibiotics. Males, useless as layers, are killed right away: crushed, dehydrated, starved, suffocated. As they age and their laying-rate slows, females are starved so as to force them to shed feathers and induce more laying. They are killed within a couple years (HSUS 2009; cf. Norwood & Lusk 2011: 113–127, which rates layer hen lives as not worth living).

Freerange egg farming ideally avoids much of this. Yet it still involves killing off young but spent hens and also baby roosters. It often involves painful, stressful trips to industrial slaughterhouses. So, as it is plausible that industrially and freerange farming chickens for meat makes them suffer, so too is it plausible that industrially and freerange farming them for eggs does. Killing raises only slightly more complex issues, but if the case against killing chickens for meat goes through, so, too, does the case for killing them on egg farms.

The threat to the environment, too, arises from industrial farming itself rather than whether it produces meat or eggs. Chickens produce greenhouse gas and waste regardless of whether they are farmed for meat or eggs. Land is deforested to grow food for them and resources are depleted to care for them regardless of whether they are farmed for meat or eggs.

In sum, arguments much like arguments against chicken production seem to apply as forcefully to egg production. Arguments from premises about harming the environment and killing and hurting chickens seem to apply to typical egg production as they do to typical chicken production.

5.1.2 Dairy

Like beef cattle, dairy cows on industrial farms are tightly confined and bereft of much stimulation. As dairy cows, however, they are routinely impregnated and then constantly milked. Their calves are taken from them. Males, useless as milkers, are typically turned to veal within a matter of months. Females live for maybe five years. (HSUS 2009; cf. Norwood & Lusk 2011: 145–150).

Freerange milk production does not avoid very much of this. Ideally, it involves less pain and suffering but it typically involves forced impregnation, separation of mother and calf, and an early death, typically in an industrial slaughterhouse. So far as arguments against raising cows for meat on the basis that doing so kills them and makes them suffer are plausible, so are analogous arguments against raising cows for dairy.

The threat to the environment is also similar regardless of whether cattle are raised for meat or milk. If arguments against raising cows for meat on the basis that doing so harms the environment are plausible, then so are similar arguments against raising cows for milk. Raising cows for meat and for milk produces greenhouse gas and waste; it deforests and depletes resources. In fact, to take just one example, because of methane emissions, the greenhouse-gas-based case against dairy is stronger than the greenhouse-gas-based case against poultry and pork (Hamerschlag 2011; Ritchie, et al. 2023 is also useful).

In sum, arguments much like arguments against beef production seem to apply as forcefully to dairy production. Arguments from premises about killing and hurting cattle and harming the environment seem to apply to typical dairy production as they do to typical beef production.

5.2 Plants

As it might be that some animal and animal product farming are wrong, it might be that some plant farming is wrong for similar reasons. These reasons stem from concerns about humans, plants, animals, and the environment. This entry will focus on the second, third, and fourth. CIW 2010 and Holmes 2013 cover harms to workers on plant farms.

5.2.1 Plants Themselves

Edwina drenches Fatima’s prized cactus in pesticides without permission. This is uncontroversially wrongful but only uncontroversial because the cactus is Fatima’s. If a cactus grows in Edwina’s yard and, purely for fun, she drenches it in pesticides, killing it, is that wrong? The orthodox answer is no, but there is an unorthodox but increasingly common objection about the treatment of plants according to which any killing of plants is at least pro tanto wrongful and that treating them as mere tools is too (Marder 2013; Stone 1972 and Goodpaster 1978 are earlier discussions and Tinker 2015 discusses much earlier discussions). One natural way to develop this thought is that it is wrong to treat plants this way simply because of the effects on plants themselves. An alternative is that it is wrong to treat the plants this way simply because of its effects on the biosphere. In both cases, we need not assume plants are sentient.

The objection raises an important issue about interests. Singer, following Porphyry and Bentham, believes that all and only sentient creatures have interests. The challenge that Marder, et al. raise is that plants, though not sentient, seem to do better or worse, to flourish or founder, because they seem to have interests in a certain amount of light, nutrients, and water. One way to interpret the position of Porphyry, et al. is that things are not as they seem here and, in fact, plants, lacking sentience, have no interests. This invites the question of why sentience is necessary for interests (Frey 1980 and 1983). Another way to interpret the position of Porphyry, et al. is that plants do have interests but they have no moral import. This invites the questions of when and why is it permissible to deprive plants of what they have interests in. Marder’s view is that plants have interests and that these interests carry significantly more moral weight than one might think. So, for example, as killing a dog for fun is wrong, so, too, is killing a dandelion. If killing a chicken for food we don’t need is wrong, so, too, is killing some carrots. Yoon (2011) worries that if eating that chicken is wrong, so, too, is eating the carrot.

If it is impermissible to kill plants to provide ourselves food we don’t need, how far does the restriction on killing extend: To bacteria? Pressed about this by Gary Francione, Marder is open-minded: “We should not reject the possibility of respecting communities of bacteria without analyzing the issue seriously” (2016: 179; cf. Sebo 2025).

5.2.2 Plant Production and Animals

Uncontroversially, plants are impressive (Schlanger 2024), but Marder’s view rests on a controversial interpretation of plant science and, in particular, on a controversial view that vegetal responses to stimuli—for example that “roots…are capable of altering their growth pattern in moving toward resource-rich soil or away from nearby roots of other members of the same species” (2016: 176)—suffice to show that plants have interests and are ends in themselves, and it is pro tanto wrong to kill them and treat them as tools.

Uncontroversially, much plant production does have various bad consequences for animals. Plant production in the US is largely large scale. Large-scale plant production involves—intentionally or otherwise—killing a great many sentient creatures. Animals are killed by tractors and pesticides. They are killed or left to die by loss of habitat (Davis 2003; Archer 2011). The scope of the killing is disputed in Lamey 2007 and Matheny 2003 but all agree it is vast.

The “intentionally or otherwise” is important to some. While these harms are foreseen consequences of farming, they are unintended. To some, that animals are harmed but not intentionally harmed in producing corn in Iowa helps to make those harms permissible (see entry on doctrine of double effect). Pigs farmed in Iowa, by contrast, are intentionally killed. Chickens and cows, too. (Are any intentionally hurt? Not typically. Farming is not sadistic.)

The scale is important, too. Davis (2003) and Archer (2011) argue that some forms of meat production kill fewer animals than plant production and, because of that, are preferable to plant production. Their idea is that if animal farming is wrong because it kills animals simply in the process of producing food we don’t need, then some forms of plant farming are wrong for the same reason. More weakly, if animal farming is wrong because it kills very large numbers of animals in the process of producing food we don’t need, then some forms of plant farming are wrong for the same reason.

An outstanding issue is whether these harms are necessary components of plant production or contingent. A further issue is how easy it would be to strip these harms off of plant production while still producing foods humans want to eat at prices they are willing and able to pay.

5.2.3 Plant Production and the Environment

A final objection to the permissibility of plant production: There are clearly environmental costs of plant production. Indeed, the environmental costs of plant farming are large: topsoil loss; erosion; deforestation; run-off; resource-depletion; greenhouse gas emissions. To take just the last two examples, Budolfson (2016: 169) estimates that broccoli produces more kilograms of CO₂ per thousand calories than pork and that almonds use two and a half times the water per thousand calories that chicken does.

If some forms of animal farming are wrong for those environmental reasons, presented in §2.2.3, then some forms of plant farming are wrong for those reasons (Budolfson 2018 and Bruckner forthcoming).

Again, an outstanding issue is whether these harms are necessary components of plant production or contingent. A further issue is how easy it would be to strip these harms off of plant production while still producing foods people want to eat at prices they are willing and able to pay.

5.3 Summary of Animal Product and Plant Subsections

Moral vegetarian arguments standardly oppose treating animals in various ways while raising them for food that we do not need to eat to survive. This standardly makes up part of the arguments that it is wrong to eat animals.

These arguments against meat production can be extended mutatis mutandis to animal product production. They can be extended, too, to some forms of plant production. This suggests:

One possibility is that the first premise is false and that some of the arguments are stronger than others.

Another possibility is that the first premise is true and all these arguments are equally strong. We would then have to choose between accepting the second premise—and thereby accepting the conclusion—or denying that meat production is wrong.

Another possibility is that the argument is sound but of limited scope, there being few if any alternatives in the industrialized West to industrialized plant, animal product, and meat production. The idea would be, sure, all these practices are at least pro tanto wrong, but it is all things considered permissible to produce some food.

A final possibility is that the parity of these arguments and evident unsoundness of an argument against industrial plant production show that the ideas behind those arguments are being misexpressed. Properly understood, they do not issue in a directive about the wrongness of this practice or that. Rather, properly understood, they just show that various practices are bad in various ways. If so, we can then ask: Which are worse? And in which ways? The literature typically ranks factory farming as worse for animals than industrial plant farming if only because the former requires the latter and produces various harms—the suffering of billions of chickens—that the latter does not. Or consider the debate in the literature about the relative harmfulness to animals of freerange farming and industrial plant farming. Which produces more animal death or more animal suffering? Ought we minimize that suffering? Or consider the relative harmfulness of freerange and industrial animal farming. Some argue that the former is worse for the environment but better for animals. If so, there is a not-easy question about which, if any, to go in for.

6. New Directions

One way to think about some ideas of the last section is that the road that gets you to moral vegetarianism goes much farther than that. Some interesting new work urges that the road doesn’t even quite get to moral vegetarianism.

This entry has omitted quite direct arguments against consuming meat, arguments that do not derive from premises about the wrongness of producing this or that. This leaves a hole. For even if it is wrong to eat wrongfully-produced food, mightn’t it be permissible to eat faultless roadkill (Koelle 2012; Bruckner 2015) or the corpse of an animal dead from natural causes (Foer 2009) or a lab creation (Pluhar 2010; Donaldson & Carter (eds.) 2016; Milburn 2016; Abrell 2024)? What sort of vegetarianism is that? Perhaps, as Fischer (2018 and 2020) urges, what seem like arguments for moral vegetarianism are best construed as arguments to eat “unusually.”

Lamey 2019 discusses this. Some traditional arguments in food ethics stand against it. Judeo-Islamic prohibitions on eating pork, for example, derive from the uncleanliness of the product rather than the manner of its production. Rastafari prohibitions on eating meat, for another example, derive in part from the view that meat consumption is unnatural. Historically, such prohibitions and justifications for them have not been limited to prohibitions on consuming meat. The Laws of Manu’s prohibition on onion-eating derives from what consuming onion will do to the consumer rather than the manner of onion-production (Doniger & Smith (trans.) 1991: 102). The Koran’s prohibition on alcohol-drinking derives from what consuming alcohol will do to the consumer rather than the manner of alcohol-production (5:90–91). As the introduction mentioned, Porphyry opposed meat-eating partly because it was pleasant and, hence, distracted the intellect. Whether the meat was wrongfully-produced was irrelevant to that argument.

Arguments like this, arguments against consumption that start from premises about intrinsic features of the consumed or about the consumed’s effects on consumers, largely do not appear in the contemporary philosophical literature. Somewhat more common these days are arguments according to which the wrongness of consumption and production are explained by a common feature. For example, it is wrong to eat something and to produce it because doing so exploits or treats an end-it-itself as a mere means (Diamond 1978 and Korsgaard 2018). Arguments like this do not have any more trouble explaining why it is wrong to eat roadkill than a factory-farmed chicken.

They might have some trouble with pets though. Korsgaard is admirably upfront about this. Pets--even the word might suggest something off about our relation with them--are a tricky issue for moral vegetarians. As discussed in §5, the moral vegetarian case against killing, hurting, or raising animals for food might well be extended to killing, hurting, or raising animals in other circumstances. Indeed, as Sebo (2025) urges, they might be extended to beings other than animals. But, just sticking to animals for now, what, if anything, might moral vegetarian arguments show about the ethical treatment of pets (Bok 2011; Overall (ed.) 2017; Palmer 2011; Milburn 2022)? Of zoo animals (Gruen 2011: Chapter 5; Gruen (ed.) 2014; Browning and Veit 2024)? Animals in shelters (Giroux, Pepper, and Voigt (eds.) 2023)? Laboratory animals (Gruen (ed.) 2014)? May moral vegetarians feed their dogs meat (Milburn 2022)? Would it make a difference if the meat were otherwise going to be wasted, were just byproduct of factory farms that produce McNuggets or Big Macs? Relatedly, moral vegetarians oppose chicken killing and consumption and yet some of them aid and abet domestic cats in killing billions of birds each year in the United States alone (Loss, et al. 2013; Pressler 2013). Is this permissible? If so, why (Cohen 2004; Milburn 2015; Sittler-Adamczewski 2016)?

What, if anything, do moral vegetarian arguments show about duties regarding wild animals? Palmer 2010 opens with two cases from 2007, one of which involved the accidental deaths of 10,000 wildebeest in Kenya, the other involving the mistreatment and death of 150 horses in England. As Palmer notes, it is plausible that we are required to care for and help domesticated animals—that’s why it is plausibly wrong to let horses under our care suffer—but permissible to let similar harms befall wild animals—that’s why it is plausibly permissible to let wildebeest suffer and die. And yet, Palmer continues, it is also plausible that animals with similar capacities—animals like horses and wildebeest—should be treated similarly. So was our toleration of 10,000 wildebeest deaths permissible? Or did we make a moral mistake in not intervening in such cases? McMahan 2015 and, especially, Faria 2022 argue that standard moral vegetarian arguments against killing and suffering lead (eventually) to the conclusion that we ought to reduce predation in the wild (and do quite a bit more); Korsgaard 2018 is more skeptical. Donaldson & Kymlicka 2011 use those standard arguments to get to conclusions about infrastructure and citizenship for animals. These discussions are partly about whether consumers need do more than not consume wrongfully-produced goods. Need they be pickier in how they spend their money than simply not buying meat, e.g., not going to restaurants that serve any meat? Need they protest or lobby? What forms of solidarity are called for and why? What would it even be to be in solidarity with a chicken? Cochrane and Cojocaru 2022 is squarely on these last few questions. Shelby 2005, Bommarito 2016, and Zhao 2019 all bear on them.

This entry has attended mostly to moral issues about animals, but recent work on consumption and food justice has paid a good deal of attention to people. Sexism, racism, classism, and ableism are unjust. Among the issues of food justice, then, are how, if at all, the practices of vegetarianism and omnivorism or encouragement of them are sexist (C. Adams 1990) or racist (Alkon & Agyeman (eds.) 2011) or classist (Guthman 2011) or ableist (Van Dyke 2018).

Industrial animal agriculture raises its own questions of justice: It degrades the environment—is this unjust to future generations who will inherit this degraded environment? Also, what makes it so environmentally harmful is the scale of it. That scale is driven, in part, by demand for meat among the increasingly affluent in developing countries (Herrero & Thornton 2013). Is refusing to meet that demand—after catering to wealthy Western palates for a long stretch—a form of classism or racism?

There are also questions of intergenerational justice having to do with the ethics of caregivers feeding kids meat or not (Fredericks and Fischer 2024). If it is typically wrong for Leon to eat the hot dog, it is typically wrong for young Leon Jr. to eat the hot dog. Is it morally permissible for Leon to cook a hot dog for Leon Jr.? Or to not intervene when Leon Jr. orders one at a baseball game?

7. Conclusion

Given length limits, this entry cannot convey the vastness of the moral vegetarian literature. Between the Species, Journal of Agricultural and Environmental Ethics, Journal of Animal Ethics, Environmental Ethics, and Food Ethics publish relevant articles yearly. Dozens of good articles and books have been omitted from discussion. Also, I have attended almost only to academic work and the arguments have come almost only from philosophy, but some of the best philosophical literature on moral vegetarianism is literature. Coetzee 1999, Kang 2016, and Tokarczuk 2019, for example, cover quite a bit of §2 and §4. There is excellent work in the popular press. There are poems and movies.

The moral vegetarian literature arguments mostly attends to according to which certain products are wrongfully produced and consumption of such products bears a certain relation to that wrongdoing and, ipso facto, is wrong. Moral vegetarians then argue that meat is such a product: It is typically wrongfully produced and consuming it typically bears a certain relation to that wrongdoing. This then leaves the moral vegetarian open to two sorts of objections: objections to the claims about production—is meat produced that way? Is such production wrongful?—and objections to the claims connecting consumption to production—is consuming meat related to wrongful production in the relevant way? Is being so related wrong? Explaining moral vegetarian answers to these questions was the work of §2 and §4.

There are further questions. If moral vegetarian arguments against meat-consumption are sound, then are arguments against animal product consumption also sound? Might dairy, eggs, and honey be wrongfully produced as moral vegetarians argue meat is? Might consuming them wrongfully relate the consumer to that production? Explaining the case for “yes, yes, and yes” was some of the work of §5.

Relatedly, some plants, fruit, and nuts might be wrongfully produced. Some tomatoes are picked by workers working in conditions just short of slavery (Bowe 2007); industrial production of apples sucks up much water (Budolfson 2016) and destroys animal habitat; industrial production of corn crushes numerous small animals to death (Davis 2003). Are these foods wrongfully produced? Might consuming them wrongfully relate the consumer to that production? Explaining the case for “yes and yes” was some of the work of §5. While the entry mostly attended to birds and land mammals, §3 applied some of its ideas to sea creatures and insects. As Crary and Gruen note, “abstaining from the products of industrial animal agriculture...does not release us from entanglements in the global web of practices in which human beings harm and kill other animals” (2022: 139). As stressed in §6, the web binds us to people, too, and all sorts of animals we don’t and would not dream of eating.

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Acknowledgments

Surveys of the moral vegetarian literature are common. I have greatly benefited from reading, among others, Engel 2015, Fischer 2018, McPherson 2018, and S. Rachels 2011.

I have benefited, too, from helpful comments, criticisms, and suggestions. For them, I thank an anonymous referee, Lena Ashooh, Anne Barnhill, Selim Berker, Mark Budolfson, Terence Cuneo, Bob Fischer, Rachelle Gould, Matthew C. Halteman, Elizabeth Harman, Oscar Horta, James John, Robert C. Jones, Jeff McMahan, members of the Vermont Ethics Group, Kate Nolfi, Clare Palmer, L.A. Paul, Tina Rulli, Jeff Sebo, Peter Singer, William O. Stephens, Sarah Stroud, Mark Timmons, Kenny Torrella, Amy Trubek, Alisha Utter, and Daniel Vallstrom.

Some material in this entry started life in Barnhill & Doggett 2017a and 2017b.