Simon of Faversham

First published Thu Feb 8, 2018; substantive revision Tue Oct 15, 2024

Simon of Faversham († 1306) was a thirteenth-century British scholar, mainly known as a commentator on Aristotle’s logic and natural philosophy. He is considered a modist, among other things because of his use of the notions of modi praedicandi and modi essendi in his commentary on Aristotle’s Categories (cf. Marmo 1999). Simon’s work as an Aristotelian commentator heavily relies on Albert the Great’s paraphrases on the Aristotelian corpus. His question-commentaries sometimes portray key medieval discussions in a somewhat undeveloped state, but also offer uniquely developed discussions, for instance his discussion of the Meno paradox in his commentaries on Posterior Analytics and his treatment of empty reference. In the places where his discussions are well developed, he exhibits good philosophical analysis and resourcefulness. Simon’s works are also of great historical interest because they represent an important stage in the development of thirteenth-century philosophical ideas. His corpus is relatively unexplored, and although an important part of it is extant, a large part is also unedited.

1. Life

Simon of Faversham was born circa 1260 in Faversham, a seaport town in Kent, England.[1] He became master of arts at the University of Oxford, but then taught at the Arts faculty of the University of Paris in the 1280s, where probably most of his works were produced, even if he may have revised some of them after his return to Oxford in 1289. Later in life, Simon became a Doctor of Theology at the University of Oxford. After his return to England, he held several clerical offices: sub-deacon at Croydon in 1289, and deacon at Bocking and rector of Preston in 1290. Simon became chancellor of the University of Oxford in 1304. In 1305, archbishop Winchelsey named him archdeacon of Canterbury, the highest ecclesiastical appointment in England for non-priests. After giving up this post, Simon was named rector of Reculver, but soon after he lost his appointment to the candidate of the Papal curia. Simon died in 1306 in a trip to the Papal curia, where he was going to fight the loss of his appointment.

2. Writings

Simon’s philosophical corpus consists mostly of commentaries on the Corpus Aristotelicum. His logical works are undoubtedly the most thoroughly studied, and consist of the following commentaries:

  • 1. Quaestiones libri Porphyrii (=In Isag.)
  • 2. Quaestiones super librum Praedicamentorum (=In Cat.)
  • 3. Quaestiones libri Perihermenias (=In Perih.)
  • 4. Quaestiones super librum Priorum
  • 5. Quaestiones super librum Posteriorum (two redactions)
  • 6. Dicta super librum Topicorum
  • 7. Quaestiones super librum Elenchorum (two series of questions)
  • 8. Sophisma ‘Universale est intentio’
  • 9. Quaestiones super universalia

Most of these are edited. 4, 6 and 9 are only extant in manuscript form, but there are partial editions of 4 and 6.[2]

Simon’s works on Aristotle’s natural philosophy are considerably less studied, and consist of the following commentaries:

  • 10. Quaestiones super libro Physicorum (two series of questions)
  • 11. Quaestiones super librum De anima (=In De an.)
  • 12. Quaestiones super parva naturalia herein
    • 12.1 Quaestiones super librum De somno et vigilia;
    • 12.2 Quaestiones super libro De longitudine et brevitate vitae;
    • 12.3 Quaestiones super libro De iuventute et senectute;
    • 12.4 Quaestiones super libro De inspiratione et respiratione
  • 13. Recollectiones super librum Meteorum
  • 14. In De generatione et corruptione (doubtful)
  • 15. Quaestiones super librum De motu animalium

Most of these are extant only in manuscript form. Only 12.1 has been fully edited (Ebbesen 2013). The questions on De anima III (Sharp 1934) are also edited, although only from one manuscript. Finally, there are partial editions of 10 and 15.[3]

3. Logic

3.1 The Subject Matter and the Division of Logic

Like most thirteenth-century commentators on the logica vetus (Boethius’s Latin translations of Porphyry’s Isagoge and Aristotle’s Categories and De interpretatione, together with Boethius’s commentaries on these texts), Simon of Faversham begins his commentary with a prologue, which treats of the subject matter of logic and the division of logic, corresponding to the division of Aristotle’s Organon into eight(!) treatises.[4]

Like other masters from the last quarter of the thirteenth-century such as Radulphus Brito, Simon considers the subject matter of logic to be the methods of knowledge acquisition (modi sciendi): the intellectual operations whereby we can proceed from something known to the knowledge of something unknown. These methods are definition, division, and, most importantly, the syllogism (In Isag.: prologue). Accordingly, logic is neither a purely theoretical science, as it does not consider essences or quiddities, nor a purely practical science, as its aim is not practical action. As a science, logic is instrumental to the proper functioning of the theoretical sciences (In Isag.: q.1).

As was commonly the case at this time in the thirteenth century, Simon also holds that logic is about logical intentions (cf. In Isag.: q.2). But his logic of intentions is not nearly as developed as that of the later Parisian master Radulphus Brito. Logical intentions are notions that can be applied to the knowledge of what things are essentially, i.e., quiddities. According to Simon, the intellect forms these intentions from the ways things present themselves to it (i.e., from apparentia). Thereafter, the intellect attributes different intentions to different things according to different properties. For instance, after having noticed that some ways of being are common to several things, the intellect forms the logical intention species, after which the intellect can apply this intention to the concept of man and express this act with the assertion ‘man is a species’. Consequently, despite not being a theoretical science, logic is ultimately grounded in the properties of the things from which logical intentions are taken (In Isag.: q.2).

As regards the division of logic, which is more precisely a division of the syllogism, Simon’s commentary is noteworthy in one regard: following in the footsteps of Giles of Rome and the Arabic logical tradition, Simon considers rhetoric and poetics to be parts of logic, i.e., to function by way of syllogisms. Different types of syllogism are demarcated based on the varying degrees of certainty of the premises (In Isag.: prologue). Hence, if the premises are accepted as mere suspicion (suspicio),[5] the syllogism is rhetorical and the conclusion will also be accepted as mere suspicion (a syllogism dealt with in the Rhetoric). If it “proceeds from fictitious premises that portray horror or pleasure” (In Isag.: prologue), the syllogism is poetic and the conclusion will be accepted as an estimation (aestimatio) (a syllogism dealt with in the Poetics). If the syllogism proceeds from acceptable premises, the syllogism is dialectical and the conclusion will be an acceptable belief (a syllogism dealt with in the Topics). If it proceeds from the indubitable indemonstrable principles proper to a given science, the syllogism is demonstrative and the conclusion will be certain and infallible knowledge (a syllogism dealt with in the Posterior Analytics). Finally, if it proceeds from knowledge that seems acceptable, but is not, the syllogism is sophistical and the conclusion will be an error (deceptio) (a syllogism dealt with in the Sophistical Refutations).

In addition to this division of syllogistic reasoning into five types, logic also studies the formal underpinnings of syllogistic reasoning, which is analysed in terms of the moods and figures of Aristotelian syllogistic developed in the Prior Analytics.

Finally, logic is also concerned with the simple notions out of which syllogistic premises are composed. In the Categories, those simple notions are considered insofar as they are related to the category of being. In the De interpretatione, those same notions are considered insofar as they are the subjects and predicates of mental compositions and divisions, i.e., mental assertions (In Isag.: prologue).

3.2 Signification

Simon also contributes to the medieval discussion about the signification of words—whether they signify things or concepts—a discussion prompted by Aristotle’s claim in the first chapter of the De interpretatione that words signify concepts. Simon clearly opposes the Boethian tradition, which defends the immediate signification of concepts, and sides with those who claim that words signify things.[6]

Following a division first attested in Porphyry, Simon divides words into words of first and second imposition. Words of first imposition are given as names of essences, which have being independently of a knowing subject. Words of second imposition are given as names of logical intentions, the being of which depends on a knowing subject. Words of second imposition clearly signify concepts, so the controversy does not concern them. Rather, it concerns words of first imposition, such as ‘human’ and ‘stone’.

For Simon, words of first imposition do not signify a concept but an essence. His argument goes as follows:

  1. ‘X’ signifies x if and only if ‘x’ occasions the concept of x in the listener and expresses the concept of x in the speaker (cf. De int. 1 and 3).
  2. ‘Human’ does not occasion the concept of the concept of human in the listener, nor does it express the concept of the concept of human in the speaker. If it did, real predicates such as ‘run’ could not be verified of any human because obviously the act of running cannot be attributed to the concept of human.
  3. Therefore, ‘human’ does not signify the concept of human; and generally, ‘x’ does not signify the concept of x.
  4. On the contrary, ‘human’ occasions the concept of human in the listener and expresses the concept of human in the speaker.
  5. Therefore, ‘human’ signifies the human essence; and generally, ‘x’ signifies x—an essence.

It is remarkable that, in Simon’s view, ‘x’ signifies x only if both the expression-condition for the speaker and the understanding-condition for the listener are met. This double condition for signification, typical of the last quarter of the thirteenth century, represents a break with the more expression-oriented notion of signification common in the second and third quarters of the century (Marmo 1999).

Now, following the Avicennian idea that existence—mental or actual—is an accident of essences, Simon also makes clear that ‘x’ does not signify essences according to their existence in the external world. In other words, ‘human’ does not signify any particular human, but the human essence. This part of the argument goes as follows:

  1. ‘X’ signifies the same thing the definition of ‘x’ signifies.
  2. The definition of ‘x’ does not signify a particular thing, but a thing only with regard to its essential features and regardless of accidents such as external or mental existence.
  3. Therefore, ‘x’ does not signify a particular x, but x with regard to its essential features and regardless of accidents such as external or mental existence.

Consequently, Simon also holds that when the referents of a word of first imposition are all destroyed, the word does not lose its signification because for a word to signify, its significate—the essence—simply needs to be conceptualized, but an essence can continue to be conceptualized even after the destruction of all its particular instances.

3.3 Truth and Empty Reference

Simon also discusses whether truth is a property of thoughts or of things. He gives a solution typical of the period, according to which truth is above all a property of the knowing subject who is in possession of a true belief (In Perih.: q.6).

Simon accepts the common medieval definition of a true belief as one that is adequate (adequatio) with the way things are. However, unlike other thirteenth-century masters of arts (e.g., Robert Kilwardby and Radulphus Brito), Simon maintains that this adequation concerns the second, and composite, operation of the intellect—composition and division—as well as the first, and simple, one—the apprehension of essences (In Perih.: q.6). Hence, while other masters hold that adequation can only obtain between composite items (i.e., composite thoughts and composite things), Simon holds that, since the intellectual grasping of an essence is naturally in agreement with this essence, it is also susceptible of truth (In Perih.: q.6). Regarding the truth of composite items, however, Simon’s position is remarkably elegant, as is evident in his discussion of empty reference in the commentary on the Prior Analytics.

Simon’s position as regards empty reference is crucially different from the one held by modists such as Boethius of Dacia and Radulphus Brito, who claim that the truth-makers of essential predications, such as ‘the human is an animal’, are real things in the external world, so that ‘the human is an animal’ would be false if no human existed.[7] Simon, by contrast, claims that it is true, supporting his claim with an elegant account of truth-determination. According to him, for an essential predication such as ‘the human is an animal’ to be true, it suffices that the essences expressed by the subject and the predicate are conceptualized and signified. They must be conceptualized because ‘the human is an animal’ expresses the mental composition of the concepts of human and animal, which evidently requires the human and the animal essences to be conceptualized (Ebbesen 1987: 159). They must also be signified because otherwise, ‘the human is an animal’ would have no semantic content at all. However, ‘human’ and ‘animal’ do not need to refer to or signify anything real in the external world.

The latter claim is shown as follows: assertions of the form ‘S is P’[8] involve the relevant mode of being of the significate of the predicate (henceforth ‘of the predicate’). In assertions where real accidents are predicated (e.g., being white, running, etc.), the relevant mode of being of the predicate is actual existence; therefore, their truth-makers must be things in the external world (Ebbesen 1987: 160). Likewise, in assertions where logical intentions are predicated (e.g., being a species or a genus), the relevant mode of being of the predicate is mental existence; therefore, their truth-makers are concepts. But in essential predication, the relevant mode of being is neither actual nor mental existence because essences are independent of any sort of existence; therefore, the truth-makers are simply the essences conceptualized and subsequently signified by the subject and predicate (Ebbesen 1987: 160). Therefore, ‘the human is an animal’ is true even when no human exists, simply because being an animal is a definitional part of being human, that is, being an animal is a part of the human essence.

4. Psychology

4.1 Definition of the Soul and Body/Soul Relation

Simon’s general psychology is standard Aristotelian doctrine, in many aspects derived from Albert the Great’s and Aquinas’s psychological teachings. However, as we shall see, Simon sometimes conflates their views, which suggests that he was not entirely aware of their opposition. Simon holds that the rational soul is the substantial form of the human body because it is that on account of which humans can perform their proper operation, i.e., intellection. However, unlike the substantial form of purely material things, the substantial form of a human being does not emerge from a natural arrangement of matter but is given to the human body as its perfection by an external source, i.e., by the first cause. Simon then describes the soul both as the perfection (like Albert) and as the substantial form (like Aquinas) of the human body, but seems unaware of the conflict between Albert’s and Aquinas’s positions. For Albert, who wants to avoid psychological materialism, the soul is the perfection, and not the form, of the human body; a soul that is given to it by God. For Aquinas, however, who wants to make the rational soul the defining element of the human being, the soul must be the intrinsic substantial form of the human body, which is nonetheless separable after the body’s death. It remains unclear whether Simon intentionally conflated the two views, and if so, whether he thought the two views could be somehow reconciled.

The rational soul has three faculties—vegetative, sensitive and intellectual—of which the sensitive and the intellectual are cognitive. The sensitive faculty is bodily because its operations fully depend on bodily organs. It includes the external senses—touch, taste, smell, hearing, and sight—as well as the so-called internal senses—common sense, phantasia, and memory. By contrast, the intellectual faculty is separate, that is, it is not bodily because it does not depend for its operation on bodily organs, even though it is occasioned by sensory representations. Accordingly, Simon, like Albert and Aquinas, rejects the position of those who, like Avicenna and Averroes, posit some kind of metaphysical separation of the intellect from the human body.

4.2 Metaphysics of the Intellect

According to Simon, the intellect is the faculty of the rational soul whereby it thinks. Simon, who follows the Aristotelian doctrine closely, holds this faculty to be immaterial, passive, and separate. It is separate because it does not need to use a bodily organ in order to perform its operation of intellection. It is also passive, but not in the sense that matter is passive. In fact, there are two senses in which something is said to be passive because it can receive forms with or without undergoing qualitative change. Like matter, the intellect receives forms because it needs an intelligible object on which to perform its proper operation. But matter is passive in a further and more fundamental sense because when it is brought to act by a form, it undergoes qualitative change. The intellect, however, does not undergo qualitative change but is simply actualized. Accordingly, the intellect is passive because it is potential with respect to the act of intellection. And precisely because it does not suffer qualitative change when it is brought to act, the intellect is manifestly immaterial.

The intellectual faculty, i.e., the intellect, comprises a passive capacity—the possible intellect—and an active capacity—the agent intellect, which is the intrinsic active principle of the act of intellection (In De an.: q.13). The proper operation of the passive capacity is apprehension, i.e., the reception of essences through the assimilation of intelligible forms. The proper operation of the active capacity is abstraction, i.e., the production of the intelligible forms that trigger the operation of the possible intellect (In De an.: q.13).

4.3 Intellection as Abstraction and Apprehension

Intellection is the proper operation of an intellect that comprises both a passive and an active capacity. Hence, the psychological mechanisms of intellection include abstraction, performed by the agent intellect, and reception in the possible intellect (In De an.: q.16).

The primary object of intellection is an essence presented to the intellect in the form of an intelligible species (In De an.: q.10). Since forms are material and particular in both external things and sensory representations (phantasmata), and since the intelligible object must be immaterial and universal, the intellect must produce an immaterial object to represent those forms under the aspect of universality—the intelligible species. The intellect does this through the act of abstraction performed by its active capacity, the agent intellect (In De an.: q.12).

The agent intellect endows the essence with intelligibility: through its act of abstraction it makes universal and immaterial the material and particular essence in the sensory representation (In De an.: q.12 and q.16). Simon, however, wavers between different descriptions of the act of abstraction. On the one hand, he describes it as similar to the act of illumination, so that just as light enables the eye to see and the visible object to be seen, so the agent intellect enables the possible intellect to think and the essence in the sensory representation to be thought (In De an.: q.12). Consequently, he seems to consider intellection as similar to the act of vision. But the analogy with vision has its limits because the visible object is visible in itself, whereas the essence in the sensory representation must be made intelligible by the agent intellect. On the other hand, Simon describes the act of abstraction as the extraction of an intelligible species from the sensory representation, a species that is ‘transferred’ to the possible intellect, thus actualizing its act of apprehension (In De an.: q.16). Later commentators would reject one or the other model of abstraction depending on the extent of their realism about essences. Thus, the Averroist master John of Jandun rejects the illumination model because there is no way for something that exists in a bodily organ to be made universal, whether by illumination or otherwise, while remaining in that organ. Radulphus Brito, in turn, rejects the ‘transferring’ model because it fails to explain the transfer of a form from the material to the immaterial realm. Again, it seems Simon is unaware of the conflicts each model faces, as well as of the difficulties that arise from holding them at the same time.

4.4 Dreams and Divination Through Dreams

Since Simon’s commentary on the Parva naturalia does not contain commentaries on De sensu and De memoria, the best place to reconstruct his views on the physiological and psychological mechanisms of sensory cognition is his commentary on De somno et vigilia, which also covers De insomniis and De divinatione per somnum. Question 13* of this commentary provides broad accounts of the physiological and psychological mechanisms of dreams and divination in dreams (ed. Ebbesen 2013).

According to Simon, dreams are produced by the common sense from images (idola) sent to it by the phantasia. Dreams, however, have different origins, stemming either from the dreaming subject or from celestial bodies. If from subject, they stem from either her body or her soul. Dreams stem from someone’s body when the powers of a bodily organ are affected by choleric or phlegmatic humors (two of the four bodily fluids in Hippocratic medical doctrine). When the organs are thus affected, the phantasia forms images that are in agreement with those fluids and sends them to the common sense. A person is then able to dream that she is on fire, for example, if the choleric humor is dominant. Dreams can also stem from someone’s soul when during sleep the soul is affected by a memory, e.g., of a friend who is far away. A person is then able to have a melancholic dream about her friend.

Dreams with their origin in celestial bodies give rise to the possibility of divination in dreams. Such dreams originate from an influx the human body receives from the celestial bodies. The phantasia forms images in agreement with the influx and sends them to the common sense. When the organ of the common sense is affected by those images, the common sense produces likenesses of the things that will happen. Thus, thanks to this influx from celestial bodies, humans are able to foresee the future in dreams, for instance, future wars or bountiful harvests. According to Simon, who follows in Averroes’s footsteps, this sort of dream is divinely given to humans because they lack cognitive access to future events that are useful or harmful. The premonitory dream, however, does not provide an exact indication of the future event. In fact, the diviner must interpret her dream in order to judge what the dream is supposed to foresee. Since divination is part of astrology, a good interpretation requires that one properly understand both the mechanisms of dreams and of celestial bodies (Ebbesen 2013: 144). When properly interpreted, divination in dreams provides accurate information about the future:

… it is infallibly true that the images formed by the phantastic power [i.e., the phantasia] are signs of such effects, and that these effects occur by necessity unless a stronger motion supervenes, which … hinders those effects … (Ebbesen 2013: 145)[9]

So, unless something unexpected happens that changes the course of events, a properly interpreted dream originating from celestial bodies is an almost certain indication that a useful or harmful future event will take place.

5. Metaphysics

Simon did not write a commentary on Aristotle’s Metaphysics, or, if he did, it did not survive. However, his positions on some crucial metaphysical discussions can be found in his commentaries on Porphyry’s Isagoge and Aristotle’s Categories. Here we will sketch his views on two related issues: universals and individuals, and essence and existence.

5.1 Universals and the Principle of Individuation

According to Simon, universality is a notion the intellect attributes to some things that exhibit the capacity to inform several individuals. Take, for instance, Socrates. Socrates presents himself as a being endowed with reason and sensation. The soul realizes that reason and sensation are found in multiple individuals, so it takes being a rational animal—being a human—as a unified thing that essentially determines many individuals. So, on the one hand, being a human really inheres in Socrates and as such it exists only particularly. On the other hand, the intellect considers being a human as a unity that can occur in several individuals and as such being a human is a universal, and more specifically, a species. Following in the footsteps of Avicenna, Simon considers two modes of being of essences: a particular mode in individuals and a mental mode as the content of concepts to which the notion of universality is applied. In this sense, universals are merely notional or intellectual, as everything that exists in the external world is particular:

… the human according to existence outside the soul is not a species, because according to external existence it is particular, but it is a species according to existence in the soul. In fact, the intellect grounds the intention of the species in the consideration of the nature of the human as one in many. (In Isag.: q.4)[10]

In other words, universality is a mode of understanding things that exhibit the capacity to inform several individuals:

… we must not posit a universal human because it exists universally. Rather, [human] is universal because it is understood universally, when [the intellect] sets aside all the individuating conditions. (In Isag.: q.5)[11]

It is also noteworthy that the essence need not actually inform several individuals. Indeed, Simon also holds that the intellect can apply the notion of species to an essence instantiated in only one individual, as in the case of the sun and the moon (which were considered to be species in his time). Simon grounds his position not only in the examples of these celestial bodies but also via the following argument:

  1. If a species required several actual instances, this would be either as regards essence or as regards existence.
  2. Not as regards essence, because being instantiated in one or in many is not included in the definition of an essence.
  3. Nor as regards existence, because from the example of celestial bodies, it is evident that an essence can sufficiently exist in only one individual.
  4. Therefore, a species does not require several actual instances of the essence. (In Isag.: q.26)

In sublunary beings, however, the species is in fact always instantiated in several individuals. Simon’s explanation of this fact also reveals his position on the principle of individuation. According to him, in sublunary beings a single individual never exhaustively actualizes all of matter that can be actualized by its essence:

Why are there several instances of sublunary beings? … because all the matter pertaining to one species is not found in one individual. … But in superior beings all of the matter pertaining to one species is found in one individual. (In Isag.: q.26)[12]

The multiplication of individuals of the same kind is caused by the existence of chunks of matter that can be actualized by the same essence through a quantitative division of matter (In Isag.: q.26). But this is only the principle of individuation of sublunary material beings. Superior immaterial beings are fundamentally individual, as Simon tells us in his commentary on De anima:

… particulars are twofold: some by matter, some by subsistence (the intelligences are particular in the latter way). Hence, I say that my intellect is particular, not by matter, but by subsistence, inasmuch as it is a power subsistent per se and not the act of a body. (In De an.: q.8)[13]

Simon seems to hold a twofold account of individuation: there is individuation by the division of quantified matter through essence, which explains the individuation of material beings; and individuation by subsistence, which explains the individuation of immaterial beings such as celestial bodies, the intelligences, and the human intellect. Simon undoubtedly introduces his twofold account to circumvent the Averroistic solution to the question of the individuation of superior beings via the introduction of spiritual matter.

5.2 Essence and Existence

In question 20 of his commentary on Aristotle’s Categories, Simon argues that substances are either compound or simple. In addition, all created substances are a composition of essence and existence. Compound substances are also composed of matter and form. The reason why all created substances are composed of essence and existence is that existence is not part of their essence, but given to them extrinsically by the first being. Thus, Simon strongly suggests that he is committed to a real distinction between essence and existence.

However, as John Longeway pointed out in an earlier version of this entry, Simon changes his mind about this. This change is evident in question 49 of his second commentary on Posterior Analytics, where he addressed the question of whether existence is something added to the essence. Here, Simon objects to Aquinas’s claim that existence is something added to the essence with the following argument:

  1. If added existence is something real, then it is actual.
  2. So, it is either a first or a second actuality.
  3. Not a first, because a first actuality is not different from the essence.
  4. Not a second, because a second actuality is an operation that presupposes actual existence.
  5. Moreover, it cannot be a third actuality, because this is contrary to Aristotelian doctrine (furthermore, it would lead to an infinite regress, as Radulphus Brito would point out).
  6. Therefore, added existence is not something real. (Longeway 2000: 7–8)

Even so, Simon still holds that existence is something added to created beings. But how, if not as something real? Since we can understand what a thing is without considering its possible modes of existence (i.e., actual, mental etc.), it seems that there is indeed a distinction between essence and existence (cf. Longeway 2000: 9). So, the distinction is either notional or real. It is not real, as was shown with the argument above. Therefore, the distinction must be notional: since the definition of an essence does not include existence at all, existence must be a notion added to the essential definition, a notion that refers to the relation of a substance to its cause (cf. Longeway 2000: 10–11). Hence, we can think of a substance as some kind of thing (e.g., a man) according to its essence (esse essentiae), but we can also think of it as something that exists in a causally ordered reality, according to its being in an effect (esse in effectu) (cf. Longeway 2000: 13).

5.3 Predication of Being

Finally, in question 27 of his commentary on the Categories, Simon straightforwardly opts for the analogy of the predication of being across the ten Aristotelian categories. Being is not univocally predicated as the genus of the categories because it is not univocally predicated of substance and accident. In fact, accidents do not have being without qualification because they only have being in relation to substances, and so their being depends on the being of substances. But being is not purely equivocal with respect to substance and accident either, because accidents have being in a certain respect thanks to their relation to substances. Being, then, is analogous to substance and accident: it is primarily predicated of substances and secondarily predicated of accidents.

Bibliography

Primary Literature (edited)

  • Ebbesen, Sten, 2013, “Simon of Faversham, Quaestiones super librum De somno et vigilia. An Edition”, Cahiers de l’Institut du Moyen Age Grec et Latin (henceforth CIMAGL) 82: 91–145. <available online>
  • Longeway, John Lee, 1977, “Simon of Faversham’s Questions on the Posterior Analytics: A Thirteenth-Century View of Science”, Ph.D. dissertation, Cornell University. [Dissertation Abstracts International, 38(7): 4211–A.]
  • Ottaviano, Carmelo, 1930, “Le Quaestiones super libro Praedicamentorum di Simone di Faversham”, Atti della Reale Accademia Nazionale die Lincei, serie 6, Memorie della Classe di Scienze Morali, Storiche e Filologiche, 3: 257–351.
  • Simon of Faversham, [SF-OL] 1957, Magistri Simonis Anglici sive de Faverisham Opera Omnia. Vol. 1: Opera logica,
    (1) Quaestiones super libro Porphyrii
    (2) Quaestiones super libro Praedicamentorum
    (3) Quaestiones super libro Perihermeneias
    edited by Pasquale Mazarella, Pubblicazioni dell’Instituto universitario di magistero di Catania, serie filosofica, testi critici, 1, Padua: Cedam.
  • –––, 1984, Quaestiones super libro Elenchorum, edited by Sten Ebbesen, Thomas Izbicki, John Longeway, Francesco del Punta, Eileen Serene, and Eleonore Stump, Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Mediaeval Studies.
  • Yokoyama, Tetsuo, 1969, “Simon of Faversham’s Sophisma: Universale est intentio”, Mediaeval Studies, 31: 1–14.

Secondary Literature

  • Christensen, Michael S., 2015, “Simon of Faversham Quaestiones super De motu animalium. A partial edition and doctrinal study”, CIMAGL, 84: 93–128. <available online>
  • Clerke, Agnes Mary, 1897, “Simon of Faversham”, Oxford Dictionary of National Biography, vol. 52: 263.
  • Corbini, Amos, 2006, La teoria della scienza nel XIII secolo. I commenti agli “Analitici secondi”, Firenze: Edizioni del Galluzzo.
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Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

I would like to thank the Knut and Alice Wallenberg Foundation (Sweden) for their financial support.

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