Speusippus

First published Thu May 22, 2003; substantive revision Thu Aug 29, 2024

Speusippus of Athens was the son of Plato’s sister Potone; he became head of the Academy on Plato’s death in 348/347 and remained its head for eight years (Diogenes Laertius, Lives IV 1), apparently until his death. His date of birth is harder to get a fix on; it has reasonably been estimated at ca. 410. He apparently wrote a lot: “a great many treatises and many dialogues” (Lives IV 4; Diogenes lists about 30 titles, but his bibliography, by his own admission, is incomplete). We have very little of what he wrote, if any (we have something from a work later attributed to him, On Pythagorean Numbers, discussed below, but this is not one of Diogenes’ titles; scholars sometimes claim that genuine material is also preserved by Iamblichus, De communi mathematica scientia IV. The evidence is discussed below).

Diogenes tells us (Lives IV 1) that Speusippus “abided by the views of Plato”; from what little we can tell, this is simply false. In particular, Speusippus rejected the Theory of Forms.

References will be to the primary sources; the two most recent collections of the fragments (Isnardi Parente 1980; Tarán 1981) have indices that will enable the reader to locate the texts (Lang 1911 does not). Citations from Plato and Aristotle are to any standard edition; those from other ancient authors are taken from texts listed in the bibliography (translations are by R. Dancy, but where an alternative English translation is offered, they are referenced in the text).

Before discussing what we can infer from the texts at our disposal, the entry provides an overview of scholarly approaches to the material, highlighting how the different methodological perspectives of scholars have produced very different depictions of Speusippus’ thought. This contextual background is essential for understanding the criteria shaping this and other interpretations of the surviving testimonia.

1. Overview of main scholarly approaches to the material

Two aspects in particular have marked the history of scholarly interpretations of the Early Academy, and Speusippus specifically. On the one hand, a hermeneutical drive: the urge to understand the Platonic credentials of Plato’s first successors. On the other hand, a crucial and widely shared methodological assumption: Aristotle is not and cannot be an accurate witness.

The interaction of these two aspects, along with the varying degrees of receptiveness towards different philosophically significant themes, prompted scholars to prioritize certain sources over others, resulting in a variety of different scholarly approaches. This, in turn, yielded very different depictions of Speusippus’ philosophy. An overview of the most influential approaches can be summarized as follows.

  1. Working on the assumption that Aristotle often twists the philosophical views he presents, information from authors other than Aristotle has been considered more reliable. Given the very dichotomous transmission of material concerning Speusippus, mostly preserved by either Aristotle or Middle and Neo-Platonic authors, this perspective has led scholars to utilize texts that are more chronologically distant from Speusippus to elucidate compatible information found in Aristotle’s work. This approach was originally advanced by Merlan, who claimed that the material preserved in Chapter 4 of Iamblichus’ De communi mathematica scientia reproduced content concerning Speusippus (more on this below). The compatibility of Iamblichus’ account with claims found in Aristotle’s texts led Merlan (1953 [1968]) to suppose that Iamblichus likely had access to Speusippus’ writings, and could provide complementary information that Aristotle did not preserve. As an illustration, scholars supporting this view significantly downplay Aristotle’s criticism that Speusippus envisioned an episodic world (i.e., a world where each ontological layer is disconnected from the previous one; see Arist. Metaph., Λ 10, 1075b37–1076a5; N3, 1090b13–20), and believe this view should be corrected in the light of Iamblichus’ description of a continuous system. Similar readings have been advanced by scholars such as Krämer (1964) and the Tübingen school, and more recently by Metry (2002), and Dillon (2003). These interpretations have a strong metaphysical focus, and claim that some pioneering ideas that will become popular in Middle-Platonism and Neoplatonism originated in the Early Academy as a development of Plato’s esoteric theories. Speusippus and Xenocrates, for instance, have been read as postulating unitarian generative systems produced by primary principles, to be understood as principles of all things. This perspective has an invaluable philosophical merit: by intimately connecting the development of later streams of Platonism to the internal evolution of the Academy and projecting the roots of their theories either in the future or in the past, it finds a significant place for Early Academic philosophy within the Platonist tradition.
  2. Starting from the opposite assumption, namely that the material preserved by Iamblichus cannot constitute an independent source of Speusippean doctrine, an opposed methodological approach was advanced by Tarán with the publication of his collection (1981). Tarán’s reconstruction is deeply rooted in Aristotle’s text, it is sensitive of the contexts in which testimonia are preserved and grounded in a scrupulous analysis of the Greek. Tarán too, however, ultimately inherited from his teacher Cherniss the idea that Aristotle is a generally unreliable witness, and this is expressed as a need to get rid of Aristotle’s influence when interpreting material presenting Speusippus’s view. Thus, the data obtained via internal analyses of Aristotle’s text is dismissed when it is considered the result of Aristotle’s own criticism. As an illustration, the charge of episodicity is rejected by Tarán on completely different grounds than method (i), namely, via assessment of the argument construction and structure. In opposition to method (i), this approach significantly downsizes the metaphysical commitments of Speusippus: Iamblichus’ testimony is dismissed as unreliable, and Speusippus’ primary principles, the One and Plurality, are considered by Tarán as nothing else than number one and two. Tarán’s approach is precious insofar as it is philologically precise and attentive, prioritizes a meticulous analysis of the text, and highlights conclusively how important it is to examine the context in which the testimonia are embedded.
  3. A middle ground between approaches (i) and (ii) can be found in Isnardi Parente’s collection (1980). Although Aristotle is considered a primary witness for the reconstruction of Early Academic doctrines, the information is counter-balanced or combined with that obtained by other sources (similarly, Dancy, in the previous version of this entry, Dancy 2021). To keep on with the illustration, as we would expect from a middle-ground approach, Isnardi Parente does not dismiss Aristotle’s charge of episodicity straight away but contends that Aristotle is evasive as to how Speusippus would escape the charge, that is by establishing similarity between the various ontological layers of reality. Given the extensive work Isnardi Parente conducted on many aspects of Early Academic philosophy, her approach shows to be extremely helpful for the analysis of individual fragments especially; in addition, this approach allows for a more substantial assessment of subjects on which Aristotle preserved almost nothing, or that are only tangentially touched upon by different sources, such as, for instance, Speusippus’ psychological theory.

Each of these methodological approaches has yielded distinctly different portrayals of Speusippus, sometimes leading to incompatible interpretations. Recent specialist approaches have predominantly embraced Isnardi-Parente’s middle-ground approach, reflecting a shift towards a more nuanced appraisal of Aristotle’s reliability as a source. This trend highlights a growing preference for problem-oriented analyses (see, e.g., Bénatouïl & El Murr 2010; Bénatouïl 2017; Horky 2018; De Cesaris 2023; Benati 2024). Such efforts have proven especially valuable in exploring the Platonic credentials of Early Academic views by focusing on the problems these views sought to address, thus offering a more dynamic understanding of the Platonist tradition, less focused on the continuity of doctrines. Significant scholarly work on Aristotle’s texts has also conspicuously influenced this reevaluation. While many studies have contributed to the broader field, two unpublished works stand out for their significant impact on the reconstruction of Early Academic philosophy: Crubellier’s (1994) analysis of books M and N of Aristotle’s Metaphysics, and Menn’s study of The Aim and the Argument of Aristotle’s Metaphysics (see Other Internet Resources).

Ultimately, what methodology one deems the most appropriate to the material remains, of course, at the discretion of each interpreter. However, it is crucial to recognize that these methodological decisions, particularly in the absence of direct material, can lead to markedly divergent conclusions. In this entry, significant focus is placed on Aristotle’s text, complemented by scholarly evaluations of the material preserved by Iamblichus, to provide a more comprehensive understanding of the subject.

2. Metaphysics

In the Metaphysics, Aristotle often presents brief summaries of Plato’s views and those of others. From these, we learn what little we can about Speusippus and his contemporary, Xenocrates.

According to Aristotle, all three of Plato, Speusippus, and Xenocrates constructed their worlds operating with two principles (archai): the One and something opposed to it. The latter appears under different names, and it looks as if the different names go with different ones among the three: ‘the Indefinite Dyad’ or ‘the large and (the) small’ seem to be the expressions favored by Plato, ‘plurality’ seems to be associated with Speusippus, and ‘the unequal’ with Xenocrates. And for Plato, the One was identified with the Good.

These principles are primarily employed by these three thinkers in connection with numbers. But there are two ranges of number operating in Aristotle’s discussions (see Metaphysics I 6, Ν 8–9). There are what he refers to as formal numbers, one for each numeral; these are the (Platonic) Forms for numbers. But since there is only one for each numeral, and a mathematician has to be able to add two and two to get four, there is another range of numbers required: the mathematical numbers, indefinitely many for each numeral n, each of the indefinitely many a collection of n units. As Aristotle has it, Plato accepted both ranges, and Speusippus only mathematical numbers; Speusippus, then, rejects Plato’s Theory of Forms and his belief in formal numbers.

There are only two passages in which Aristotle mentions Speusippus by name in dealing with his metaphysical views: Metaphysics Z 2, 1028b21 and Λ 7, 1072b31. Neither passage can be considered actual quoting, but there is some practice consensus for referring to these and similar pieces of testimony concerning Speusippus as ‘fragments’, given that this is how the two collections by Isnardi Parente and Tarán refer to the texts preserving Speusippus’ view.

The method followed in the reconstruction of Speusippus’ views is a matter of chaining: we start from anchor texts and look for other passages in which the views ascribed to him in them are under discussion. Those passages will sometimes bring in new views; we then ascribe those views to Speusippus, and go looking for passages in which those views seem to be alluded to. When sketching out summaries of the Platonists’ views, Speusippus is often distinguished from Plato and Xenocrates (usually referred to as “those who posit the Forms”) and spoken of as “he who posited mathematical number only” or referred to with similar formulations. This helps us gather more information.

In the first of our two anchor texts (Metaphysics Z 2, 1028b18–24), while discussing the ways in which people have answered the question ‘what are the substances?’, Aristotle ascribes to Plato the view that there are not only perceptible substances but eternal ones of two types: forms and mathematical objects. He then says that Speusippus thought there were even more types of substance; he “started from the One” and adopted principles (archai) for each of his types of substance: “one for numbers, another for magnitudes, then for soul”. So we have at least four layers of beings: numbers, magnitudes, souls, and perceptible beings; the One is Speusippus’ starting point, but he has different principles for each level of being.

We find a confirmation of this structure of the world in another passage of the Metaphysics (N 3, 1090b13–20):

Again, if one is not too easily satisfied, one might inquire further with regard to all number and the objects of mathematics, that they contribute nothing to one another, the prior to the posterior; for if number did not exist, none the less magnitudes would exist for those who maintain the existence of the objects of mathematics only, and if magnitudes did not exist, soul and sensible bodies would exist. But the phenomena show that nature is not a series of episodes, like a bad tragedy (transl. Ross slightly modified).

Here we can recognize Speusippus behind the reference to “those who maintain the existence of the objects of mathematics only”. The passage confirms that Speusippus’ world presents four layers of beings: numbers, magnitudes, soul, and perceptible beings (here listed explicitly). The passage also adds an important detail concerning these layers, namely that, according to what Aristotle says, they appear to be causally independent from one another. If one level ceased to exist, no consequence would affect the other layers. One possible way of reading the information provided by these two Aristotelian texts together is that the postulation of principles for each stage of reality serves precisely the purpose of rendering each layer of beings independent.

Aristotle more than once complains of Speusippus’ ‘episodic’ universe. From these critiques, it emerges that, apparently, the train of causality did not start with the One and go down through the various levels, but started anew at each level. The same criticism is reiterated by Theophrastus (Metaph., 4a 9–17). Scholars have resisted this characterization of Speusippus’ world on various bases, but most often by appealing to Iamblichus’ DCMS (more below) where the One is said to be the same principle throughout, yet realized in different ways at each level because of the matter it acts upon. As the number 1, or the unit, at the level of numbers, as the point, in what DCMS calls ‘place’ or, we might translate, ‘locus’, at the level of geometrical figures. As it will be clearer below, endorsing or resisting such readings depends on the methodological choices we make. Yet, if we grant that Platonic participation constituted a crucial problem for Speusippus (as the Principle of Alien Causality appears to suggest, more below), the interventions in his system may be understandable considering the epistemological advantages they may offer. If each ontological section of the system is symmetrically separated from the others, each is independent and to be investigated by means of specific epistemological practices. In this picture, the mathematical layer does not constitute a paradigmatic model for the sensible one, nor does it express any causal functions over sensible bodies, the inquiry into which deserves to be conducted according to different rules than those reserved for mathematical and geometrical ones. Possibly for the same reason each ontological domain has its peculiar principles: for this may allow objects in each domain to remain homogeneous to one another (i.e., to respond to the same definition) and prevent principles of different levels from performing explanatory functions at other levels.

In the second anchor text (Metaphysics Λ 7, 1072b30–1073a3), Aristotle, having just sketched a proof for the existence of an unmoved mover, which he refers to as a principle (arche) and as ‘god’, says something about Speusippus’ views about principles: that he (and the Pythagoreans) suppose that a principle is not characterizable as ‘beautiful’ or ‘good’, going on the analogy of plants and animals, where beauty and goodness emerge in the end state rather than the beginning.

Then we begin chaining.

In Metaphysics N 4–5, Aristotle discusses various Platonistic views about the relationships between the first principles and goodness; N 4, 1091a34–36 refers to contemporaries of Aristotle’s who deny that the good is among the principles but suppose it comes in later in the development; the second of our two anchor texts warrants the guess that Speusippus is among them. And then some other things about the passage in N fall into place: Speusippus’ main way of referring to the principle opposed to the One was ‘Plurality’, and, more importantly, he denied a theory about causality that was part of Plato’s Theory of Forms as we find that Theory in, say, the Phaedo: a theory to the effect that the possession of a feature F by a perceptible object was due to its participation in something supremely F that transmits its being F to the perceptible object; as opposed to this ‘Transmission Theory of Causality’, Speusippus adopted what we might call a Principle of Alien Causality: the first cause of Fs is not itself F (more details about this view in Dancy 1989 [1991: 77–112]).

Speusippus’ Principle of Alien Causality has different implications depending on how we understand the very structure of Speusippus’ world. On the assumption that Speusippus’ universe is a generative or genealogical one (i.e., one where the One somehow acts throughout all layers of reality), the instantiation of the Principle of Alien Causality pertains to the One with respect to all beings. In other words, the principle should be understood as follows: the One, considered as the cause of all beings, is not itself a being (Dancy 1989 [1991]). This could find some confirmation in the conclusion of a parallel argument by Aristotle in Metaphysics N 5. 1092a11–17, where Aristotle appears to conclude that “the One would not even be a being” and other remote sources such as Latin translation of part of Proclus’ commentary on Plato’s Parmenides (more below).

Differently, on the assumption that Speusippus’ universe is episodic (i.e., one where each layer of reality, having its own principles, is causally independent of the others), the Principle of Alien Causality is understood as having a more limited scope. In this understanding, given that the One and Plurality are taken to be principles of numbers only, the application of the Principle of Alien Causality would not extend to all levels of being but rather be restricted to the relationship that principles of each level have with what they are principles of. On this reading, the conclusion of the parallel argument Aristotle preserves in Metaphysics N, claiming that “the One would not even be a being” should be understood as the conclusion of a reductio ad absurdum by Aristotle, rather than as genuine evidence of Speusippus’ view (as in Tarán 1981: 42).

The claim that “the One is not a being” has been central for those interpretations that saw in Speusippus’ One an anticipation of a principle that is beyond being and similar to that postulated by Neoplatonist authors (see, for instance, Krämer 1969, Halfwassen 1992, Bechtle 2010, Dillon 2010, building upon claims in Dodds 1928). Indeed, scholars found further support for this claim in William of Moerbeke’s Latin translation of part of Proclus’ commentary on Plato’s Parmenides. In the Latin text preserved, Proclus tells us that “the One is higher than being and is the source of being” and that Indefinite Duality was later introduced because if the One were “in itself, conceived as separated and alone, without the other things, with no additional element, nothing else would come into existence”. Most importantly for our purposes, the text claims that this “is also how Speusippus interprets the doctrine of the ancients” (translation by Tarán, 1981: 350–351). The scholarly community is neatly divided into two groups as to how much the information that William’s translation preserves could be projected onto Speusippus’ thought. On the one hand, a positivistic reading of the data; on this account, Speusippus is the propounder of a metaphysical/ontological interpretation of the first two hypotheses of Plato’s Parmenides, which antedates Moderatus’ interpretation. On the other hand, a skeptical attitude concerning the information contained in the Latin passage; on this reading, the text has gone through Neoplatonic or Neopythagorean reinterpretations and, as such, it does not preserve genuine information about what Speusippus thought. Determinant for reinforcing the skeptical attitude towards the material has been an influential paper by Steel (2002), who pointed out the closeness that the retroverted text in Greek showed to the formulation of Plato’s second hypothesis in the Parmenides, and claimed that the text was probably forged in Neopythagorean circles as an attempt to credit Speusippus with the Neopythagorean concept of a transcendent One above being and a subordinate Dyad.

Similarly important for proto-Neoplatonist readings of Speusippus has been a chapter of the De communi mathematica scientia (On Mathematical Science in General, hereafter DCMS) by Iamblichus (3rd century CE) after the case has been made by Merlan (1953 [1968]) for the idea that chapter IV of DCMS contained paraphrase if not quotation from Speusippus.

No doubt chapter IV of Iamblichus’ DCMS is resonant of Speusippus’ theories. Indeed, the text expands on information that is compatible with what we gather from Aristotle’s testimonia on many points. For instance, it claims that One and Plurality are the principles of mathematical numbers; a plurality of principles exist, each pair peculiar to their ontological level; the absence of beauty and goodness in the principle; the ‘material’ principle is not connoted as bad. Yet, Iamblichus also adds a number of details that are not paralleled elsewhere. Here, too, the scholarly community has displayed two opposite attitudes toward the material. For a defense of it, see Dillon 1984, 2004, and 2012. For a dismissal of it, Tarán 1981: 86–107 and Isnardi Parente 2005 (Other Internet Resources), who sees at the basis of DCMS IV essentially Aristotelian reports, where the transcendental aspect of the One has been accentuated. This is one of those cases where the methodological choices of the interpreters become critical as they have the effect of producing radically different depictions of Speusippus.

We have a fair amount of information about what Speusippus thought about numbers, preserved in pseudo-Iamblichus’ Theologumena arithmeticae. This book is a compilation from various authors: Anatolius, Nicomachus of Gerasa, possibly Iamblichus himself, possibly authors unknown. It discusses various properties of each of the first ten numbers. When it gets to the number 10, the ‘decad’, after a section that looks as if it descends from Nicomachus, it begins to speak of Speusippus and a book of his which it says was entitled ‘On Pythagorean Numbers’ and was compiled from various Pythagorean writings, especially those of Philolaus (82.10–15: that the book had that title and that Philolaus or any other Pythagorean was a source for Speusippus are both problematic claims). After what purports to be a description of the book (82.15–83.5), it introduces a long quotation from Speusippus himself concerning the number 10.

The description preceding the quotation begins (82.20) with a passage on the first half of Speusippus’ book, telling us that it talked about numbers of various types and the five so-called ‘Platonic solids’ (the tetrahedron or pyramid, the cube, the octahedron, the dodecahedron, and the icosahedron, assigned in the Platonic tradition starting with Timaeus 54d–56b to the elements of which the universe was composed and to the universe itself or to the fifth element, ether). This is relatively unproblematic.

The second half of the book, the author tells us, was about the number 10. Unfortunately, the description of that half of the book that precedes the quotation contains wording which it seems impossible to ascribe to Speusippus. The author tells us that Speusippus showed that the number 10 was:

a sort of artistic form for the cosmic accomplishments, obtaining in its own right (and not because we use it nor as it happens), and lying before the god that is maker of the all as an all-complete paradigm. (DCMS 1975a,b: 83.2–5; translation by Waterfield 1988: 112)

The trouble is that we have already got Speusippus rejecting the Theory of Forms, and in particular denying that aspect of the Theory in which the forms are treated as ‘paradigms’: ideal cases that transmit their properties to things that participate in them.

As it happens, this passage is too good to be true: it is almost verbatim what Nicomachus himself wants (see, e.g., Nicomachus’ Introductio arithmeticae I vi 1 [1866: 12.1–12; 1926: 189]). So it seems best not to ascribe it to Speusippus.

The quotation itself is another matter. In the quotation, Speusippus tells us that the number 10 is ‘perfect’ or ‘complete’. The explanation in Euclid vii Def. 23 ([1970: 105; Def. 22 in [1926: 278]) for the phrase ‘perfect number’ is a ‘number that is the sum of its proper divisors’. This makes the first perfect numbers 6, 28, and 496: 10 is not a perfect number in this sense.

Rather, for Speusippus number 10 is perfect because it exhibits both some characteristics that are peculiar to it, and others that it itself, insofar as perfect, must display (but are not exclusive to it). Among the latter kind of qualities, Speusippus lists that a perfect number must be even (for it must contain an equal number of odd and even numbers); it must contain an equal number of first and uncompounded numbers and secondary and compounded numbers (and number 10 is the first to display this property); it must contain an equal amount of multiples and submultiples of these latter. Among the peculiar characteristics that number 10 has we find that: it displays all arithmetical ratios; it contains all kinds of numbers (linear, square, and cubic numbers); it displays the first numerical progression (for how Speusippus understood these characteristics and examples, see Tarán 1981: 257–298).

Despite scholars frequently speaking of this text as referring to the decad, it is crucial to underline that the Greek ‘dekas’ occurs in the verbatim quotation one time only. With the exception of line 50, Speusippus consistently refers to 10 as: ‘ta deka’, ho deka [arithmos], “ιʹ”, ho tōn deka arithmos, or in other words, he consistently emphasizes its numerical aspect. And the same occurs with all other numbers mentioned. More precisely: in the section discussing the characteristics of 10, Speusippus regularly refers to numbers as cardinals. It is in the subsequent section of the text, when Speusippus explains the composition of figures to show how, when enumerating their elements, our count always reaches 10, that the language changes and we find terms like ‘duas’, ‘tetras’; ‘exas’ and ‘dekas’. The reason why Speusippus here uses terms such as ‘dyad’, ‘tetrad’, ‘hexad’, and ‘decad’ is precisely because he is referring to groups of 2, 3, 4, 6, or 10 objects. This aspect has been overlooked by studies on the text, probably inadvertently influenced by the metaphysical summary.

One important result one gathers from the properties that Speusippus ascribes to 10 is that he seems to have supposed that number 1 was among the numbers. In this, he was apparently ahead of his time, for the generally accepted view was that 1 is not a number (for this see Aristotle, Metaphysics, book Ι; Euclid, Elements vii def. 2, proof of prop. 1, et passim). But if this is so, it is essential to recall that we are dealing with Aristotle’s ‘mathematical’ numbers, where there is a plurality for each number. So there is a plurality of numbers 1 (so that we can add 1 and 1 to get 2, etc.). Then the One is not the number 1; the latter comes about when you get a plurality of units, any of which counts as a 1, any couple of which counts as a 2, and so on. That the One is not the number 1 is only what we should expect, given the Principle of Alien Causality: the principle for numbers is not itself a number.

When we try to consider Speusippus’ views as they bear on the other levels of his universe, unfortunately, we have virtually nothing further to tell us what is going on: nothing that tells us what could be going on at the level of soul, or perceptible bodies. A passage in Stobaeus (Eclogues I 49.32 [1884: 364.2–7]) that apparently descends from Iamblichus’ De anima tells us that he defined the soul ‘by the extended in every dimension’, but this claim remains elusive (for recent attempts to understand the definition, see Opsomer 2020 and De Cesaris 2022).

3. Epistemology

Aristotle says, in Posterior Analytics II 13. 97a6–11:

There is no need for one who is defining and dividing to know all the things that are. And yet some say that it is impossible to know the differences between something and each other thing while one does not know each other thing, and without the differences one cannot know each thing, for a thing is the same as that from which it does not differ, and it is other than that from which it differs.

The ancient commentators (see esp. Anonymous In An. post. 584.17–585.2, where the ascription is credited to Eudemus) tell us that this is Speusippus’ position (it has antecedents in Plato, Philebus 18c and Theaetetus 208c-e).

It is a version of what is sometimes called ‘holism’: knowing something involves knowing where it is located among everything else. In this particular context, knowing a thing appears to be a matter of knowing its definition, and its definition is something arrived at by the Platonic method of division (there is room for controversy here: see Falcon 2000). An example suggested by what Aristotle says elsewhere in this same chapter (96a24-b1, much simplified) might be an attempt to define the number 3 as follows:

(Dtriad) a triad =df a number, odd, prime

We reach this definition by successive divisions:

a diagram of the form (number (odd (prime (triad)) (composite)) (even))

And then the view being ascribed to Speusippus is that knowing the number 3 is knowing where 3 is on such a grid, along with knowing where every other number on the grid is.

It is very difficult to imagine sustaining this epistemological holism. It might seem easier if we confined the view to things like mathematics. But we already know that Speusippus’ universe extended beyond the realm of mathematical objects, and it seems quite likely that another division suggested by Aristotle in that chapter (96b30–35) would be acceptable (at least in principle) to Speusippus:

a diagram of the form (animal (tame (footed (two-footed (man)) (four-footed)) (winged) (swimming)) (wild))

The difficulty of sustaining the idea that knowing man is a matter of knowing its position on a tree that locates absolutely every animal, or even every ensouled thing, or (worse yet) absolutely everything, is enormous. But it looks as if Speusippus would have been committed to this.

For we find this in Sextus Empiricus:

… but Speusippus said that, since of things some are perceptible and others intelligible, the criterion of the intelligible ones is the scientific account, and that of the perceptible ones is the scientific perception. Scientific perception he understood to be that which partakes of the truth in accordance with the account. For just as the fingers of the flautist or harpist have an artistic actuality, yet one that is not completed in them in the first instance, but perfected on the basis of discipline conforming to reasoning, and as the perception of the musician has an actuality that can grasp what is in tune and what is out of tune, and this is not self-grown but comes about on the basis of reasoning, so also the scientific perception partakes of its scientific practice as naturally derived from the account, leading to the unerring discrimination of the subjects. (Adversus mathematicos vii 145–146 [1935: 80, 81])

The use of the word ‘scientific’ should not lead one away from the main point: it translates a word that means ‘pertaining to knowledge’, and Speusippus is claiming that there is knowledge at the level of perceived objects. There is no indication that he gave up his holism at this point. So he seems to be committed to defending a rather drastic position.

And he seems to have pursued knowledge at the level of perceived objects with considerable zeal. We have book-titles such as Definitions and Likes in which Speusippus apparently attempted with some zeal to locate various species of plants and animals on something like a division-tree, although the details are not extant. What we hear about Speusippus’ efforts is, for example:

MARSHWORTS: Speusippus in book II of Likes says they grow in water, their leaf resembling marsh celery. (Athenaeus II 61c [1927: 266, 267])

Speusippus in the Likes calls the melon a ‘gourd’. (Athenaeus II 68e [1927: 298, 299])

Speusippus in book II of Likes says that trumpet-shells, purple-fish, snails, and clams are similar. … Again, Speusippus enumerates next in order, in a separate division, clams, scallops, mussels, pinnas, razorfish, and in another class oysters, limpets. (Athenaeus III 86c,d [1927: 372, 273])

Speusippus in book II of Likes says that, of the soft-shells, the crayfish, lobster, mollusc, bear-crab, crab, paguros are similar. (Athenaeus III 105b [1927: 450, 451])

There are a total of twenty-five such citations in Athenaeus. Most simply record that Speusippus said one organism was like another (as with the last two), or simply record differences of terminology that happened to catch Athenaeus’ eye (as with the second one). The only one that promises anything more is the first one above, and that hardly promises much. But it has been supposed (see Tarán 1981) that it implies that Speusippus differentiated species of animals on the basis of features that would not have counted as differentiae in Aristotle’s way of classifying animals: differences of locale. And it is certainly possible that Speusippus’ holism involved a rejection of Aristotle’s essence-accident distinction: if we take the text quoted above from Aristotle as implying that someone who knows marshworts must know every respect in which they are like or unlike every other organism in the universe, and every such differentiating feature is as good as any other in defining them, then we have abandoned the project of differentiating organisms as it appeared to Aristotle.

This line of thought has suggested to some (see Tarán 1981) that the criticism of the Method of Division in Aristotle’s Parts of Animals I 2–3 constitutes a criticism of Speusippus. This possibility remains highly controversial.

It appears from Simplicius’ Commentary on Aristotle’s Categories ([1907: 38.19–24]) that Speusippus applied his method of division, however it worked, to language: there we hear of a division of terms even more elaborate than Aristotle’s in the opening chapter of the Categories: there we hear of homonyms, synonyms, and paronyms, but Speusippus differentiated between tautonyms (uses of the same term), within which there are homonyms (same term but different definitions) and synonyms (same term and same definition), and heteronyms (different terms), within which there are heteronyms proper (different names, different things), polyonyms (many names, the same thing), and paronyms (as in Aristotle: different terms and different things, with one term derivative from another, as ‘courageous’ and ‘courage’). Whether this classification was not only more elaborate than Aristotle’s, but also had a different basis (that in Aristotle being a classification of things according to how they are referred to, that in Speusippus being a classification of terms themselves), is in dispute (Barnes 1971, Tarán 1978).

Finally, a little bit about Speusippus’ attitude toward the epistemology of mathematics is preserved by Proclus. Assuming that Aristotle in Metaphysics N 3, 1090a25–29, 35-b1 is discussing Speusippus (he is talking about “those who say there is only the mathematical number”), Speusippus held that the truths of mathematics are not about perceptible things, and that the axioms from which they follow “fawn on the soul”: that is, perhaps, suggest themselves. Proclus adds the following:

For universally, Speusippus says, of the things for which the understanding is making a hunt, some it puts forward without having made an elaborate excursion, and sets them up for the investigation to come: it has a clearer contact with these, even more than sight has with visible things; but with others, which it is unable to grasp straight off, but against which it makes its strides by inference, it tries to effect their capture along the lines of what follows. (Commentary on Book I of Euclid’s Elements [1873: 179.8–22; 1970: 141])

So we begin from some sort of intuition by which the axioms suggest themselves and proceed from them to the rest of the mathematical truths.

We also hear from Proclus of a dispute in the Academy between some, whom we might call ‘constructivists’, who saw mathematics as something like a human construct, and referred to the truths of geometry as ‘problems’, demanding geometrical constructions, and others, whom we might think of as ‘mathematical realists’, who saw mathematics as describing an eternal, unchanging realm of objects, and referred to the truths of mathematics as ‘theorems’ or ‘objects of contemplation’. Proclus says:

But already among the ancients, some demanded that we call all of the things that follow from the principles theorems, as did Speusippus, Amphinomus, and those around them, thinking that for the theoretical branches of knowledge the appellation ‘theorems’ was more appropriate than ‘problems’, especially in that they make their accounts about eternal things. For there is no coming-to-be among the eternal things, so that the problem could have no place with them, it requiring a coming-to-be and making of that which was not before, e.g. constructing an equilateral triangle or describing a square when a line is given, or placing a line at a given point. So they say it is better to say that all these things are, but that we look at their comings-to-be not by way of producing them but by way of knowing them, treating the things that always are as if they were coming-to-be. (Commentary on Book I of Euclid’s Elements [1873: 77.15–78.6; 1970: 63–64])

So Speusippus, as we might have predicted from the foregoing, was firmly in the realist camp.

4. Ethics

Speusippus certainly wrote about ethics: the bibliography in Diogenes lists (in Lives IV 4) one book each on wealth, pleasure, justice, and friendship. But we have nothing that can be properly called a fragment.

We have already seen that Speusippus rejected Plato’s Theory of Forms, and that he refused to place the good among the metaphysical first principles. So he was not obviously prone to the objections of Aristotle against Platonic ethics in Nicomachean Ethics I 6, the general upshot of which is that Plato’s theory puts the Good out of human reach.

Speusippus appears to have adopted a rather down-to-earth goal, and in this he is a lead-in to Hellenistic concerns. Hellenistic ethics is dominated by the identification of the ideal of human happiness as ‘undisturbedness’ (ataraxia). According to Clement, Stromata II 22, 133 [1939: 186.19–23]):

Speusippus, Plato’s nephew, says that happiness is the completed state in things that hold by nature, or possession of goods, for which condition all men have desire, while the good ones aim at untroubledness (aochlesia). And the excellences are productive of happiness.

These formulations ‘anticipate’ Stoic and Epicurean ones: the emphasis on ‘natural’ conditions is a feature of Stoicism, and the notion of ‘untroubledness’ is found in Epicurus (see To Menoeceus, in Diogenes Laertius Lives X 127).

There is an argument implicit in the clause “for which all men have desire, while the good ones aim at untroubledness” that fits in perfectly with a debate about the good and happiness that we know from Aristotle to have been current in the Academy, and in which Speusippus played a leading role. Nicomachean Ethics X 2 begins (1172b9–10):

Eudoxus, then, thought pleasure to be the good because he saw all things, both rational and irrational, aiming at it, ….

This sort of ‘Universal Pursuit Argument’ is one that became very popular in the Hellenistic period; here we have Eudoxus applying it in favor of the claim that pleasure is the good: ‘hedonism’ (for more on the discussion between Eudoxus and Speusippus, see Warren 2009, Cheng 2020a and 2020b). And Speusippus strenuously denied hedonism (see below).

We might, then, see Speusippus responding to the Universal Pursuit Argument construed as favoring hedonism by saying: we should not care about what all things in general aim at, but at what human beings aim at, in fact, more specifically, the good ones among them, and what human beings pursue is not pleasure, but the completed state in things that hold by nature, and the good ones, more specifically, pursue untroubledness. The word ‘untroubledness’, aochlesia, comes from a verb ochleein that can just mean ‘to move’, so untroubledness might well suggest a certain stillness, lack of motion. This will fit with Speusippus’ views on pleasure and pain.

Before we turn to those, we have a little more with which to flesh out Speusippus’ idea of the good for man; none of it, regrettably, is supplied with argument.

Cicero, in various places, ascribes a view to “Aristotle, Speusippus, Xenocrates, and Polemon” which he himself rejects. In the Tusculan Disputations he enumerates (V X 29) various things such as poverty, ingloriousness, loneliness, pain, ill health, etc., which many people (but not he: his own view is the Stoic one that virtue all by itself guarantees happiness) take to be bad things, and then says:

Therefore I do not easily give in to … those ancients, Aristotle, Speusippus, Xenocrates, and Polemon, since they count the things I have enumerated above among the bad things, and these very people say that the wise man is always happy. (V X 30 [1927: 454/455–456/457])

Cicero is, in the last clause, accusing these people of inconsistency: they think the wise man is always happy, and yet they think there are things such as wealth and health the lack of which would bring about unhappiness.

Seneca says:

Xenocrates and Speusippus think that one can become happy even by virtue alone, but not that there is one good, that is morality (honestum). (Epistulae morales 85.18 [1965: I.292; 1920: 294, 295])

This can be seen as expressive of the same reservation Cicero had. If Speusippus and Xenocrates espoused the view that the virtuous man was always happy but thought that there were non-moral evils such as poverty and pain, then they thought that there were non-moral good things as well: the absence of poverty and the absence of pain. So (on Cicero’s and Seneca’s account) they were not consistent in maintaining that virtue (which incorporates only moral goods) was sufficient for happiness.

And it appears that Speusippus and Xenocrates did think that there were non-moral goods; Plutarch, in De communibus notitiis adversus Stoicos 13. 1065a [1976: 704, 705]) refers to Speusippus and Xenocrates as “thinking that health is not indifferent and wealth not useless”.

We are left with two views to ascribe to Speusippus (and to Xenocrates): that wisdom, or virtue in general, is sufficient for happiness, and that there are non-moral goods the lack of which conduces to unhappiness. Cicero’s question as to how these can be rendered consistent is a good one, and we have no information about how Speusippus might have answered it.

Let us turn to the one other topic about which we have some purchase on Speusippus’ ethical views, that of pleasure:

Speusippus and the entire old Academy say that pleasure and pain are two evils opposed to each other, but that the good is what is in the middle between the two. (Aulus Gellius, Atticae noctes IX v 4 [1968: 284; 1927: 168, 169])

The inclusion of the rest of the Academy along with Speusippus is presumably due to the influence of Cicero’s teacher Antiochus’ unifying efforts. At any rate, there is confirmation that this was Speusippus’ view, from two passages in Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics: VII 13, which names Speusippus, and X 2. 1173a5–13, which does not, but repeats the argument of the former passage.

In the first of those chapters (in 1153b1–7) Aristotle mentions Speusippus as having attacked the claim that pleasure is something good. He had canvassed arguments to the effect that pleasure is a bad thing earlier in the chapter, and some of the arguments certainly sound like Speusippus (1152b12–20):

And so, in favor of the claim that pleasure is not a good at all, it is argued (1) that every pleasure is a perceptible coming-to-be toward a natural state, while no coming-to-be is of the same kind as its ends, e.g. no house-building is of the same kind as a house. (2) Again, the temperate man avoids pleasures. (3) Again, the intelligent man pursues what is painless, not what is pleasant. (4) Again, pleasures are a hindrance to reflecting, and by as much as one enjoys them, by that much are they more of a hindrance, as with the pleasure of sex; for no one could think in the course of that. (5) Again, there is no art of pleasure, although everything good is the work of an art. (6) Again, children and wild animals pursue pleasures.

Assuming that we correctly understood Speusippus’ response to the Universal Pursuit Argument, (2), (3), and (6) are consonant with that response.

But (1) plainly echoes material in Plato’s Philebus (see esp. 53c–55a). And that leads to the interesting suggestion that in that dialogue Plato is entering the dispute between Eudoxus and Speusippus. It has been suggested independently of that passage that Speusippus is lurking behind the ‘harsh thinkers’, the anti-hedonists, of 44a–47b (Schofield 1971; Dillon 1996).

If that is right, and if Graeser’s suggestion that Plato in the Parmenides is responding to some of Speusippus’ metaphysical views (Graeser 1997, 1999; see also Halfwassen 1993), it is plain that the understanding of some of what is going on in late Plato would be aided by an understanding of what was going on in Speusippus. The loss of his writings is regrettable indeed.

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Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

For the update in August 2024, Giulia De Cesaris was primarily responsible for the content of Sections 1 and 2, while Sections 3 and 4 substantially remain as originally written by Russell Dancy.

Copyright © 2024 by
Russell Dancy
Giulia De Cesaris <giulia.decesaris@unito.it>

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