Syrianus

First published Mon Jul 6, 2009; substantive revision Tue Oct 21, 2025

Syrianus of Alexandria was a Neoplatonist philosopher active mainly in Athens between the late 4th and early 5th century, C.E. He was the second head of the Neoplatonic Academy of Athens, one of the two chief philosophical schools in the Mediterranean landscape of the 5th–6th century, C.E., along with that of Alexandria. Among several other works now for the most part unfortunately lost, Syrianus authored a commentary on books Beta (III), Gamma (IV), Mu (XIII) and Nu (XIV) of Aristotle’s Metaphysics, one of the very few extant ancient commentaries on this work. An influential teacher of philosophy and rhetoric, Syrianus established on several philosophical issues the standard view of late ancient Athenian Platonism. His teachings were built upon, expanded and systematized by Proclus (412–485), his most distinguished pupil and successor as leader of the Academy. Especially through Proclus, they exerted a major influence on later philosophy.

1. Life and works

1.1 Life

1.1.1 Main Biographical Data

Our limited knowledge of Syrianus’ life stems from three main ancient sources: Marinus of Neapolis’ Proclus or on Happiness, a commemorative speech of Proclus, mostly known under the inauthentic title of Life of Proclus (cf. Saffrey-Segonds 2001), written by his successor scholarch; Damascius’ Life of Isidore, both a biography of Damascius’ master and a sort of general history of 5th century Neoplatonist philosophers, also known as The Philosophical History (cf. Athanassiadi 1999); and the article Syrianos in the ancient lexicon Souda (Σ 1662, IV 478.21–479.8 Adler).

The son of an otherwise unknown Philoxenus (cf. Martindale 1980: 878, 1325), Syrianus was born in Alexandria (cf. Damascius, Life of Isidore, fr. 34D, 112.8 Athanassiadi [A.] = Souda Σ 1662, IV 479.6 Adler), most likely in the second half of the 4th century, C.E. This was a tumultuous era for his native city and the wider Roman Empire. Alexandria, long celebrated as a major cultural and commercial hub (cf. e.g. Diodorus Siculus, XVII.52.5; tr. Oldfather: “the first city of the civilized world”; Ammianus Marcellinus XXII.16.7; tr. Rolfe: “the crown of all cities”), became increasingly burdened by strife between its pagan elite and a notoriously quarrelsome Christian populace. This resulted, among other things, in the murder at Christian hands of the philosopher and mathematician Hypatia (c. 355–415). More broadly, the Empire was undergoing profound political and religious shifts: the Gothic victory at Adrianople (378) shook its foundations, and Christianity became the state religion under Theodosius I, who reigned from 379 to 395, leading to intensified suppression of both Christian heresies and pagan practices.

In this context Syrianus probably received a basic education in rhetoric and philosophy in Alexandria. Then he moved to Athens (we do not know exactly when) to pursue philosophical studies under Plutarch of Athens (c. 350–432), a highly respected Platonist philosopher, commentator, and teacher, also known as “the Great” (cf. e.g. Marinus, Proclus, §12.2, p. 14 Saffrey-Segonds [S.-S.]; the epithet is also attested for Syrianus himself, cf. Luna 2016: 679). Unfortunately, all his works are lost, apart from a few fragments (cf. Taormina 1989, Longo 2010, and Luna-Segonds 2012). Plutarch was responsible for re-establishing the Platonic Academy in Athens, with major consequences for late Neoplatonism. The Academy became, along with the school of Alexandria, the chief philosophical school in the Mediterranean landscape of the 5th–6th century, C.E., until its abrupt closure by Justinian’s edict of 529 C.E., which prohibited teaching “to those who are sick with the sacrilegious madness of the Hellenes” (Codex Iustinianus I 11.10 §2 Krüger; cf. Cameron 1969; Wildberg 2005). It had no institutional continuity with Plato’s original Academy, which ceased to function long before, in the 1st century B.C.E., at the time of the first Mithridatic War and Sulla’s siege of Athens of 86 B.C.E. Rather, it was a kind of private foundation based in Plutarch’s own house and professing doctrinal and spiritual continuity with Plato’s own school. Located at the south slope of the Acropolis, close to the temples of Asclepius and Dionysus (so not at the site now known as the original location of Plato’s Academy outside the ancient city’s walls), it served as both a teaching quarter and accommodation for masters and students (cf. Caruso 2013). Syrianus first lived and studied there as a close associate of Plutarch and with other students, including Hierocles of Alexandria, also destined to become a prominent Platonist philosopher. Upon Plutarch’s death in 432, Syrianus inherited the house and assumed leadership of the Academy, continuing its teaching tradition. In 430/1, Proclus (412–485) arrived in Athens to join the School, first as a student of Plutarch for about two years, then of Syrianus for about five. Syrianus quickly recognized Proclus as the ideal disciple and successor he had long sought. Thus, upon Syrianus’ death, probably in 437 (cf. Saffrey-Westerink 1968: XVI), Proclus, at only about twenty-six, became Syrianus’ scholarch successor and inherited Plutarch’s house. Concurrently, two other students of Syrianus, Domninus of Larissa, especially versed in mathematics, and Hermias of Alexandria, author of the only extant ancient commentary on Plato’s Phaedrus (see below §3.2.4), left Athens for their hometowns.

Syrianus was buried in a two-place vault on the slopes of Mount Lycabettus (eastern suburb of Athens), where he also arranged for Proclus to be interred (cf. Marinus, Proclus, §36.24–34, p. 42 S.-S.). Proclus’ epitaph for Syrianus, later added to the vault, eloquently testifies to their bond and shared intellectual purpose:

I, Proclus, a Lycian by birth, Syrianus
Here nurtured me to succeed him in his teaching;
The common tomb here received our two bodies:
May a single abode welcome our souls as well.
(Marinus, Proclus, §36.37–42, p. 43 S.–S.; cf. Gelzer 1966; there is also an epigraphic epigram on Syrianus, discovered in 2003 on a reused stone not far from the Lycabettus, cf. Agosti 2008).

Evidence suggests Syrianus, depicted by Damascius as a strikingly handsome and tall man with impressive intellectual powers (fr. 47.1–9, p.138 A.), may have been married and had a son, Alexander, to whom Syrianus’ commentary on Hermogenes of Tarsus’ On Types of Style (assuming Syrianus’ authorship of it, see below) is dedicated (the information finds some support in a Scholium on John Tzetzes’ Chiliades, mentioning “the son of Syrianus”, cf. Goulet 2016). Damascius mentions two other (unspecified) kinship relations: with the grammarian Ammonianus (Life of Isidore, fr. 47, p. 138 A.) and one Aedesia (fr. 56, p. 156 A.), praised as “the most beautiful and noble of the Alexandrian women” (fr. 56.23, p. 156 A.; tr. A.). Syrianus would have liked to betroth Aedesia to Proclus. But the latter remained a bachelor, and she married Hermias of Alexandria instead.

1.1.2 Teaching activity

Syrianus led the Academy for five years (432–7), instructing distinguished students such as the aforementioned Domninus and Hermias. His most illustrious pupil, however, was Proclus, whose commentaries and systematic works profoundly shaped later philosophy. The bond between Proclus and Syrianus was exceptionally strong, mirroring that between Syrianus and Plutarch. Syrianus recognized Proclus as the sole heir capable of advancing his and Plutarch’s philosophical legacy (cf. Marinus, Proclus § 12.31–6, p. 15 S.–S.). Proclus, in turn, consistently referred to Syrianus with deep respect, as “our guide”, “our teacher” (cf. Luna-Segonds 2007: LXVI–LXVIII), and even “our father” (cf. e.g. Proclus, On Plato’s Parmenides [in Prm.] VII 1142.11, p. 15 Luna-Segonds [L.-S.]), and praised him extensively in his writings (cf. e.g. Platonic Theology [TP] I 1, p. 7.1–8 Saffrey–Westerink [S.-W.]; in Prm. I 617.21–618.13, pp. 1–2 L.-S.).

Syrianus’ teaching approach, consistent with the Imperial-age tendency, heavily emphasized the reading and exegesis of classical philosophical texts, particularly by Plato and Aristotle. He pursued this task with remarkable intensity. Marinus, in his account of Proclus’ education (cf. Proclus, §13, pp. 15–6 S.-S.), highlights Syrianus’ rigorous methodology: after Plutarch’s introductory lessons on works like Aristotle’s De anima and Plato’s Phaedo, Syrianus subjected Proclus to a far more demanding and systematic philosophical training. In under two years, they comprehensively studied almost the entire Aristotelian corpus, covering “Aristotle’s treatises on logic, ethics, politics, physics and … theological science” (i.e. metaphysics, see below §3.1), presumably in that order, confirmed by passages of Syrianus’ Metaphysics commentary (cf. 80.5–7 Kroll, where politics, however, is not mentioned).

This intensive study of Aristotle served as a propaedeutic for understanding the “higher mysteries” of Plato’s dialogues (read following the so-called “Iamblichus’ canon”, cf. Festugière 1966) and, ultimately, the Orphic Poems and Chaldaean Oracles. Building on the work of Neoplatonist predecessors like Porphyry and Iamblichus, Syrianus firmly integrated Aristotle into the philosophical curriculum, structuring it as an ascending intellectual and spiritual journey. Crucially, this did not imply that Syrianus believed their doctrines were in complete agreement.

1.2 Works

1.2.1 The surviving (non-fragmentary) works

Only the following two works of Syrianus have come down to us in a non-fragmentary form:

Commentary on Books III, IV, XIII, and XIV of Aristotle’s Metaphysics
Nature of the work. This is one of the very few extant ancient Greek commentaries on Aristotle’s Metaphysics, along with those of Alexander of Aphrodisias and of Asclepius of Tralles (overview: Luna 2003). Notably, it is one of only two written by a Neoplatonist (with Asclepius’, of which Syrianus’ and Alexander’s were the main sources, see below), and the only one that fields a sustained critical engagement with Aristotle. The commentary does not offer a unified and comprehensive interpretation of the Metaphysics. It covers only four books and presents itself as a collection of three separate essays of quite different character and purpose, respectively on Beta, Gamma, and Mu and Nu. The titles of these separate parts (regardless of whether they are Syrianus’ own) already mark the differences:

  • The first essay is entitled “Syrianus, the Son of Philoxenus, on the Problems raised in a verbal way in Book Beta of Aristotle’s Metaphysics, and deemed in need of arbitration”. It begins, unusually, with no introductory remarks, except a swift recapitulation of the subject matter of books I and II. Typically, Syrianus goes through the aporiae raised by Aristotle on the subject matter and methodology of “first philosophy”, one by one, and in each case explains briefly how he thinks these difficulties ought to be resolved, not how Aristotle (supposedly) resolves them in subsequent books of the Metaphysics.
  • The second, concise essay is entitled “A Course (ephodos) by Syrianus, the Son of Philoxenus, on Book Gamma of Aristotle’s Metaphysics”. Syrianus discusses the main topics of the book (the subject of first philosophy, being and its per se attributes, the Principles of Non-Contradiction and the Excluded Middle) but keeps his comments short because, as he says, of the “adequate explanations provided by the most industrious Alexander (of Aphrodisias)” (54.12–3 Kroll).
  • The third treatise is entitled “Investigations (episkepseis) by Syrianus, the Son of Philoxenus, into the Difficulties Aristotle Raises About Mathematics and Numbers in Books Mu and Nu of the Metaphysics”. This is a long defense of Platonism and Pythagoreanism against Aristotle’s criticism and is a most instructive part of Syrianus’ work.

The question arises whether Syrianus also commented on other books. The last lines of the extant text (cf. 195.10–3) suggest that he did not comment on Book I, since he states that the discussion of Aristotle’s criticisms of the Platonists and the Pythagoreans in Books XIII and XIV would allow one to answer those in Book I as well. So the commentary was intended to be selective. But this does not entail that what we have is complete. Asclepius gives two quotations from Syrianus concerning Book Z (cf. Asclepius, On Aristotle’s Metaphysics 433.9–436.6, 450.18–28 Hayduck), but these may have issued from an oral course and not from a commentary and are testimonies and not fragments (cf. Cardullo 1993; Luna 2001: 173–5).

History of the text and translations. The commentary is transmitted in 35 manuscripts. The source of the entire manuscript tradition is the Parisinus Coislinianus 161 (14th century). The editio princeps is H. Usener’s and appeared in 1870 in volume V of the Bekker edition of Aristotle’s works. A later edition, which remains standard, is due to W. Kroll, published in 1902 for the Commentaria in Aristotelem Graeca series (vol. VI 1). A new edition (with French translation and notes) is in preparation for the Collection des Universités de France (aka Collection Budé) by C. Luna, C. D’Ancona, and J.-P. Schneider. It promises to improve on the earlier editions in many respects, including as regards the citation of the Aristotelian lemmas, which Syrianus transcribes in full but both Usener and Kroll have shortened, citing only the beginning and end, and sometimes not even printing them as lemmas, but in spaced characters within the commentary, as if they were quotations (cf. Luna 2004 and 2007).

There are two translations: a Latin one (of books III, XIII and XIV only) by Gerolamo Bagolino (ca. end 15th cent. – † 1552), a Veronese physician and professor of philosophy in Padua and translator of works by Aristotle and some of his commentators. This translation was published in 1558 in Venice and based on a now lost manuscript. More recently, J. Dillon and D. O’Meara have produced a translation into English, published in two volumes, in 2006 (books XIII and XIV) and 2008 (books III and IV) for the Ancient Commentators on Aristotle series (this translation will be used, with modifications, in the rest of this entry). There may also have been an Arabic translation of the commentary on Book B, cf. Ibn al-Nadīm, Kitāb al-Fihrist, 251.30–252.1 Flügel = 312.17 Tajaddud.

Relationship with Alexander, Asclepius, and Ps.-Alexander. Alexander of Aphrodisias’ Metaphysics commentary is Syrianus’ main source for the literal exegesis of the Metaphysics books he comments on. Concetta Luna (2001: 72–9) has identified 51 quotations (17 explicit, 34 implicit) from Alexander in Syrianus’ commentary, suggesting that Syrianus had Alexander’s commentary at hand. This does not mean that Syrianus simply repeats Alexander. Indeed, the former’s commentary also has critical aims, aimed at defending Platonism, and is not limited to literal exegesis. Alexander and Syrianus together then constitute the main sources of Asclepius of Tralles’ commentary (cf. again Luna 2001: 99–186). Both Syrianus and Asclepius know Alexander’s commentary in its entirety. We instead read only that to the first five books. The commentary on books VI–XIV transmitted to us under Alexander’s name is actually spurious, thus standardly referred to as Ps.-Alexander. Now, the commentaries of Syrianus and Ps.-Alexander on Books XIII and XIV contain a number of common passages. This raises the question of their relationship. The traditional view, established by Praechter 1906, identifies Ps.-Alexander with Michael of Ephesus (12th cent.) and implies that Syrianus was the source of Ps.-Alexander. Contra, Tarán 1987 defended the inverse relationship and argued that Ps.-Alexander was an earlier author than Syrianus and his source. This position is refuted by Luna 2001, which confirms the traditional interpretation with new arguments.

Commentaries on Hermogenes of Tarsus’ On Types of Style and On Issues
Nature of the work and history of the text. These are commentaries on two popular rhetorical treatises by Hermogenes of Tarsus, a major rhetorician of the 2nd–3rd century, C.E. More particularly, the On Issues commentary divides up into two parts: a lemmatic commentary on chapters 1–11 of On Issues, and an independent non-lemmatic exposition of the fourteen Hermogenes’ “issues”. Both commentaries have been transmitted by two manuscripts, the Marcianus graecus 433 (M) and the Messanensis S. Salv. 118 (S) both from the 11th century. For the On Issues commentary, we should add a compilation of lemmatic scholia, preserved in the Parisinus graecus 2923 (P), also from the 11th century. According to the latest editor of the work (Patillon 2021) these scholia transmit a distinct work, a proto-commentary On Issues (for criticisms see Luna 2023). The editio princeps of Syrianus’ commentaries on On Types of Style and On Issues (without the scholia) is Rabe 1892, which remains standard for the On Types of Style commentary; that of the scholia is Walz 1832–6, vol. IV. For the On Issues commentary and the scholia the reference edition is now Patillon 2021 (on which cf. again Luna 2023).

Authorship. Syrianus is referenced as “sophistēs” (“rhethorician”) in the title of both commentaries, and the style of the latter seems quite different from that of the Metaphysics. It has therefore been doubted whether Syrianus the sophistēs was the same as Syrianus the philosophos (cf. recently Caluori 2012: 57–62). But the term “sophistēs” has no negative meaning in the commentaries on Hermogenes, where indeed rhetoric and philosophy are linked. References to and citations from philosophical works abound (Plato, minor Platonists, Aristotle), and there are no good reasons to doubt that this commentary was written by Syrianus the Neoplatonist (cf. Luna 2016: 702–3; Patillon 2021: XI–XII).

1.2.2 Other works

The problem of the Suda’s two lists. Apart from these commentaries, there is evidence for a much broader literary output. But it is not easy to determine exactly everything Syrianus wrote. The Suda (Σ 1662, IV 478.23–479.2 Adler) attributes to him: seven books of commentary on Homer; four on the Republic; two On the Theology of Orpheus; a treatise On the Homeric Gods; one On the Agreement between Orpheus, Pythagoras, and Plato with the Chaldean Oracles in ten books; and other unspecified exegetical works. This list is surely incomplete because it fails to mention any work on Aristotle. Further, the Suda attributes the same list of works, with minor differences, also to Proclus (cf. Π 2473, IV 210.8–13 Adler), posing a problem of attribution that has predictably divided scholars. Virtually all available interpretative options have been entertained, and no scholarly agreement has been reached: some believe that the real author is Proclus and the attribution to Syrianus is false (Zeller 1903: 820–4): others that the real author is Syrianus and the attribution to Proclus is false (Praechter 1926); others that the two may have written works with the same title (Sheppard 1980: 46); others that Proclus took up and revised works by Syrianus, notably on the Orphic Poems and On the Agreement between Orpheus, Pythagoras, and Plato with the Caldean Oracles (Saffrey 1992).

A reconstruction of Syrianus’ bibliography and his works survived in fragments. The reconstruction of the full list of Syrianus’ writings is therefore no easy task. On the other hand, Syrianus’ works, especially his commentaries, were greatly admired by later generations of Neoplatonists (Isidore and Damascius regarded him as one of the best exegetes), and he is therefore often referred to and quoted. Thanks also to the careful study of this external evidence, we can draw a list of works attributable to Syrianus with reasonable certainty (cf. Luna 2016: 686–702).

Commentaries on Aristotle (apart from the aforementioned Metaphysics commentary)

  • Organon (fragments collected by Cardullo 1995a):
    • Categories
    • De interpretatione
    • Prior Analytics
  • Works of natural philosophy (fragments collected by Cardullo 1995b):
    • Physics
    • De caelo
    • De anima

Commentaries on Plato

  • Phaedo (possibly a monograph on the argument on the contraries, cf. d’Hoine 2015)
  • Sophist
  • Statesman
  • Parmenides (fragments collected by Klitenic Wear 2011)
  • Philebus
  • Phaedrus (through Hermias’ commentary)
  • Republic
  • Timaeus (fragments collected by Klitenic Wear 2011)
  • Laws X

Commentaries on Theological Treatises

  • Orphic Poems
  • On the Agreement between Orpheus, Pythagoras, and Plato with the Chaldean Oracles

Commentaries on Homer

  • Solutions to the Homeric Problems
  • Monograph on the union of Zeus and Hera

2. Syrianus, the history of late Neoplatonism, and Aristotle

2.1 Syrianus’ place in Greek Neoplatonism

Syrianus was a pivotal figure in late ancient philosophy. He established standard philosophical views distinctive of the later Greek Neoplatonists, especially Athenian. He also considerably bolstered Aristotle’s position as their primary philosophical interlocutor (besides Plato) and a central authority in their educational curriculum. Furthermore, Syrianus was the unified root from which both the main late ancient philosophical schools, those of Athens and Alexandria, branched off.

The second scholarch (or ‘successor’, in the terminology of the School) of the refounded Academy, Syrianus advanced Plutarch’s project to renew Athenian Platonism after a stagnant phase in the 4th century. Plutarch pursued that project by drawing inspiration from Iamblichus’ legacy (cf. Praechter 1910; Saffrey-Westerink 1968: XXXV–XLVIII; Goulet 2012). He promoted a radical theological reading of the Parmenides (see below §3.2) and an in-depth comparison between Plato and Aristotle, recognizing the latter’s prominent role in the Neoplatonist educational path, as evidenced by his De anima commentary (cf. Luna-Segonds 2012: 1090–1091) and the start of his teaching of Proclus with the De anima and the Phaedo (cf. Marinus, Proclus §12.9–15, p. 15 S.-S.). Syrianus advanced Plutarch’s project with unprecedented rigor and breadth: (1) He fleshed out the theological interpretation of Plato’s Parmenides with remarkable sophistication, thereby spelling a new yardstick of Platonic exegesis. This interpretation, as we know of it especially from Proclus’ monumental commentary on the dialogue, became the backbone of subsequent Neoplatonist philosophical elaboration, making Syrianus a fundamental source for later Neoplatonist doctrines (cf. esp. Luna 2000a and D’Ancona 2000a). (2) He engaged with Aristotle’s works with novel meticulousness, acknowledging their decisive philosophical and pedagogical importance for Platonism (see below §2.2). He read with Proclus all Aristotle’s writings in under two years (see above §1.1). He studied the Peripatetic commentary tradition, notably on the Metaphysics, in greater depth, of course with special attention to its most authoritative representative, Alexander of Aphrodisias (cf. esp. Luna 2000b, 2001, and D’Ancona 2000b). More importantly, unlike Plutarch’s more conciliatory attitude, Syrianus approached Aristotelian texts, notably in his Metaphysics commentary, to show systematically the superiority of Platonism and its immunity from Aristotelian criticisms (particularly in Books XIII and XIV of the Metaphysics). This commentary stands as a crucial document for understanding the reception of Aristotle in late Neoplatonism (cf. again D’Ancona 2000b). Overall, we can say that Plutarch gave impetus to a fundamental project to renew Platonism; Syrianus advanced this project decisively and with unprecedented thoroughness and rigor; Proclus brought it to completion with unparalleled systematicity. With respect to this trajectory, Damascius can be seen as a critical and aporetic reflection on Proclus (cf. Opsomer 2014).

Syrianus also embodies the unified historical root from which both the Athenian and Alexandrian philosophical schools developed (cf. Frede 2009: 23–7). He directly ruled the Athenian school, before Proclus brought it to its peak. The Alexandrian school, on the other hand, received a major input from Ammonius, the son of Hermias, Syrianus’ direct pupil. After his master’s death, Hermias returned to his (and Syrianus’) hometown Alexandria and began teaching there. At the appropriate age, Ammonius himself was sent to study under Proclus in Athens, where he presumably absorbed further views ultimately rooted in Syrianus’ teachings. Upon his return to Alexandria, he took Hermias’ place following the latter’s untimely death, and trained major Alexandrian Neoplatonists, including Damascius, Simplicius, Asclepius, Olympiodorus, and Philoponus. Damascius and Simplicius would then later move to Athens until the school’s closure in 529 (Damascius was the last diadochus).

2.2 Syrianus’ attitude towards Aristotle

In a seminal 1910 study, Karl Praechter drew some fundamental distinctions between the Athenian and Alexandrian schools. Among these were contrary stances toward Aristotle: hostile for the Athenians, conciliatory for the Alexandrians. Syrianus’ Metaphysics commentary, with its combative and polemical tone (cf. Dillon-O’Meara 2006: 11–20), seems to give strong prima facie support to this picture. In this light, Syrianus appears as an uncompromising opponent of Aristotle, uniquely committed to attacking him and defending Plato, the custodian of philosophical truth, against his wayward pupil. Yet closer analysis reveals a more complex scenario. The interplay between the two schools was less clear-cut than Praechter allowed. Ties of discipleship and kinship complicate rigid divisions (cf. Hadot 1990). Without discounting Praechter’s influential reconstruction (cf. D’Ancona 2005), a more nuanced view is needed, including for Syrianus.

A staunch defender of Plato against Aristotle, Syrianus departs from the conciliatory Porphyrean-Iamblichean approach. Instead of stressing common ground, he attacks Aristotle’s anti-Platonist objections as ineffective and often dictated by misunderstandings, unable to rise beyond a physicalist perspective to an adequate understanding of the first principles of reality. Compared to the “divine” nature of Platonists and Pythagoreans, Aristotle’s is only “daimonic” (cf. e.g. On Aristotle’s Metaphysics [hereafter, references to Syrianus are to this work, except otherwise noted] 86.7, 115.25, 168.6, 192.16 Kroll; O’Meara 1989: 123).

Still, Syrianus’ stance is not purely polemical. As we have seen, he assigned Aristotle a major pedagogical role: his educational programme for Proclus began with the full Aristotelian corpus. This presupposed some shared philosophical framework – which did not prevent disagreements on specific issues (cf. Gerson 2005; Menn 2012: 45–6). the keynote programmatic declaration prefacing Syrianus’ commentary on Metaphysics XIII and XIV, first brought to scholarly attention by Saffrey (1987) and much studied since (cf. Longo 2001; Frede 2009; Helmig 2009; d’Hoine 2016; Golitsis 2018). There Syrianus calls for “judicious and impartial examination” of Aristotle’s misconceived and unjustified criticisms of Plato, while also declaring himself Aristotle’s disciple in logic, physics, and ethics, and even hailing him a “benefactor of humanity” (80.14), for the wealth of “apt remarks, accompanied by demonstrations of the highest quality” that he has set forth “in the excellent work” (80.9–10: en tēi teleōtatēi pragmateiai tautēi) that he thinks the Metaphysics is. The rhetorical pitch of this captatio benevolentiae is patent, but it would be unfair to dismiss it as insincere. Syrianus is a committed Platonist, but one who engages with Aristotle seriously. He prioritizes substantive argumentation over simple controversy, putting his finger on what he saw as tensions and weaknesses and arguing that their resolution required Platonism, above all, recognition of the One as the superessential first principle, which Aristotle denies (cf. 118.21–2): “For if this proposition is adequately established, it seems that Aristotle will be in agreement with all the genuine doctrines of Pythagoras and Plato” (141.13–5).

3. Metaphysics

3.1 Syrianus’ conception of metaphysics

The title Metaphysics (ta meta ta physika), unknown to Aristotle and attested since the 1st century BCE (cf. Brisson 1999: 44–50), appears in Syrianus only in the headings of his three-pronged Metaphysics commentary. He rather references the work as “theological treatise” (80.17: tēs theologikēs pragmateias; cf. Ammonius, On Aristotle’s De Interpretatione 27.32–33 Busse; Philoponus, On Aristotle’s On the Soul 518.36–519.1 Hayduck; Elias, Introduction to Philosophy 20.21–22 Busse; with Napoli 2012), a label based on Metaphysics VI 1 and germane, as we shall see, to Syrianus’ view of the object of metaphysics. Nowhere in Syrianus – or in ancient Greek literature generally (cf. Brisson 1999: 37–43) – does the substantivized adjective metaphysics (metaphysikē) occur. Yet clearly Syrianus conceives a distinct metaphysical science, which he calls indifferently “first philosophy”, “wisdom”, or “theological science”.

This emerges especially from Syrianus’ commentary on Metaphysics IV 1–2. There Syrianus endorses most of Aristotle’s pronouncements, including that there is a science of being qua being (as well as its per se accidents and the principles of demonstrations), and that this is primarily the science of substance (ousia), because being is said in many ways but substance is primary among them, as all other beings are said to be by reference to (pros) it. But while approving of the letter of Aristotle’s text, Syrianus twists its spirit, aligning first philosophy with dialectic as in Republic VI–VII, a move with a long afterlife (cf. Courtine 2005: 59).

3.1.1 Object

Syrianus accepts that being is said in many ways, but “by derivation from and reference to one thing” (55.1: aph’henos kai pros hen, cf. Aristotle, Nicomachean Ethics I 4.1096b27–8; Alexander of Aphrodisias, On Aristotle’s Metaphysics 241.3–5 Hayduck; more later), namely substance, from which all other things “receive being” (55.10). But he identifies ousia with Being itself (55.8: autoon), the monad of Being which Syrianus also identifies with the supreme genus of Being of Plato’s Sophist.

Against Aristotle’s denial of such a genus (cf. e.g. Topics IV 6.127a26–39; Sophistical Refutations 11.172a13–15; Posterior Analytics II 7.92b14; Metaphysics III 3.998b22–28; VIII 6.1045a36–b7; XI 1.1059b31–4), Syrianus argues (building on Peripatetic debates on specific difference and Alexander of Aphrodisias’ negative judgement about this argument, cf. his On Aristotle’s Metaphysics 206.12–207.6 Hayduck, 176.17–177.17 Golitsis) that the prohibition applies to being only as one of the “later-born” (hysterogenes) logical genera, i.e. universals posterior to and mentally abstracted from particulars (post rem), not to metaphysical genera, which are productive causes of what falls under them and form with it a series ordered according to priority and posteriority (cf. Granieri 2022: 230–5). Thus, Being itself, the monad and supreme genus of being, secures unity to both being and its science and bestows being in degrees (cf. 56.14; Proclus, in Prm. I 704.1–12, p. 117 L.-S., 704.1–9, p. 101 Steel et al.) to everything else, primarily on intelligible substances, the original articulation of Being itself, which is their unity (cf. 85.12–4). This leads Syrianus to interpret “being qua being” in two complementary ways: as Being itself, the monad or supreme genus of being from which all beings proceed; and as the substantial intelligible beings in which Being itself articulates (cf. Steel 2005: 7). That is why, in identifying the subject of first philosophy, Syrianus swings between these two referents: Being itself or intelligible Substance (cf. e.g. 55.8, 58.13–4: autoon, noētē ousia—both picking up to prōtōs on at 11.9–31) and primary beings or intelligible substances (cf. 57.23–4: ta prōtōs onta, ousiai) proceeding from it, “beings which by nature belong to themselves and exist by themselves” (56.6). In this framework, then, “being qua being” no longer refers, like in Aristotle, to every and any being, considered simply as being, but to an absolute or unqualified being, a being that is purely being, i.e. intelligible being. Aristotelian first philosophy thus becomes a theological science of divine essences, close to Platonic dialectic (cf. Verbeke 1981: 123; O’Meara 1986: 5–7; Steel 2005; Bonelli 2009; Van Campe 2009: 271–9; note that Proclus, On Euclid’s Elements 9.19–10.14 Friedlein claims dialectic to be the science of being qua being). Its primary object is being qua being, i.e. divine, intelligible, real beings proceeding from Being itself, and forming with it the second level of the metaphysical hierarchy, described by the second hypothesis of Plato’s Parmenides (see below).

3.1.2 Primacy

The existence and eminence of metaphysical science follows from those of its object: Being itself is being to the highest degree (malista on), and “the best of whatever is in any respect”, so it cannot remain unknown and is rather the object of the highest cognition (malista gnōsis) (cf. 54.20–55.16; cp. Metaphysics II.2.997b27–30, cited by Syrianus, and already Plato, Republic V. 477a3; and Philebus 59a7–c6). Yet while Aristotle thought that being and unity are the same and one in nature (cf. Metaphysics IV 2.1003b22–3), in Syrianus’ (distinctively Neoplatonist) view, unity is more fundamental than being (cf. 59.13–60.26 with Schneider 2009), and the One, i.e. the Good (cf. e.g. 112.14–15 and Steel 1989), is “beyond being, transcending all beings in its simplicity and inconceivable excellences, which it is impossible to name properly” (11.21–3, based on Plato, Republic VI.509b9) and therefore worthier than it. So should the first science not be of the One-Good instead of Being? Plato’s claim that the Good is the highest object of knowledge (Republic VI.505a2–4) seems to suggest as much. But no, replies Syrianus: we should distinguish between a Good coordinate to other Forms and a superessential Good, the first principle of all and summit of the metaphysical hierarchy (cf. e.g. Proclus, On Plato’s Republic I 278.22–279.2 Kroll; TP II 7, p. 46.13–20 S.–W.); the latter “is unknowable and above all science, as Plato clearly proclaims in the Parmenides [142a4–5], whereas the passage cited from the Republic speaks rather of the Form of the Good which is seen in and with beings” (cf. 55.16–33, with Steel 1999; also Côté 2003 for Syrianus’ use of Plato’s divided line in this and other passages of his commentary). In themselves, the One and its powers, the so-called “henads” (see below), transcend all knowledge and naming (cf. Proclus, Elements of Theology [ET], prop. §162, pp. 140–3 Dodds). The subject of metaphysical science, i.e. theology, is Being.

3.1.3 Pros hen relation

Being itself confers being to everything else, but unequally. Intelligibles are primary; sensibles mere accidents of the former. Syrianus thus transposes Aristotle’s substance-accident relation into a model-copy relation (cf. 114.35–115.3 and Opsomer 2004: 40–1). Since the copy depends upon the model, both copy and model are said to be homonymously, but the priority of the model guarantees unity in homonymy. The difference with Aristotle’s own view is marked. For Aristotle, non-substances are said pros substances referentially; for Syrianus, substance is the generative cause of non-substances (cf. Courtine 2005: 191–230). His revision of the pros hen relation makes it close to synonymy, as he realizes (cf. 57.16–21), but he justifies it by redefining genus as productive principle and making room for quasi-synonymic polyvocals: beings are not equal and cannot be pure synonyms, yet all can still fall under Being as their common cause.

3.2 Metaphysical hierarchy

Along with various other Neoplatonists, Syrianus is a principle monist: all reality unfolds through a dynamic process of derivation from a single unitary principle, whose products possess decreasing degrees of unity. This “procession” (81.34: proodos) follows a divine order symbolically revealed in the second part of Plato’s Parmenides. Syrianus champions therefore a theological reading of this controversial text (cf. Saffrey 1984a; Steel 2002, 2009: 201–5; Fauquier 2018). He interprets it as describing the dynamic constitution of reality, rather than a mere logical exercise (cf. Proclus, in Prm. I 640.16–641.5, pp. 32–3 L.-S. = Syrianus, in Prm. fr. 1 Klitenic Wear [KW]). Unfortunately, Syrianus’ Parmenides commentary survives only in fragments, mostly collected by Klitenic Wear 2011 (cf. Luna 2016: 692–5 for supplements). Many are preserved in the Parmenides commentary and the Platonic Theology of Proclus, who stresses that Syrianus solved the main exegetical difficulties and declares himself to closely follow the master (cf. e.g. in Prm. I 618.3–13, p. 2 L.-S.; TP I 1, p. 7.1–17, III 23, p. 83.13–18 S.-W.; also Marinus, Proclus §13.10–7, p. 16 S.-S.; further references in Luna 2016: 693–4), so that “it is almost impossible to distinguish between Proclus’ original contribution and what he adopted from Syrianus” (Steel-Helmig 2020: §1.1).

For Syrianus the second part of the Parmenides consists of nine hypotheses (cf. Proclus, in Prm. VI 1052.15–31 [on the meaning of “hypothesis”], 1053.16–8, 1061.20–1064.12, pp. 22–24, 35–9 L.-S.), a view shared by most Neoplatonists (cf. Saffrey-Westerink 1968: LXXV–LXXXIX; Luna-Segonds 2017: XII–XXIV; exceptions include Amelius, who counted eight, and “the philosopher of Rhodes” (identified by Saffrey 1984b, 1994 with Theodorus of Asine, but cf. Luna-Segonds 2017: 220–25) who counted ten, cf. Proclus, in Prm. VI 1052.32–1053.8, 1057.6–1058.3, pp. 23–4, 29–30 L.-S.), whereas modern commentators generally count eight series of deductions. Following Plutarch of Athens (cf. Proclus, in Prm. VI 1058.22–1061.19, pp. 31–5 L.-S. = Plutarch, fr. 62 Taormina), Syrianus holds that the first five hypotheses, assuming the existence of the One, draw true conclusions, whereas the latter four, assuming the non-existence of the One, yield false ones. Thus, the first five hypotheses correspond to as many levels of the metaphysical hierarchy; the latter four to none. This distinguishes Syrianus’ exegesis from those of Amelius, Porphyry and Iamblichus, who mapped each hypothesis to a metaphysical level (cf. Proclus, in Prm. VI 1056.1–1057.5, pp. 28–9 L.-S.). The first hypothesis concerns the One, the first principle of all; the second the One-Being or Being, i.e. the domain of the intelligibles or primary being (the level of Plotinus’ Intellect); the third the Soul; the fourth the forms in matter; the fifth matter (cf. Proclus, in Prm. VI 1061.30–1064.12, pp. 36–9 L.-S. = Syrianus, in Prm. fr. 3 KW).

3.2.1 The One

The first two hypotheses have a symmetrical structure: virtually all the attributes denied of the One in the first are affirmed in the second. Syrianus, like most Neoplatonists, dissolves the antinomy (and avoids PNC violation, cf. Steel 2004) by taking to hen to have different referents: in the first, the transcendent One, first principle of all; in the second, the One coordinate with Being. Thus, the first hypothesis provides a negative description of the former, or first God (cf. Proclus, in Prm. VI 1061.31, 1096.25–28, pp. 36, 86 L.-S.), the absolutely simple summit of the metaphysical hierarchy which everything proceeds from and strives to, the One taken in itself or as “imparticipable” (amethekton). Syrianus contrasts it with the One as it relates to other things (cf. esp. Proclus, in Prm. VI 1114.35–1116.19, pp. 115–7 L.-S. = Syrianus, in Prm. fr. 4 KW), which he also calls “participated One” (methekton hen), or “some One” (ti hen) (methekton, cf. Damascius, in Prm. II p. 75.18–22 Westerink-Combès = Syrianus, in Prm. fr. 12 KW; also Proclus, ET, prop. §116, pp. 102–3 Dodds). The description is “negative” because the first hypothesis contains only negations about the One—it is a “theological hymn to the One through negations”, as Proclus puts it (cf. in Prm. VII 1191.33–4, p. 94 L.-S.; cf. TP III 24, p. 83.22–5 S.-W; with van den Berg 2001: 22–9). As maximally pure and simple, the One cannot be thought of as having any property at all, or be the subject of any positive propositional attribution, which would entail multiplicity (subject plus attribute). Strictly speaking the One cannot even be named (cf. 11.19–23), since a name would single out a particular determination and limit the One. Hence, the One is ineffable — and this, too, should not be understood as a positive attribution, nor are the names “One” and “Good” proper designations of the principle, but rather of our notion of it (cf. Proclus, in Prm. VII lat. 507.21–513.18, pp. 197–207 L.-S.). All that can be said about the One are negations, which say nothing about it (Proclus, in Prm. VII lat. 518.14–22 L.-S. < Syrianus, in Prm. fr. 10 KW), but only about ourselves. Given that there is a difference between referring to the One and expressing something about it (cf. already Plotinus, Ennead V 3 [49] 13.1–8 Henry-Schwyzer2), negations refer to the One but express nothing about it (cf. again Proclus, in Prm. VII lat. 518.14–22 L.-S. < Syrianus, in Prm. fr. 10 KW). Occasionally Syrianus calls the One a “cause” (cf. 11.24; 168.2–3; 169.2–4), but this is not a positive description of the One per se, but only relative to us (cf. already Plotinus, Ennead VI 7 [38].25.24; 8 [39].18.38–49; 9 [9].3.49–51 Henry-Schwyzer2). Ultimately, as Proclus stresses, silence is best (cf. in Prm. VII lat. 505.4–21, 521.24–30, pp. 193–4, 222 L.-S.; TP III 8, p. 30.7–8 S.-W.), and, as Damascius insists, discourse on the One remains aporetic (cf. Greig 2021).

A controversial passage of Damascius’ On First Principles (II 17.3–17 Westerink-Combès) attributes to Syrianus the Iamblichean view that “beyond the One [scil. of the first hypothesis] there will be a unique principle, the Ineffable”. This would not be the subject of any of the hypotheses. Despite Iamblichus’ influence on Syrianus (cf. Cardullo 1993), the attribution lacks further support and is doubtful (cf. Klitenic Wear 2011: 6, 316–8). Note that for Iamblichus the first hypothesis concerns both the first God and all gods (cf. Proclus, in Prm. VI 1054.38–1055.2, 1064.21–1065.1, 1066.17–1071.4, pp. 27, 39, 42–8 L.-S.). Note also that Syrianus already deems the One of the first hypothesis ineffable.

3.2.2 The One-Being (1): attributes and henads

The attributes of the One-Being and their order. After the One, Syrianus posits a pair of opposing and complementary principles through which the One generates all reality and is present in it in the mode proper to each (ad modum recipientis) (cf. 112.14–9). These principles are dubbed (more often by Syrianus) Monad and Dyad, following Metaphysics XIII–XIV, or (more often by Proclus and already by Iamblichus, cf. Damascius, On First Principles II, p. 28.1–4 Westerink-Combès) “Limit” (peras) and “Unlimited” (apeiron), following Plato’s Philebus (cf. Luna 2000a: 228–38). They have different functions: the Monad-Limit, which resembles the One and has a primacy between the two (cf. 125.29–33, 166.1–2, 167.9–10, 184.11–2; with Luna 2000a: 255–7) is responsible for stability, permanence, unity, indivisibility, identity, similarity, equality, paternity and masculinity; the Dyad-Unlimited, by contrast, for procession, movement, multiplicity, division, divisibility, otherness, dissimilarity, inequality, maternity, femininity, fertility (cf. Sheppard 1982; Luna 2000a: 239–5; D’Ancona 2000a).

From these principles derives the second hypostatic level of reality, described by the Parmenides’ second hypothesis. Syrianus’ major innovations in the Parmenides exegesis concern this and the third hypotheses. The attributes denied to the One in the first hypothesis are affirmed in the second, which concerns the participated One, i.e. the One-Being with all divine intelligible beings that proceed from it (including the so-called greatest Kinds of Plato’s Sophist, such as Being and Difference, which are therefore subordinate to Monad and Dyad, pace Aristotle, Metaphysics XIV 2.1089a1–1090a2, cf. Granieri 2024).

Proclus praises Syrianus for being the first to pay attention to the order of the attributes of the One-Being (for the attributes before Syrianus cf. Van Campe 2009: 253–66). This order, identical in the two hypotheses (except that the pairs of attributes are eleven in the first and fourteen in the second), is for Syrianus philosophically and theologically significant (cf. Dillon 2009 and again Van Campe 2009): each pair of attributes marks a distinct level of divine reality in descending causal order. These levels are “orders of gods [...] expressed [...] by means of names familiar to the philosophers” (Proclus, in Prm. VI 1061.33–6, p. 36 L.-S. < Syrianus, in Prm. fr. 3 KW). Thus, while the first hypothesis was a “theological hymn to the One through negations”, the second is a hymn of the generation of all divine classes (cf. Proclus, TP I 7, p. 31.22–7 S.-W.). Syrianus explains these attributes by drawing from both the Parmenides and the Sophist, and showing his distinctive and celebrated exegetical method of treating all Plato’s words with utmost seriousness, to reveal their deeper, ultimately allegorical and theological meaning (cf. Klitenic Wear 2018: esp. 477–81 on the Parmenides; Syrianus also interpreted Homer allegorically and theologically, cf. Buffière 1956: 541–58; Manolea 2003). In doing so, he sets out an architecture of the divine world, which, while building on earlier Neoplatonist exegeses, achieves unprecedented complexity and sophistication. The post-Plotinian tendency to multiply levels of reality reaches its highest expression. More particularly, Syrianus sees the “spiritual realm” as

a system of three triads of intelligible gods [scil. Being], followed by three triads of intelligible-intellective gods [scil. Life], followed in turn by [an hebdomad of intellective gods [scil. Intellect]]—two triads and a seventh entity, termed the «membrane» (hypezôkôs). “These, taken together (each triad being taken as a unit for the purpose), produce a total of nine levels of being [...]. Here Syrianus is able to adduce five further levels of divine entity below the «membrane»: (1) hypercosmic gods; (2) hypercosmic-encosmic gods [...] (3) the encosmic gods; (4) universal souls [...]; (5) the so-called «superior classes of being» (ta kreittona genê), comprising the angels, daemons and heroes (which Iamblichus had actually made the subject of the third hypothesis, rather than Soul, as did all other Neoplatonic exegetes” (Dillon 2009: 237–8; additions in square brackets are our own; on (3), (4) and (5), see Steel 2009; full scheme in d’Hoine-Martijn 2017: 323–8).

Henads. Each set of attributes/level of reality/class of gods manifests a decreasing unity (hence they are collectively called ‘the Unified’, to hēnomenon). This brings us to the notorious doctrine of the henads, probably introduced by Syrianus himself and later elaborated by Proclus (cf. ET propp. §§ 113–65, pp. 100–45 Dodds; TP III 1–6 S.-W.; with Saffrey-Westerink 1978: XL–LXXVII, part. XL–LII on the origin, which other interpreters, e.g. Dillon 1972 and 1993, ascribe to Iamblichus; and D’Ancona 1992): “the whole second hypothesis, therefore, [Syrianus] says, reveals to us a multiplicity of autonomous henads, on which are dependent the entities about which the second hypothesis teaches us, revealing to us in its terms all their specific characteristics in turn” (in Prm. VI 1062.33–1063.1, p. 37 L.-S.). The fundamental motivation for the henads lies therefore in “die crux neuplatonischer Philosophie” (Beierwaltes 1980: 39): how does the One, utterly simple, give rise to multiplicity? Aristotle regarded the existence of multiplicity and difference as basic evidence and dismissed the issue as based on false Eleatic premises (cf. Metaphysics XIV 2.1089a1–2), but Syrianus insists it is real (cf. 46.22–5 and Granieri 2024), and the henads are meant to solve it: they are participated unities mediating between the transcendent One and derivative beings.

Even if the doctrine does not originate as such from Iamblichus himself, the existence of the divine henads somehow follows from his law of mean terms. This law states that “every producing cause brings into existence things like to itself before the unlike” (ET § 28). Thus, there are no leaps in the chain of being, but everything is linked together by similar terms. The henads fulfill this function, for as participated unities they bridge the gap between the transcendent One and everything that comes after it. (Steel-Helmig 2020: §3.1)

Though not a separate hypostasis, henads are manifestations of the first One at each hypostatic level, unifying it. Among the many problems with this controversial doctrine is the relation of the henads to the Monad-Dyad/Limit-Unlimited pair: the latter seems to precede and ground the henads, yet the henads are described as incomposite and functioning as an independent, parallel means of explaining how multiplicity arises from the One. Various solutions have been proposed. For example, some have argued that we should distinguish different referents of “henads” depending on the passages involved (cf. D’Ancona 1992); others that at each level of divine existence, the henads are a modality of Limit that carries in itself a power to produce beings: Unlimitedness (van Riel 2001). Research on this topic is still ongoing and expanding (cf. Opsomer et al. forthcoming).

3.2.3 The One-Being (2): Forms

The third intelligible triad of Syrianus’ metaphysical hierarchy includes the Paradigm, the realm of Platonic Forms. Syrianus’ Metaphysics commentary, especially on Books XIII and XIV (and more particularly on XIII.4–5, entitled in the commentary’s very manuscripts “The argument about the Forms”), preserves many of his views on Forms. He takes these views to constitute a body of doctrines shared also by the Pythagoreans, Socrates and even the Eleatics (cf. e.g. 104.33–105.18), and immune from Aristotle’s criticisms. The commentary also supplies a useful scheme for ordering those views under “four problems”: (1) whether Forms exist (which for Syrianus is also to ask what and why they are); (2) of what things; (3) what items participates in them; (4) how participation occurs (108.31–109.4, commenting on Metaph. XIII 4.1079a3–4; cf. already 39.30–40.5, on Metaphysics III 4.999b23–4). This scheme – transmitted through Iamblichus from Middle Platonist scholastic attempts at systematizing accounts of Forms, themselves shaped by exegesis of the Parmenides and by engagement with Aristotle’s critiques of the Forms (cf. d’Hoine 2004, 2009; Luna-Segonds 2011: 93–7) – was later adopted and revised by Proclus in in Prm. III (cf. 784.14–27, p. 3 L.-S.; see also d’Hoine-Michalewski 2012 for an overview of Neoplatonist accounts of Forms roughly along the “four problems” scheme).

The existence and nature of Forms. Syrianus distinguishes three main levels of being and Forms: intelligible, dianoetic, and sensible (cf. esp. 81.31–83.31):

  1. Intelligible Forms are universal, partless, perfect, and simple essences, that exist eternally, immutably, and fully exemplifying a given natural attribute. Thus, as Syrianus explains, echoing Middle Platonist remarks, they are neither just names, nor mental entities of sorts, as e.g. the Stoics believed (cf. 105.19–107.3 with Dörrie-Baltes 1998: 250–62). They are not even mere eternal duplicates of sensible particulars, as Aristotle contended, rejecting Platonic Forms as causally ineffective, epistemologically useless and ultimately vacuous notions (cf. esp. On Ideas; Metaphysics I 9, III 2, VII 14, XIII–XIV). For Syrianus Aristotle’s objections rest on a physicalist misconception of Forms and their consequent reduction to special sensibles (cf. Madigan 1986; Cardullo 2003; d’Hoine 2023). Instead, Forms are the true causes of things, in three distinct senses (cf. 82.2–11, 104.14–5, 107.38–108.7): efficient, i.e. productive and generative; paradigmatic, because their effects revert and assimilate to them; and final, as sources of goodness, order, beauty, and unity in their participants (due to their essentially mathematical nature, which does not however make them identical to mathematical numbers, on which cf. Mueller 1998; Dillon-O’Meara 2006: 3–8; and Lernould 2009). By contrast, Aristotle’s separate incorporeal substances, the unmoved movers, are only final causes (or at best also efficient, cf. Ge 2021). This causal description, too, follows a Middle-Platonist scholastic classification of causes, later developed by Proclus, and based on a revisionist expansion of Aristotle’s fourfold aetiological scheme (cf. d’Hoine 2017). As immaterial, Intelligible Forms exist as “both unified and distinct, although embraced by a single nature” (85.12–4), and multilocated like light.
  2. Dianoetic Forms are images of the intelligible Forms within the cosmic and individual soul (see §3.2.4 below). They are also the objects of recollection, not as concepts abstracted from sensibles (so called “later-born” concepts), but essentially pre-existing in our soul and implanted in it. Their recollection is triggered by the experience of sensible Forms, which stir up the soul. Dianoetic Forms have therefore a key epistemological function for Syrianus (see §4 below).
  3. Sensible Forms are images of dianoetic Forms and contribute to the constitution of hylomorphic compounds. They are the “inseparable causes of sensible objects being the ultimate images of the separate forms” (83.5–6), and contributing to the formation of sensible individuals. The latter are also beings and substances in a certain way, but in a defective sense vis-à-vis true and eternal substances, and are better called genesis (cf. 3.37–40, 171.32–3). Syrianus thus does not wholly reject Aristotelian hylomorphic essentialism, but subordinates it to the Platonist doctrine of intelligible Forms-causes.

The extent of the realm of Forms. Although they are universal (though not causally inert, as per various standard modern theories of universals), and although it is true that “if there is a Form of a given thing, there will also be universal reason-principles of that thing” (114.11), it is not the case that for every concept over many particulars there is a Form corresponding to it (cf. 114.9–11). Thus, pace Aristotle, Syrianus denies (that Plato countenanced) Forms of: evils; negations; changeable things; bare parts, i.e. parts which are not also wholes (e.g. hands or fingers); primary attributes of bodies (e.g. sweetness or whiteness); composite entities (e.g. white man); artifacts (cf. d’Hoine 2006a and 2006b); things contrary to nature (cf. 107.5–108.29, 110.18–27, 114.2–11 with Dörrie-Baltes 1998: 343–53). In short, he admits only Forms of natural kinds (and we would like to know more about what criteria of “naturalness” he advocated).

Participation and ‘Third-Man’ argument. The complementary relation to eidetic causality is participation (methexis): that on which a Form exerts its causal action, bestowing to it certain properties, is said to participate in that Form. Like several predecessors, Syrianus asks what items count as participants (cf. Dörrie-Baltes 1998: 359–67), and answers, following Iamblichus, that they are neither all intelligibles and all sensibles (pace Numenius, Cronius, and Amelius), nor only sensibles (pace Porphyry), nor only intelligibles: they are Soul and the sensibles (109.14–6).

Focusing with Aristotle on the Forms-sensibles relation, Syrianus holds, consistently with various Platonic dialogues (cf. e.g. Phaedo 78e2; Parmenides 133d3; Timaeus 52a5), that by participating in a Form, a sensible participant also takes its name, and also that ‘Forms are indeed homonymous with sensible particulars, and not synonymous with them’ (108.27–9; echoed by 111.37–8). Yet, they are not “homonymous in any chance sense, but only in the way that a model is related to an image of itself, and specifically when the model generates the images in virtue of its essence, and causes them to revert to it” (115.1–3). The point is that Forms and sensibles do not share the same essence and are not what they are in an identical sense: the Form of F-ness is F in a sense fundamentally different from the many Fs (the Form of Man is man in a sense fundamentally different from the many men). The former is the paradigmatic essence of F, the latter possesses F-ness only in a derivative and defective way.

This also allows for a solution to the notorious Third-Man Argument (cf. esp. Opsomer 2004), evoked by Aristotle at Metaphysics XIII 4.1079a11–13 as a well-known problem for proponents of Forms, and raised already by Plato at Parmenides 132a–133a: if the Form of Man not only fully expresses the characteristic of “what-it-is-to-be-a-man” (say “humanity”) but also is a perfect instance of that characteristic (i.e. the “Form-of-Man” is a man, more perfect than any physical man), then there must be a resemblance between the Form of Man and the physical copy of that form, which requires the postulation of a “Third Man” grounding such resemblance. Syrianus points out correctly (cf. 111.27–33) that this kind of argument could go on ad infinitum and then retorts (cf. 111.33–112.6) that it is a mistake to suppose that the predicate “man” is used in the same sense in the two cases: “If the point is that, because the Essential Man is synonymous with men in this realm, as Alexander states in his exegesis of this passage, and all synonyms come to be synonyms by virtue in their participation in some Form, a ”third man“ will manifest itself as being predicated of both the Form and the things in this realm, then the argument becomes ridiculous; for it is not the case that the things in this realm are synonymous with the relevant Form” (111.33–37). Syrianus does not deny self-predication, but contends instead that the predication of “man” in the case of the Form and in the case of the natural human being, involves homonymy, though, as already mentioned, in the way proper to a model-copy relation (cf. again 115.1–3). That is to say, the Form of Man is a man in the sense that it is productive of natural substances of a specific kind, i.e. human beings, which deserve the same predicate to the extent that they actively instantiate the essential characteristic of that form (i.e. “revert to it”). In the end, Syrianus’ solution to the problem may not be entirely satisfactory, but it was, by his time, the standard one among Platonists.

3.2.4 Soul

The third hypothesis of the Parmenides, Syrianus maintains, deals with the Soul. But not “all Soul pure and simple, but such as has proceeded forth after the divine Soul; for the whole divine Soul is comprised in the second hypothesis” (Proclus, in Prm. VI 1063.5–7, p. 38 L.-S. < Syrianus, in Prm. fr. 3 KW). Syrianus distinguishes three types of souls: (1) divine; (2) intermediate or demonic, always engaged in intellectual activity; and (3) human, which exercise it in inconstant and changeable ways (cf. Proclus, ET §184, p.160.21–30 Dodds). Souls of the first type are described in the second hypothesis, where Plato says that the One partakes of time (cf. Prm. 151e3–153b7), a condition proper to souls (cf. Steel 2009); whereas demonic and human souls, derived from divine ones, are described in the third. This arrangement – whose philosophical motivation is likely to assign distinct life principles to different levels of the hierarchy – sets Syrianus’ exegesis apart from those of various predecessors, such as Plutarch of Athens, who assigned the third hypothesis to soul without distinction, and Porphyry, who, while making distinctions, assigned it to the whole soul, rather than to the rational alone, as Amelius claimed (cf. Luna-Segonds 2017: 242–3). The Athenian tendency to multiply the levels of reality to meet both exegetical and philosophical needs is again evident.

Further insights into Syrianus’ view of the soul come from fragments of his Timaeus commentary (also collected and examined by Klitenic Wear 2011; cf. also her 2009). These suggest a complex view of the soul, building on various Neoplatonist predecessors, notably Porphyry and Iamblichus. Syrianus regards the soul as a life-giving principle, operating across different levels of reality. Central to his doctrine is the relationship between the hypostasis Soul (the transcendent universal Soul) and the individual soul. Regarding the former, Syrianus seems to conflate it with the World Soul, arguing that it possesses both a transcendent, super-cosmic aspect linked to Intellect (after Iamblichus) and a multiplicity of powers suitably distributed throughout the cosmos (echoing Porphyry), without thereby having a precise spatial location (agreeing with both Porphyry and Iamblichus) (cf. esp. Proclus, in Ti. II 105.28–106.9 Diehl, III 147.3–15 van Riel = Syrianus, in Ti. fr. 13 KW). The soul is thus one by virtue of this super-cosmic element and multiple by virtue of its division. As both one and many, the soul can proceed and revert while remaining in itself, exercising unified providence over the all plurality of pure forms and particular bodies. Regarding individual souls, Syrianus, like Iamblichus, stressed their cyclical descent into generation. This descent is a necessary process (as the soul’s nature precludes permanent residence in the intelligible realm) with variations in frequency leading to differing degrees of connection to higher realities (cf. Proclus, in Ti. III 236.31–237.9, 278.9–32 Diehl, V 97.22–98.6, 151.11–152.9 van Riel = Syrianus, in Ti. ffr. 23 and 25 KW). Overall, Syrianus’ doctrine highlights the soul’s unity and multiplicity and its role in connecting higher and lower principles, contributing to a highly interconnected universe, a concept further developed by Proclus (Klitenic Wear 2009: 200).

Another relevant source for the interpretation of Syrianus’ views on the soul is Hermias’ commentary on the Phaedrus, the only Neoplatonist commentary on this dialogue and the only writing of Hermias that survives (of which we now have a new critical edition, Lucarini-Moreschini 2012; a full English translation, Baltzly-Share 2018 and 2023; a book-length study, Neola 2022; and a full collection of papers, Finamore-Manolea-Klitenic Wear 2019). Traditionally, this work has been considered a faithful record of Syrianus’ teaching, with Hermias’ contribution deemed minimal (cf. i.a. Menn 2012: 45 n.3; Luna 2016: 689–91, with further references) - also due to Damascius’ judgement of Hermias as a zealous and hard-working scholar but unoriginal philosopher (cf. Damascius, Life of Isidore, fr. 54, pp. 152–4 A.). However, this view has faced significant recent scholarly criticism (cf. esp. Fortier 2018 and Neola 2022, but already Moreschini 1992, 2009). This fundamental scholarly disagreement may be a consequence of the intractability of the authorship question based on the available evidence, or so do the most recent translators of Hermias commentary believe (Baltzly-Share 2018: §5). Due to this complicated state of affairs and the present space limitations of this entry, we will leave Hermias’ commentary aside.

3.3 Principles of demonstration

Syrianus agrees with Aristotle that first philosophy studies also the principles of demonstration, i.e. the syllogistic axioms, first and foremost those we traditionally call the Principle of Non-Contradiction (PNC) and the Principle of Excluded Middle (PEM). While his Metaphysics commentary offers limited remarks on the PEM, his insights on the PNC are significant (they have been extensively examined by Longo 2004, 2005, 2009; cf. also O’Meara 2009 and Kiosoglou forthcoming).

Three key aspects of Syrianus’ treatment of the PNC stand out:

  • Pre-Aristotelian Formulations: Syrianus contends that the PNC was formulated already by philosophers prior to Aristotle (cf. 18.18). Likely he has in mind figures such as Parmenides, the Pythagoreans, and Plato (cf. Longo 2004; on Plato, cf. Republic IV 436b9–10; Euthydemus 293c8–d1; Phaedo 102e8–103b5; Theaetetus 188a10–b1; Sophist 230b7–8). He therefore questions the originality of Aristotle’s formulation of the PNC.
  • Exclusion of the One-Good: Syrianus explicitly excludes the One-Good, the highest principle in his metaphysical hierarchy, from the scope of the PNC (cf. 18.22–9; Kiosoglou forthcoming sees in this passage a polemic against Origen). He bases this on the authority of older philosophers (Pythagoreans and Plato) and his own strong interpretation of Republic VI 509b, which places the One-Good beyond being (cf. §3.2.1). Since the PNC, following Aristotle, applies to every being qua being, this exclusion is consistent.
  • Plurality of PNC?: Uniquely in ancient philosophy, Syrianus refers to axioms of contradiction (in the plural) on three occasions (cf. 71.13–15; 78.22–5; 79.15–17; for the expression in the singular, cf. 66.14, 68.29, 69.7–8, 74.17–8). According to Longo (esp. 2005), this should be explained in the broader context of Syrianus’ distinction between two versions of the PNC: one positing that two contradictory statements cannot both be true, and another that they cannot both be false. This distinction – so her reading goes – bears also interesting resemblance to the modern analysis of one of the most eminent modern interpreters of the Aristotelian PNC theory, Jan Łukasiewicz (cf. Longo 2009). To this interpretation, however, it has been objected (cf. Cavini 2007: 151–4) that Syrianus refers to the principle of excluded middle (PEM), particularly in its syntactic variant, as “the other of the axioms of contradiction” (71.14–5), and therefore that he does not in fact distinguish between two versions of the PNC, but collectively calls the PNC and PEM “axioms of contradiction” (a plural expression that can be explained in light of the use, common among commentators, of the expression ‘axiom of contradiction’ both collectively, to indicate both the PNC and PEM, and distributively, to indicate the PNC alone; cf. also Kiosoglou forthcoming for further discussion).

4. Epistemology

The cornerstone of Syrianus’ theory of science is a point on which he actually agrees with Aristotle: science is of universals (cf. e.g. 161.4–5, 163.1–2; Aristotle, Metaphysics III 6.1003a14–5; On the Soul II 5.417b22–3; also Posterior Analytics I 11.77a7–8; Topics VII 14.164a10–1; on Syrianus’ and Aristotle’s theory of science in the Posterior Analytics cf. Ierodiakonou 2009 and Longo 2011). But he has a different conception of universals, which substantially differentiates his epistemology from Aristotle’s. In addition to Platonic intelligible Forms, the first paradigmatic universals (cf. §3.2.3), Syrianus distinguishes three further types of universals (two of which correspond to two types of essences and Forms distinguished above, cf. §3.2.3): dianoetic, i.e. located in the cosmic and individual soul; immanent, i.e. located in cosmic nature; and ‘later-born’ (hysterogenē), abstracted from sensible particulars (cf. e.g. 28.11–3, 53.8–9, 160.30–161.36). Syrianus’ position is that the proper objects of science are the dianoetic universals or Forms. These are images of the intelligible Forms within the cosmic and individual soul, where they are implanted and pre-exist eternally. By contrast, Platonic intelligible Forms are beyond the human capacity for comprehension and discourse, so strictly speaking they cannot be scientifically known (cf. 115.21–6, also citing Aristotle, Metaph. VIII 3.1043b25–32). Immanent universals are multiplied in their instances, thus lacking the unity required by the object of science. The “later-born” universals are logical entities, whereas science must grasp the actual articulations of reality. To better understand Syrianus’ position, we can analyze a specific passage, 160.30–161.36.

At Metaphysics XIII 9.1086b5–7, Aristotle contends that, while it is true that “without the universal it is not possible to get knowledge”, it is not the case that universals are separable (as, according to Aristotle, Plato and his followers believe). Commenting on these lines, Syrianus undertakes to show that, pace Aristotle, the universals from which demonstrative proofs and scientific knowledge derive cannot be inseparable universals (i.e. inseparable from the particulars, or enmattered universals), but must be “causal principles which are both prior and more general [than sensible things]” (161.24). His first argument proceeds counterfactually: “if demonstrations are arrived at by means of inseparable universals, first of all, ”animal“ will not be said of human being as a whole; for the animal in human being will not, presumably, embrace also ”rational“, ”capable of laughter“, and ”mortal“” (161.16–18). That is: suppose demonstrations are obtained through inseparable universals; then, in the conclusion “human being is a rational animal”, the genus “animal” designates an inseparable universal, i.e. the instantiated genus (“the animal in human being”); if so, however, ‘animal’ could not be predicated of ‘human being’ as a whole, because it is only a part of it (the two constitutive parts of a species being genus and differentia) and cannot therefore itself embrace the constitutive differentiae of that species (e.g. “rational”, “capable of laughter”, and “mortal”). Only the separate universal or genus can contain the differentiae and produce scientific knowledge.

Dianoetic universals are thus the true objects of recollection. They are not empirically acquired concepts abstracted from sensible particulars, but essentially pre-existing notions implanted in our souls. Immanent universals are not themselves the objects of science, but the experience of them stirs up the soul and triggers the recollection of dianoetic Forms. Thus, Syrianus is a pugnacious critic of the abstractionism he attributes to Aristotle and a defender of Platonic innatism and theory of recollection. In this too he will be followed by Proclus (cf. Mueller 1990; Helmig 2012: 205–335; Lautner 2024; cf. also Lautner 2009 for the distinction of different types of logos in Syrianus’ theory of science).

5. Philosophy of nature

Like all ancient Platonists, Syrianus thinks that the sensible objects we ordinarily experience are ontologically defective. They are imperfect, impermanent, unstable, and constitutively subject to generation and corruption. The physical cosmos, following the Timaeus, does not constitute a self-sufficient order, but depends entirely on higher, incorporeal causes. Bodies are passive, devoid of intrinsic power, and wholly subject to action from incorporeal agent-principles, of which they are no more than an illusory projection. The production, organization and functioning of empirical phenomena is the result of the work of the only true causes, the supersensible ones. In particular, they are the result of the action of an intelligent agent, the demiurge (cf. Klitenic Wear 2017), who in the Syrianean-Proclean pantheon represents the third member of the first intellectual triad (cf. above §3.2.2.; Klitenic Wear 2011: 12–5). Supersensible causes pervade the cosmos and keep it operating according to a precise plan. Physical properties—extension, motion, resistance—are pale reflections of ideal paradigms. Thus, the sensible world possesses only a diminished, derivative mode of being. Strictly speaking one can only improperly apply to it the name “substance” (ousia—‘becoming’ (genesis) is the more appropriate name (cf. 3.37–40 and 171.32–3). Here, however, also lies the ambivalence of the relationship of Platonists like Syrianus with the physical world. It is itself flawed and imperfect, but as the effect of paradigmatic causes and ultimately of the One-Good principle it is ordered according to a good and positive design.

Syrianus agrees with Aristotle that sensible beings are composed of form and matter. However, he also stresses that enmattered forms are mere images of and depend upon separate intelligible Forms, the true ousiai, hence on still higher metaphysical principles, up to the One-Good. Thus, he accepts some of the basic claims of Aristotelian hylomorphism, but frames them in a distinctively Platonist theory of transcendent and paradigmatic causes. This differentiates Syrianus’ position from that of other Neoplatonists, such as Plotinus, who firmly reject Aristotelian hylomorphism and essentialism.

The chief cause of the inferiority of sensible beings is their material component. This does not imply the identification of matter and evil. Syrianus sees evil as a necessity of the universe and part of a providential plan. Indeed, what appears evil to us is only so from our limited perspective, that is, because we consider the whole from the point of view of the part. That is, we lack the global perspective of the divine creator. Evil does not exist in an absolute sense, as evil per se, because the Demiurge has produced the totality of the world according to a providential good plan. The only possible existence of evil is parasitic, as indicated by Iamblichus and reiterated by Proclus: evil exists only in connection with matter, without however being the same as it.

Syrianus also articulates a complex metaphysical account of time and space grounded in a hierarchical and participatory cosmology. He conceives of time not as a mere measure of motion, but as a distinct metaphysical reality (though still a mere image of eternity) rooted in the psychic realm, where it governs the soul’s cyclical movements and imitates higher eternal patterns. Eternity, by contrast, is situated in the intelligible realm and identified with the unified, unchanging totality of being. Time proceeds from this eternal source, unfolding its content in a discursive manner suitable to soul’s nature (cf. Klitenic Wear 2008). Similarly, Syrianus redefines space—or place—as an incorporeal interval (diastēma) that functions not as a passive container, but as a dynamic mediating principle between the World Soul and the physical cosmos. Informed by intelligible forms and psychic logoi, place actively orders and sustains the natural motion of bodies, assigning them to their proper regions (cf. Marongiu 2024). Thus, Syrianus integrates temporal and spatial realities within a metaphysical framework that preserves the primacy of intelligible causality while accounting for the ordered structure of the physical world.

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Acknowledgments

As of the 2025 update, Roberto Granieri has taken responsibility for updating and maintaining this entry. Thanks to Riccardo Chiaradonna, Lloyd Gerson, Concetta Luna, and Jan Opsomer for exceptionally helpful feedback on a draft.

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Roberto Granieri <roberto.granieri@uniroma3.it>
Christian Wildberg

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