Theodicies

First published Thu Aug 8, 2024

Stemming from theos (God) and dike (justice), a theodicy is an attempt to show how the justice, goodness and other features of God can be upheld in light of the evils in our world. As such, theodicies suggest reasons for which God would cause or allow the suffering, premature death, loss, and harm we experience and observe, including genocides, illnesses, persistent pain, grief, natural disasters, and assaults.

Instances of suffering that seem to many people to be pointless (that is, which seem as if there could be no God-justifying reason for permitting them to occur), as well as the general facts about evil in our world—including its vast amount, its uneven distribution, and the intensity of suffering in truly horrid cases—pose a powerful theoretical challenge to a theistic worldview. The divine attributes of omnipotence, omniscience, and perfect goodness, in particular, seem to indicate that there would not be any pointless evils in the world, and they also seem to indicate that the facts of evil would not be what they are. (For discussion of relevant arguments from evil, see Rowe 1979, 1996; van Inwagen 2006; Oppy 2013; Speak 2015; Ekstrom 2021.)

Providing an explanation of the reasons that justify God in permitting the instances of evil in our world would enable the theodicist to counter the claim that there are evils in the world for which there is no God-justifying reason and so to block an influential argument from pointless evils for atheism. And articulating God’s reasons for causing or allowing the facts of evil in our world would empower the theodicist to counter the claim that, if God were to exist, then the facts about evil in our world would not be what they are and, thus, to block an argument from the facts about evil against the existence of God.

The remaining sections describe a wide variety of lines of theodicy available in the literature on the problem of evil.

1. Relationship Building

One line of theodicy emphasizes the good of relationship building. On this theodicy, God allows suffering so that we can become closer to and bond with other created beings. When we experience loss, physical pain, illness, and injury, we tend to become more aware of our shared humanity and, as well, our shared sentience with non-human animals who also experience pain and difficulty. Through enduring a natural disaster with our neighbors, for instance, we may strengthen our sense of community. Suffering can bring us together, as when individuals assist each other in cooperative projects of rebuilding after a hurricane destroys a vast amount of property. Shared tragedy and disappointment serve to forge bonds between people: our relationships with others can be strengthened when together we endure similar hardships, such as a common medical diagnosis, when we offer each other understanding, and when we do what we can to help lighten each other’s burdens. We ourselves may feel closer to people who are attentive to us when we are ill or in grief, especially those who genuinely listen, demonstrate their care, and offer their authentic presence with us as we suffer. Highlights of one’s life may come in moments of feeling deeply understood by, and deeply understanding, another person, and various types of loss and pain can serve to make such empathetic connection possible. Some non-human animals, too, show capacities for empathy and care, as well as efforts to help one another.

In short, on this line of theodicy, God permits pain and evils of other kinds in virtue of their conduciveness to building and strengthening interpersonal bonds and social relationships. Eleonore Stump’s work on the problem of evil highlights this theme, suggesting that “suffering can be redeemed for the sufferer in personal relationship” (2010: xix). Collins (2013) develops a “connection-building” theodicy in this vein, which emphasizes, in particular, the positive value of connections among persons generated by virtuous responses to evil, including sacrificially aiding another in time of suffering, helping another out of moral and spiritual darkness, and forgiving and being forgiven. In part due to the postulation that some such connections will last forever as an ongoing part of the conscious experience of the participants in them, Collins suggests that it is plausible to hold that the positive value of connections formed through such virtuous responses to evil “outweigh both the finite evils of this life along with any negative connections formed by unvirtuous actions” (such as the connections between rapists and victims) (Collins 2013: 223).

In order for the good of relationship building plausibly to serve as a justifying reason for God to cause or permit cases of suffering we observe in the world, the relationship building theodicist will need to defend the contention that the strength and goodness of relationships developed by the suffering in question not only was worth it as an outweighing good but also was a good for which the suffering was logically necessary. That is, the relationship building theodicy will be plausible only for covering cases in which the good of relational closeness could not have been brought about in any other or better way. If Sarah could have become just as positively bonded with and close to her friend José, for instance, by sharing a love of classical music as she did by sharing the experience of trigeminal neuralgia with him, then the suffering and disability they each endure from trigeminal neuralgia cannot be justified by its being necessary for bringing about the good of their close friendship. Likewise, if neighbors could have strengthened their sense of community by way of a joyful block party just as well as by rebuilding after a tornado, then the shared suffering from the natural disaster cannot be justified by its being necessary for bringing about strengthened community.

Clearly not everyone becomes closer to others through suffering. Some individuals become isolated, bitter, and mistrusting, more distant from others as a result of the ways in which they have suffered, and understandably so, since suffering is often at the hands of other people. A relationship building theodicy thus seems best defended as proposing the good of offering opportunities for developing positive closeness to other persons or non-human animals, opportunities which may or may not be freely taken. The relationship building theodicy also faces the problem of being limited in scope, leaving out swaths of cases including infants and toddlers who die prematurely, a vast amount of non-human animal suffering, and cases in which illnesses, such as neurodegenerative diseases, destroy persons’ capacities for relationship. Thus the relationship building theodicy needs supplementation by other lines of theodicy such as those considered in subsequent sections.

2. Divine Intimacy Theodicy

A related line of theodicy also focuses on the good of building interpersonal closeness, but rather than focusing on relationships among created beings, it emphasizes human relationships with God. On a “divine intimacy theodicy” (Ekstrom 2004, 2013; Harris 2016), occasions of enduring tragedy, loss, and pain can provide routes to knowing God, such that God is experienced in the midst of suffering itself. This line of theodicy is suggested to an extent in the work of Marilyn Adams and Eleonore Stump, as well as in the writings of many mystics (Adams 1986, 1989, 1999; Stump 1985, 1994, 1999, 2010). Collins’s connection-building theodicy also incorporates relationships between human beings and spirituals beings, including angels and God. See also Wolterstorff 1988. For critique of the ways in which Stump, in particular, develops her theodicy, which differs in some respects from others described in this section, see Fales 2013.

The core idea of the divine intimacy theodicy is that, through suffering, we may become closer to God, experiencing God’s loving presence with us as we suffer, and perhaps even sharing in God’s own suffering (if God can suffer); and in our tragedies and pain, we may gain acquaintance with God and rely more deeply on God, allowing us to build intimacy of a spiritual kind with God. Suffering itself may enable a fuller awareness of God’s existence and God’s love for us. We find reports of visions of God, as well as experiences of divine comfort in the midst of suffering, in the writings of many religious thinkers: Simone Weil, for example, describes experiences of being in pain when she felt that God came down and took possession of her, so that she sensed in her suffering the presence of divine love (Weil 1950 [1951]). Julian of Norwich reports a divine vision while suffering a severe illness for which she had received last rites (c. 1400 [1984: 66]) and recounts that, in her suffering, she perceived God, sensing that God sheltered and surrounded her with love (c. 1400 [1993: 88]). Many others have likewise reported a divine vision or a sense of God’s presence in their distress, including Job, who, while suffering tremendous losses, says to God, “My ears had heard of you but now my eyes have seen you” (Job 42:5, NIV Bible). Nicholas Wolterstorff writes about a period of grappling with the question of why God would have allowed his young adult son to have fallen to his death in the prime of his life: “Through the prism of my tears”, he reports, “I have seen a suffering God” (1987: 80–81).

The suggestion of the divine intimacy theodicy, in sum, is that God allows us to suffer because this permits us to share in the experience of God and enables us to experience God’s presence and love in vivid ways, thereby developing closeness between the sufferer and God. Suffering thus could contribute positively to an individual’s relationship with God. While some religious thinkers reject the idea that God suffers, since they view impassibility as an implication of God’s immutability, a theist in the Christian tradition might see experiences in which he endures suffering as opportunities for identification with the person of Jesus Christ, providing deeper appreciation of his betrayal, sacrifice, and crucifixion. Marilyn Adams (1999) suggests that even horrendous instances of suffering might become meaningful by way of being woven into one’s relationship with God through identification with Christ, understood either as sympathetic identification (in which each person suffers his own pain, fostering empathy for, and understanding of, Christ) or as mystical identification (in which the human sufferer literally experiences a share of Christ’s suffering). Michael Harris argues that the divine intimacy theodicy is worthy of consideration as part of a traditional Jewish theological approach to the problem of suffering (Harris 2016).

An objection to the divine intimacy theodicy is this: it is common while suffering not to have a sense of closeness to God, but instead to experience confusion, alienation, and anger. In fact, suffering, especially prolonged and intense suffering, witnessed or experienced, can be accompanied by a strong impression that God does not exist. When devastated by loss, some of us may well feel utterly alone and not in fact feel comforted by a perfect being who supposedly permitted us to suffer as we do, in order for us to become closer to God. The divine intimacy theodicist might reply that, from the fact that some people reject God through suffering and do not feel God’s loving presence, it does not follow that occasions of suffering do not provide opportunities for intimacy with God; but a divine intimacy theodicist who wants to accommodate such cases by holding that the sufferer freely failed to take advantage of the opportunity (so that the non-achievement of the greater good is not God’s fault), would seem to need to add to this theodicy a defense of the existence and positive value of free will.

A second critical point is that intimacy with God is not available to every being who suffers and so it seems that the divine intimacy theodicy can provide at most a partial justificatory account. Problem cases include the pain of non-human animals and the suffering of infants and very young children, some born into deep poverty and deprivation, some with debilitating illnesses, some who die slow painful deaths through starvation, and some who are horrifically mistreated. Additionally, even if, in such cases, the sufferers were capable of intimacy with God, it is challenging to uphold the perfections of God alongside the contention that such experiences are logically necessary for the individuals who suffer to be close to God. A critic might wonder why a perfect being would not bring about the desired end in better ways or create beings who are full of a joyful, loving direct acquaintance with God, living in union with God, without their enduring tortures and pain.

3. Contrast and Appreciation Theodicies

On a contrast line of theodicy, the central suggestion is that, without evil, including suffering and wrongdoing, there could not be good. The proposal is that good and evil must both exist; one of them could not exist if the other did not exist to be a contrast to it. The proponent might draw an analogy to light and darkness, or to mountains and valleys, or to large and small. The reason God permits evils to exist, on this theodicy, is that they are necessary for the existence of goods.

We should disentangle two different lines of thinking: one, a metaphysical line of thought and, the other, an epistemological one. The metaphysical line asserts that good and evil must both exist if either one of them does. One cannot be real if the other is not real. Problems for a “necessity of contrast” theodicy include the point that it is inconsistent with traditional theism. Many theists believe in heaven, a place or a type of existence in which there is only goodness, joy, and peace, with no anguish or discord. It seems clear that heaven can exist even if there is no hell (not all believers in heaven believe in hell), and it seems clear that heaven—a wholly good place or type of existence encompassing joy and awe in the presence of the pure goodness of God—can exist independently, even if there is no suffering in existence at all (or any longer). Similarly, if it is coherent to envision a place of pure harmony between human beings and other living things, including harmony between human beings and God, with no natural disasters, no illness, and no evil at all, such as in a Garden of Eden (prior to the fall of the serpent or Satan), then good can exist without evil. Likewise, billions of human beings say they believe in a perfect God who created the universe, and part of this view is the idea that God exists before the physical universe exists and that God exists independently of the created universe. God exists always or atemporally and would exist even if God had not created the physical universe in which we live. If this belief about God is correct or even coherent, then good can exist without evil.

Justin McBrayer works to make the necessity of contrast suggestion (which he calls the counterpart theodicy) more precise by distinguishing different ideas the proponent might be making: one, the existence of goodness requires that there exist some token of evil or other in the universe; two, necessarily, for every instantiation of good, there is a unique instantiation of evil; and three, necessarily, for every instantiation of some types of goods, there is an instantiation of evil. For reasons including those described above, among others, McBrayer argues that, on each of these interpretations, “the counterpart theodicy is a failure” (McBrayer 2013: 199).

A theodicist might turn instead to expressing a second line of thought—an epistemological one—which is connected but somewhat different: namely that, if we human beings did not ever suffer, then we would not appreciate the good aspects of life, such as health, kindness, friendship, and love. On this appreciation theodicy, it is not that evil must exist in order for good to exist, but rather that evil has to exist in order for us to appreciate goodness. An empirical observation in support of the appreciation line of thought is that we often do take for granted our health and our abilities to accomplish valuable tasks until we have suffered an illness or injury. If we recover, many of us tend to appreciate our physical functioning more richly than we did before. We may develop a greater sense of well-being or an energized feeling of having a new lease on life after going through a difficult time, and we appreciate the good in our lives more than we would have, if we had not gone through some period of pain or setback.

An objection to the appreciation theodicy is that it does not adequately answer the problem of why God would create beings who suffer. The theological problem remains unsolved because God, as an omnipotent and omniscient being, would appear to be able to create the universe and the living beings in it in any way God pleases. Such a being—one who is essentially perfectly powerful, perfectly good, and perfectly knowledgeable—could have made living beings who do not have the particular psychological tendency characterizing the human beings described above, namely the tendency not to fully appreciate good except when and after they suffer. God, instead, could just as well make beings who richly savor their health and well-being and who are filled with joy and appreciation for their loving relationships and abilities, without their having to become sick or injured or disabled at all. If human psychology is limited such that we human beings underappreciate goodness until we experience badness, then a perfect creator could simply create different beings, ones who are fully appreciative of goodness all the time.

Against the appreciation theodicy there is the additional point that, if contrast were needed for appreciation of, for instance, good health and full physical functioning, then a nightmare about losing one’s home in a natural disaster or a mildly bad dream about catching a virus would be better than there being real injuries, losses, and illnesses (van Inwagen 2006: 69); and atrocities on the scale of the genocides and pandemics that mark the history of our world are not necessary for appreciation of goods such as social cooperation, kindness, and human dignity.

4. Character Development or Soul Making Theodicy

A distinctive line of theodicy deriving from the thought of the early church father Ireneus (circa 130–202) and prominently advanced by philosopher and theologian John Hick (1978) is referred to as the “soul making” or “character building” theodicy. The central suggestion of this theodicy is that God chose to create us in a world that contains natural disasters, suffering, and wrongdoing in order to help us grow in character, so that we become better people, more godlike in character, through development over time. Hick suggests that, as our perfectly loving and good Creator, God wants us not to live in a hedonistic paradise in which our lives are always pleasant, but instead to develop courage, tenacity, generosity, patience, kindness, and other positive character traits through the process of dealing with trials and losses. The justifying reason for God’s creating us in a world containing pain, disappointments, and even horrific evils, then, is to offer us opportunities to choose to respond to them in ways that make us more virtuous, developing our characters or souls. If one were to see human beings as inherently self-centered and unfit to be in the presence of a holy God, then one might view the developmental process we undergo while responding to suffering on Earth as one that enables us to become fit to be in God’s presence, a process that facilitates our developing matured moral character so that we can enter heaven.

An accurate empirical observation relevant to the soul making theodicy is that many people do tend to improve their characters through enduring periods of suffering: they become more generous or compassionate, less selfish, and less concerned about superficial goods such as riches or fame. We human beings often do grow spiritually or morally when we endure difficulty: we may gain an expanded vision of the world, developing new empathy for people who suffer in wars, poverty, and natural disasters. Those who may have been mean-spirited or condescending toward others before becoming ill, injured, or experiencing some injustice do sometimes become leaders of positive movements for change and advocates for others’ rights.

A challenge for the character building theodicy is one akin to the objection posed to the appreciation theodicy: namely, it seems that, rather than requiring created beings to develop positive moral character traits over time in a danger-filled environment in which they are vulnerable to tragedies and loss, God could have, instead, chosen to create beings who are, from the start, good, loving, and morally mature. Consider the possibility that, if God desired to make beings with whom God could enjoy relationships of shared love and joy, God might have created us already “fit” to be in God’s presence, since there seems to be no logical requirement on the creation of rational beings that they must be, by nature, cruel or selfish, or ones who need to struggle through suffering and loss in order to develop positive character traits.

Hick responds to this objection by saying that, in his judgment, good character traits acquired in a temporally-extended process through responses to struggle and suffering are more valuable than are the good character traits which, in the hypothetical alternative, God could have given us instead: ones possessed not by way of moral development in a world filled with trauma and tragedy (Hick 1978: 256). There appears to be some tension between Hick’s claim that acquired virtues are better than other virtues and the view that God’s virtues are not acquired. Further work on assessing Hick’s value judgment would be welcome.

Another objection to the soul making theodicy is the observation that, although some individuals do become, for instance, more generous after experiencing poverty, or more perseverant through suffering chronic pain, many other individuals do not. Some who suffer simply become discouraged, angry, or despondent. Hick has a reply here, too, which is that his claim is not that every instance of suffering in fact produces character growth, but instead that a world like ours offers created beings opportunities to freely respond to setbacks and suffering by intentionally developing their characters in positive ways. If we become even more selfish, bitter, or indifferent through suffering of our own or witnessing that of others, that is not God’s fault but ours. This emphasis on the divine offer of opportunities for, rather than guarantees of, positive moral development highlights the reliance of Hick’s character building theodicy on the assertion that God gave created beings the ability to choose freely among available options regarding how to act, including the opportunity to respond badly.

One might continue to press an objection with respect to people who do not grow through suffering. Whereas Hick maintains that evil provides opportunities for freely chosen virtuous response, some examples in human experience clearly do not to provide any opportunity for character development to those who suffer, including those who die prematurely, such as young children and infants who suffer fatal diseases and die in accidents, and adults who pass away suddenly of strokes and heart attacks, leaving them no chance to grow in character (Puccetti 1967). Some kinds of traumas, too, are wholly devastating to those who undergo them, and it seems wrong to blame them by saying that their traumatic experiences gave them opportunities for virtuous character development of which they themselves failed to take advantage if it was not possible, physically or psychologically, for them to do so in their circumstances. A critic might raise, in addition, the severe and inhumane violence inflicted on human beings during the transatlantic slave trade, and on victims of the Holocaust, and on those who suffer unspeakable child abuse, arguing that it is simply not credible that God permits the occurrence of such horrors so that the victims have opportunities to positively develop their souls or characters.

The theodicist could respond to this objection, as Richard Swinburne (1998: 101) does (as part of his multi-faceted theodicy), by suggesting that the victims in such horrible cases as the transatlantic slave trade were given by God the good of being of use as the vehicle of a good purpose. This good purpose could be, for instance, providing other individuals with opportunities to freely respond in virtuous ways so as to improve their own characters. One might view this position as implausible, as Ekstrom (2021) argues, in virtue of its depicting God as violating appropriate moral constraints, such as respect for the inherent dignity and value of each individual person, particularly in instances in which “being of use” is non-voluntary. Arguably preserving the goodness of God requires that the suffering of victims be good for them, and the alleged good of being of use is not sufficiently good for the victims of such evils as genocides, slave trades, pandemics, and sexual abuse to provide a God-justifying reason for permitting their suffering. This requirement is known in the literature on the problem of evil as a victim-centered constraint on plausible theodicies and, while it is not agreed to by all theists, it strikes many as a reasonable moral judgment that applies to a perfectly good and loving God who created and cares for each of us (Stump 1985: 411–413). The critic could continue that, even if victim-centered constraints on theodicies were rejected, the character building theodicist should provide further defense of the suggestion that the good of opportunities for other people’s character development enabled by the suffering of victims outweighs the negative value of the victims’ suffering.

Even if, for some instances of suffering in our world, the justifying reason for which God permits them to occur is that they offer to victims opportunities for character improvement, still when we view the extent, range, and intensity of atrocities in our world, it does not seem plausible to think that all of them can be accounted for on such grounds. Like the other theodicies we have examined thus far, the character building theodicy needs supplementation by other lines of theodicy in order to account for the facts about evil in our world.

5. Punishment for Sin

Consider the predicament of Sisyphus, who toils in an endless cycle of rolling a giant boulder up a hill only for it, upon reaching the top, to roll back down again: his plight is depicted in Greek mythology as a matter of divine punishment for his sins of deceit and impiety. Many of us ask ourselves what we (or others) have done wrong to deserve to suffer as we (or they) do, showing implicit reliance on the idea that suffering comes our way as punishment. We see illustration of the punishment theodicy in the mouths of various companions in the book of Job, who urge Job to repent of his wrongdoing and plead to God for forgiveness. Their suggestion is that Job suffers as he does, with sores, anguish, and the destruction of his property and family, because he is at fault, illustrating the idea that those who suffer have done something wrong to deserve it and if they would repent, their suffering would cease.

The idea that some evil is penalty is offered as a theodicy prominently in the work of Augustine and Thomas Aquinas, who each suggest that some of the evils in our world constitute punishments for human sin. Augustine viewed evil not as an entity that has being in itself, although this does not mean that evil is illusory—people do suffer, and people do sin, he acknowledged. Rather, as Augustine conceived of it, evil is not a substance that makes up part of the universe (Confessions VII.12.18 [1977: 174]). Still, evil as a privation (or lack of goodness) exists: it exists as damage, degradation, or defect. The question remains: why would God permit anyone to be vulnerable to damage, degradation, or defect? On Augustine’s view, damage, degradation and defect originate in the world from the wrong use of the free will, a power given by God to finite created beings, including human beings, and all of humanity is guilty of sin and merits condemnation through the fall of humankind in the original sin of Adam and Eve in the Garden of Eden (De Civitate Dei 12.1–9 [1950: xiii, 14]). Aquinas calls privation of form and integrity in free creatures “evil of penalty”, because he, also, saw these privations as penalties resulting both from original sin and personal sin, and because the privations have a characteristic feature of punishment in being contrary to the will of the afflicted person. Privation of due operation performed voluntarily Aquinas calls “evil of fault” since he sees agents as being at fault for the defect in their free acts; and he views evil of fault as worse than evil of penalty (Aquinas, Summa Theologica 1.49.6).

Richard Swinburne (1998) suggests that punishment is one good that could justify God in permitting the suffering of human beings, though his approach to theodicy is multi-dimensional, broader than an appeal only to divine punishment. Swinburne holds that it is good that God provides human beings with deterrents to sin because they are weak and in need of encouragement to act in ways that are objectively good, which at the start may involve punishment for acting badly. He writes,

parents and other educators encourage good behavior by threats and rewards as a preliminary to children learning to do good for its own sake. And it would be good for God to do the same. (Swinburne 1998: 198)

Notice that here punishment is depicted more as something useful for moral conditioning than it is depicted as retribution that is deserved.

Some find a punishment line of theodicy attractive when holding in mind considerations of justice in relation to horrific actions of crime and violence, the thought being that God would rightfully punish wrongdoers in this life or the afterlife for the suffering they have inflicted on their victims. A bare punishment theodicy, though, is incomplete, since the theodicist needs to explain God’s justification for allowing not only suffering but also wrongdoing. Another problem is that we observe many cases of individuals who cannot, for all we can tell, deserve the suffering they endure: cases of inherited genetic diseases, for instance, childhood cancers, abusive injuries to children, and non-human animal suffering both in the wild and from human cruelty. In our knowledge of history and our observations of the world around us, we do not see justice in the quality or length of the lives of rational and sentient beings. Some compassionate, kind, and generous people suffer immensely and repeatedly. Many find the suggestion that some victims suffer involuntarily as punishment for the sins of others not compelling.

6. Free Will Theodicy

With respect to the question of the justification of pain, cruelty, and other evils in relation to God, it is important to acknowledge the significant role played in theistic thought by appeal to the power of human free choice. We have seen above that many of the theodicies on offer rely on it. One prominent way to defend the goodness and other perfections of God in response to the evils of the world is to point out that, after all, God did not bring about the Rwandan genocide or the Holocaust or someone’s sexual assault. Instead, these were caused by human actions, which the theist may suggest were freely chosen by perpetrators. On the free will theodicy, God remains an absolutely perfect being even in light of the suffering in the world, because it is created beings who freely choose to harm each other (and non-human animals and the environment), and none of this is God’s direct doing. What goes wrong in our world is not the fault of God but rather the fault of the wrongdoers who use their power of free will to act badly. The free will theodicist holds that it is a great good that God gave us free will and allows us direct the course of our lives by way our own free choices (Swinburne 1998). The result of the gift of free will to the billions of people on the planet is a whole lot of bad consequences from evil choices, which God is justified in allowing because of the greater good of the gift of free will.

Several problems face the line of thought that lays all the blame for the pain and suffering in the world on the bad free choices of created beings. One problem is this: even in cases of free actions that cause harm, if God is in control of the universe, then God at least allows the harm to be freely done to the victims by the perpetrators. God’s omnipotence indicates that God could have intervened to prevent a bad choice and could have intervened after the choice to prevent its most harmful consequences. God could cause someone who intends to rape to twist his ankle and fall to the ground, for instance, or to get violently ill, or faint, preventing the intended victim’s assault. In answer to the question of why God did not do that, there must be some good reason. Preserving the stability of natural laws is a good that is sometimes suggested here. (For relevant discussion see Swinburne 1998 and for a contrary view see Sterba 2019.)

Another problem for the free will theodicy is that not all cases of suffering are brought about intentionally by human free choices, such as damage in the wake of hurricanes and the ravages of inherited diseases. Bad medical outcomes in surgical cases, too, do not always result from malicious intent or professional negligence. When a tornado rips through a town destroying some homes and not others, no human being freely chose for certain houses rather than neighboring ones to be destroyed, and no human being freely brought about the tornado in the first place.

Another difficulty facing the free will theodicy is this: whereas some philosophers think that free will would be ruled out by the truth of causal determinism (the hypothesis that at each moment there is exactly one future, given the laws of nature and the events of the past), other free will theorists believe that we can act freely even if causal determinism is true. Arguably it is crucial that the free will appealed to by a free will theodicist must be indeterminist (libertarian) in nature. (For exploration of indeterminist accounts of free will, see Clarke 2003; Ekstrom 2000, 2019; Franklin 2018; Kane 1996; Mele 2006; O’Connor 2000.) The free will theodicist thus must maintain that all compatibilist accounts of the nature of free agency, including those provided by Frankfurt (1971), Watson (1975), Fischer (2012), Nelkin (2011), and Wolf (1990), among others, are implausible accounts. In citing the free will of created beings as the greater good that justifies God in permitting instances of evil or the facts about evil, the free will theodicist also needs to hold that causal determinism is, in fact, false and that we human beings do have libertarian free will. Without maintaining these positions, the free will theodicist lacks an explanation for the violence and cruelty in the world that shields God and preserves God’s goodness, since God could have established the initial conditions of the universe and decreed that deterministic natural laws govern all events, so that the events in the world unfolded to include none that are painful, harmful or wrong. God could have done this even in worlds in which he created free (in a compatibilist sense) rational beings.

Here is an additional problem for the theodicy according to which God’s allowance of suffering is due to God’s desire to create beings with libertarian free will and to allow creatures to carry out their evil intentions as well as their good ones: such morally significant libertarian free will (in Alvin Plantinga’s (1974) terms)—or what Swinburne (1998) calls serious free will, which is libertarian free will with respect to seriously good and seriously evil potential actions—must have immense positive value, in order for it to be sensible to think that a perfect being would decide to create beings with that power. The claim that such serious libertarian free will is worth it stands in need of convincing defense. (This issue is addressed in detail in Ekstrom 2021.) Notice that there is a difference between a proposed causal explanation of evil and a divine justification for allowing evil. If the causal explanation for a vast range of cases of evil in our world is human free will, then still, in order to serve as a God-justifying reason for permitting those evils, it has to be a very great outweighing good for God to create beings with serious morally significant free will and not to intervene to prevent the consequences of their wrong choices.

7. Appeal to the Afterlife

In attempting to identify goods that justify God in permitting the evils of the world, naturally theists might suggest that we should not be limited only to goods available to rational and sentient beings during their earthly lives. From a broader perspective that includes the history and future of the universe, the time each of us spends on Earth is rather brief, and the goods that justify God in permitting the evils we endure during our earthly life spans might well be goods that exist beyond that limited time frame. We have already considered appeal to the goods of empathetic and supportive connections with other rational and sentient beings, and loving relationship and growing intimacy with God; and a theist can suggest that these goods might well last into an afterlife. (Collins’ connection-building theodicy discussed in section 1 incorporates this idea, as do Marilyn Adams’ and Eleonore Stump’s suggestions discussed in section 2.) The plausibility of the claim that there is an afterlife depends in part on one’s views about the nature of existing sentient beings and one’s views about what God could do with respect to preserving personal identity through earthly death. One might grant that we do not know for certain that there is no afterlife and that it is logically possible that the lives of some or all rational and sentient creatures continue after their earthly deaths. On a number of religious traditions, there is an afterlife existence that involves eternal joy, freedom from pain and loss, rich and everlasting love, or glorious union with God.

What we suffer while on Earth is finite in duration. If after earthly death, individuals in heaven enjoy continued loving, blissful relationships with God and other persons for eternity, then the enormity and depth of the joy and love experienced in the afterlife would so far surpass in goodness what we have experienced during earthly life that our present experiences might be seen as pale and insignificant. The theodicist appealing to afterlife goods might suggest that our finitely endured earthly periods of suffering are simply overwhelmed or swamped by the magnificently great good of an infinite heavenly existence. We might call this view, following Stephen Maitzen (2009), a “Heaven Swamps Everything” theodicy.

One might fill in an afterlife theodicy in different ways. One might suggest, for instance, that in heaven a person will no longer care about what she endured on Earth, or it will seem trivial to her from the heavenly perspective; or one might contend that, in heaven, people will not complain about the disappointments and losses they experienced in the past, no matter how tragic they were at the time, and will accept them, given their state of eternal bliss in the presence of God. Or the suggestion could be that in heaven people will have forgotten about what they endured or that, although they recall their suffering, they forgive those who caused it. Or one might suggest that in the afterlife people will come to see their earthly pains as simply overwhelmed by the great goodness of heavenly existence, which serves as compensation for them. The afterlife theodicist could say that several of these ideas are true. The core point is that heavenly existence is such a surpassingly great good that earthly sufferings are, in the scope of things, insignificant, and all suffering is compensated for or somehow “defeated” or “redeemed” by God in an eternal heavenly experience after earthly death. Stephen T. Davis, for instance, writes,

People will be able to look back from the perspective of the kingdom of God and see that their past sufferings, no matter how severe, prolonged, or undeserved, have been overcome and no longer matter. (Davis 2001: 84)

Elsewhere, Davis suggests that

The Holocaust, like all other evils (so I believe), will be redeemed in the sense that some day it will no longer be a source of suffering (even in memory); it will fade away, pale into insignificance. (Davis 2004: 272)

Notice that the afterlife theodicist should not assert that, in light of heaven, our earthly pains are nothing; a right reply is that this statement is false, since the loss of one’s child to a devastating disease is not nothing, sexual assault is not nothing, and the endurance of persistent neuropathic pain over the span of decades is not nothing. These pains, losses, and assaults are real, and even if there is a blissful eternal afterlife, the individuals who endure the death of a child, sexual assault, and chronic pain while they live on earth do indeed experience devastating pain. The question remains: what justifies God in causing or allowing such experiences of suffering by people God loves? Clearly compensation is not justification (Maitzen 2009: 122). An abusive parent who later gives a child the gift of toys after a violent episode toward her does not provide any justification for what he did to her, and he does not thereby provide an explanation or an apology, but merely tries to somehow to make up for what he put her through. Being granted eternal bliss and union with God in an afterlife is obviously not akin to being given a token gift of toys. Still, if one person endures a brutal racist assault on earth and another does not, and both end up in heaven, it is fair to ask why God allowed the first to be assaulted but spared the second, and why God elects to create a universe in which brutal racist assaults take place at all.

We should notice, as well, that the doctrine of hell poses a complication for a theodicy that appeals to goods in the afterlife. Some have argued that the view according to which some persons suffer eternally in hell presents a particularly virulent argument from evil (Lewis 2007; Ekstrom 2021) In light of its reliance on an unobserved heavenly existence, the afterlife theodicy is also not particularly helpful in moving a non-theist to deny crucial premises in central arguments from evil.

8. Felix Culpa Theodicy

One line of theodicy available in Christian thought on the problem of evil is developed by Alvin Plantinga, who highlights God’s incarnation in taking on human form and atonement in dying by crucifixion as punishment for humanity’s sins (and subsequent rising from the dead). Plantinga suggests that God’s ultimate aim is to create a world of a certain level of value, which

requires that he aim to create a world in which there is incarnation and atonement—which, in turn, requires that there be sin and evil. (Plantinga 2004: 12)

With the title of the theodicy referring to happy fault or the fortunate or blessed fall of humanity into sin, Plantinga offers that “the Felix Culpa approach can perhaps provide us with a theodicy” (2004: 14). The suggestion is that wrongdoing and suffering in our world are justified by way of their being necessary for the immense good of salvation by way of divine incarnation and atonement (Plantinga 2004: 9).

It is interesting to weigh our intuitions: is it better to live in harmony with God and with other created beings for all eternity, and to love and be loved by God, with a kind of freedom that is not serious morally significant free will (harmony and love which Plantinga grants are possible without sin or the ability to sin [2004: 10–11]) or to live in a world with heinous evils, a fall of humankind into sin and disorder, and in which there is, by hypothesis, salvation by way of divine atonement? (Notice that it is atonement, and not incarnation, that requires freely chosen wrongdoing, by the very nature of atonement: there would be no need for atonement if there were not wrongdoing as a response to which atonement is called for.) Plantinga holds that the latter is better than the former. In support of the judgment, he not only emphasizes the good of divine atonement but also maintains that

creatures that have a great deal of power, including power to do both good and evil, are more valuable than creatures who are free, but whose power is limited or meager, (2004: 15)

which concurs with Swinburne (1998). He adds that,

by virtue of our fall and subsequent redemption, we can achieve a level of intimacy with God that can’t be achieved in any other way. (2004: 18)

So on the Felix Culpa theodicy, the final condition of human beings

is better than it is in the worlds in which there is no fall into sin but also no incarnation and redemption. (2004: 25, italics added)

The way Plantinga spells out that final condition is this:

they receive God’s thanks, enjoy a greater intimacy with him, are invited to join that charmed circle [of the Trinity], (2004: 25)

echoing themes in the divine intimacy and afterlife theodicies. Assessment of the plausibility of the Felix Culpa theodicy will depend on one’s evaluation of the key value claims highlighted in this section, in relation to the particular cases of evil, and the facts about evil, in our world.

9. Hybrid Theodicy

If each of the theodicies available in the literature remains limited in scope, the question remains of whether or not, collectively, they might successfully cover the general facts about evil in our world and each instance of evil in our world, so that no instance of evil is pointless. That is, a theist might offer a hybrid theodicy, proposing that God is justified in causing or allowing some cases of suffering as punishment for sin, while the justification for the permission of other cases is their offering opportunities for character development; and certain other instances provide chances for developing the sufferer’s relationship with God; and other instances of suffering are justified in virtue of providing opportunities to build positive human relationships; and other cases are justified in virtue of being necessary for a person’s admission to a heavenly afterlife or for a particularly wonderful quality of afterlife experience; and others are a result of serious morally significant libertarian free will and original sin which God is justified in creating and permitting for some great good, perhaps the intrinsic or extrinsic good of the power of serious morally significant free will itself, perhaps including its necessity for there being divine atonement. This strategy faces conceptual challenges noted in sections above, along with the difficulty of accounting for instances of evil for which there simply seems to be no point. Some individuals endure suffering throughout their lifetimes, including infants born with incurable diseases whose lives are painful and cut short, and others who spend decades in daily intractable pain. Some suffer misfortune upon misfortune in the form of injuries, poor surgical outcomes, betrayals of trust, loneliness, poverty, injustice, and other losses that pile on. The horrendous suffering on the scale of the genocides, pandemics, wars, and abuse that mark our history, too, challenge the plausibility of a collective or hybrid theodicy. It is difficult to identify a convincing reason, or even set of reasons, that could justify a perfect God in causing or allowing the instances of evil, and the facts about evil, we observe in our world.

10. Anti-theodicy

Some philosophers and theologians have urged that the project of theodicy itself is defective in important respects, morally suspect or even wrong (Roth 2001, 2004; Surin 1986; Trakakis 2008, 2013). Crucially, theodicy should not deny the reality of evil or minimize its impact on victims. A defender of the project of theodicy might say that it is important for those who endorse a hypothesis facing recalcitrant data to explore auxiliary hypotheses that aim to account for that data in terms of the hypothesis in question. Still, it is important to notice that offering the proposed divine justifications for permitting suffering reviewed above, in certain contexts, can cause harm. For instance, it can add to the suffering of a person who lives with persistent pain, or someone who suffers a chronic illness, or a survivor of trauma, to be told by a religious leader, friend, or stranger that “God chose you for this painful experience” or “everything happens for a reason” or “in order to be unburdened from your pain, you need to forgive someone”. Certain theodicies suggest that sufferers are to blame for their own suffering—such as the punishment theodicy—while others encourage us to look for other people to blame—such as the free will theodicy, in its focus on human wrongdoing—and others imply that those who suffer do not have sufficiently virtuous character traits and so are being refined in moral character or offered chances to improve themselves as they suffer—such as the character development theodicy. The suggestion that victims suffer so that other people may develop into more empathetic or helpful people, or in order to realize greater communal heavenly joy, does not explain how God could be treating victims themselves with dignity and respect and not only using them as means to an end. When we critically assess those who are in poverty or incurable pain as at fault, judging that they must be acting wrongly or else God would not permit them to suffer, we take a position of morally superiority with respect to them, which can be cruel; and when we fail to hold in mind that all of us are, at any moment, susceptible to diseases, accidents, and disabling injuries, we lack humility and an appropriate sense of commonality. As we suffer ourselves, and as we live in a world filled with human and non-human animal suffering on a vast scale, care seems to be called for regarding how we justify pain, distress, and tragedy in relation to God.

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