1. Doyal and Gough argue that human beings have “basic needs” for physical health and “autonomy”, which they define as “the ability to make informed choices about what should be done and how to go about doing it” (Doyal and Gough 1991: 53). From these two basic needs, they then derive a range of “intermediate needs” for various goods that seem essential to the satisfaction of the basic needs. However, the notion of autonomy is employed in two senses in their analysis. The first type of autonomy consists in the ability of the individual to draw on her culture to formulate and choose personal goals and then to pursue these goals in a rational way. The second type, which Doyal and Gough term “critical autonomy”, involves an ability to critique and move beyond the culture that the individual inherits (see Doyal and Gough 1991: 67–69, 187–190). The latter notion of autonomy is much stronger than the first, and is certainly not endorsed, even implicitly, in all societal cultures or by proponents of all ethical doctrines. For many religious communities, for example, critical autonomy might look like a threat to the good life, not a basic human need. For an argument that the Doyal-Gough account of basic needs (nevertheless) offers a more ecumenical approach to the specification of social minima than Nussbaum’s approach, see Gough (2003).

2. Not all libertarians would agree with this. Sterba (1998) provides a helpful overview. Note that within Nozick’s framework, one might also conceivably defend the establishment of a social minimum policy regime as an imperfect, second-best form of “rectification” for historical injustices. The existing distribution of private property in contemporary societies has been shaped by terrible historical rights violations such as slavery and theft of land. It can be argued that the victims of such historical rights violations are entitled to some kind of compensation for these violations and/or their knock-on effects. However, where the historical injustices are long in the past, and the pattern of resulting harm and unjust advantage is now hard to discern, it can be hard to tailor rectification in a precise fashion. Rather than making no effort at rectification at all, a libertarian might possibly argue that a society that has experienced these injustices should enact a social minimum, at least as a temporary measure, so as to ensure that nobody is very badly off as a result of past rights violations. See Nozick 1974: 152–153, 230–231.

3. Not all left-libertarians propose a strictly equal division of the relevant external resources. Philippe Van Parijs proposes a “maximin” division, one that maximizes the amount of the relevant assets/asset value held by those with the lowest share of these assets/asset values. Michael Otsuka proposes a distribution that equalises opportunity for welfare, a proposal that might require giving a higher share of external resources to those with low earnings power or health conditions. See Van Parijs 1995, Otsuka 2003.

4. Bruce Ackerman and Anne Alstott 1999, present the case for capital grant of this kind, though they do not propose that it should entirely replace conventional welfare programs. Van Parijs defends, on paternalistic grounds, a periodic income grant over a capital grant (see Van Parijs 1995: chapter 2).

5. Strictly speaking, the difference principle applies to an index of “social primary goods” that includes not only income and wealth but a range of other primary goods including the “social bases of self-respect” and leisure-time. See Rawls 1999 [1971]: 478–479, 2001: 60, 179.

6. This argument can also be made within the framework of Rawls’s theory of justice as briefly outlined in section 2.4.1 above. Rawls’s first principle of justice requires that citizens enjoy a scheme of adequate basic liberties, which liberties include the political liberties of competing for elected office and exercising the vote. Rawls argues that justice not only requires that citizens enjoy these liberties but that the political liberties have what he terms “fair value”. Following the reasoning set out above in the main text, it can be argued that maintaining the fair value of the political liberties requires the enactment of a social minimum (though Rawls himself regards such an argument as superfluous in view of the fact that, in his view, the enactment of a social minimum is independently implied by the difference principle). See Rawls 1993: 327–329, 1999 [1971]: 198–199.

7. The distinction between negative and positive conceptions of liberty is made by Isaiah Berlin in his essay “Two Concepts of Liberty” (Berlin 1969 [1958]). However, the language of positive liberty goes further back at least as far as T.H. Green’s influential essay, “Liberal Legislation and Freedom of Contract” delivered as a lecture in 1881 (see Miller 1991: 21–32). Moreover, the distinction that Berlin makes in his essay is not the same as the distinction made in the main text above. Berlin’s conception of “positive liberty” is closely related to an Idealist conception of freedom as rational self-mastery, a conception that is not necessarily implied by the way I have used the term “positive liberty” above.

8. It may be a concern of this kind that has lead some philosophers sympathetic to left-libertarianism to explore ways in which we might extend the scope of the left-libertarian argument beyond what we conventionally think of as inherited resources to cover other kinds of assets. Philippe Van Parijs, for example, argues that citizens of a society have a right to an equal (or maximin) share of their society’s “job assets” exactly like the right to external assets such as land. Van Parijs argues that we can impute a monetary value to job assets (given by the employment rents attached to jobs) and that we should add the implied sum to the fund from which we pay an unconditional stipend. If we do this, then, in the circumstances of some countries today, the unconditional stipend could well be sufficient to cover most basic needs, perhaps even more than sufficient (see Van Parijs 1995: chapter 4). Whether the traditional left-libertarian argument can be extended convincingly in this way is, however, a matter of controversy. For discussion of Van Parijs’s argument, see Reeve and Williams (2003). For a general critical discussion of left-libertarianism see also Fried 2004.

9. What if a significant section of society stands outside of a broad consensus supporting a Nussbaum-style list of central capabilities? In such a case we might face a conflict between justice and legitimacy. Justice might require that we enact a social minimum in line with the reasonable conception of human capabilities provided by the list, but the just policy will lack legitimacy for some of the citizens who are bound by the policy of enactment. How such conflicts are most appropriately resolved is a very important question, but one that I do not have space to consider here.

10. Means-testing refers to the policy of making eligibility for a welfare benefit depend on how much income and/or wealth the individual or household has; eligibility is restricted to those at or below a specified threshold of income and/or wealth, and the benefit is withdrawn as income and/or wealth increase. The main argument for means-testing is that it targets scarce public funds directly to those most in need. Worries about means-testing include the following: that it creates disincentives for individuals to increase their income/wealth through their own efforts (why bother if the government will cut the benefits it pays you by a near-equivalent amount?); that it stigmatizes the poor as recipients of special assistance, something that is bad in itself and that might lead to low take-up of the benefits so that the poor actually do not receive them; and that by limiting participation in welfare to the poor it renders welfare programs politically vulnerable to cost-cutting. For all these reasons, critics argue that means-testing might not be in the long-term interests of the most needy. For a helpful discussion, critical of means-tested welfare states, see Rothstein (1998).

11. A benefit is provided “in-kind” when the government provides the individual directly with a good or service that he or she needs, or gives the individual a voucher that can be used only to purchase a specified good or service. In-kind benefits are criticized on the grounds that people will typically derive more immediate, subjective welfare if they are given a cash sum equal to the cost of the in-kind benefit and allowed to spend this sum as they like. Supporters of in-kind provision reply that in-kind provision better protects the interests of dependents, such as children; and that in some cases cash provision misses the moral point of the transfer, which is not to generate subjective welfare, but to secure a specific capability. For general discussion, see Thurow (1976); and on the latter point, see also Miller 2000: 211–212.

12. Important contributions here include Beitz (1979 [1999]), Shue (1980), Caney (2005), Ypi (2011), Ip (2016), and Laborde and Ronzoni (2016). Shue argues that universal “basic rights” include a right to subsistence and that citizens of one country have a responsibility to act to secure this right for citizens of another country provided that their own “vital interests” are not jeopardized. Charles Beitz presents an argument that Rawls’s conception of justice should apply transnationally. Given our argument that Rawls’s theory supports institution of a social minimum, this arguably entails a transnational social minimum. Simon Caney argues that egalitarian principles, such as equality of opportunity, apply globally, and one might argue that this supports enacting a global social minimum (for example, because this is necessary to secure equality of opportunity). Lea Ypi argues that since absolute deprivation has as one major cause the inequality of power between states, a concern to enact a global minimum will naturally require us also to address inequality between states. Ka-Wai Ip argues that relational egalitarian principles apply globally. This might also provide theoretical resources to support enactment of a global social minimum. Similarly, Cecile Laborde and Miriam Ronzoni argue that the individual’s interest in freedom as ‘non-domination’ establishes an interest in their state not being dominated by other states. We can argue that this supports economic arrangements at the global level to prevent states becoming so poor that they are at risk of domination by other states. Also relevant here is the literature on global freedom of movement, since freedom of movement could work to reduce risks of global poverty. For relevant discussions see Carens (2015) and Oberman (2015).