1. Drawing on Gibson’s ecological approach, and the notion that the very flow pattern of optical information provides us with an awareness of our own movement and posture and that all perception consequently involves a kind of self-sensitivity, a co-awareness of self and of environment (Gibson 1966, 111–126), Bermúdez (1998, 128) writes: “If the pick-up of self-specifying information starts at the very beginning of life, then there ceases to be so much of a problem about how entry into the first-person perspective is achieved. In a very important sense, infants are born into the first-person perspective. It is not something that they have to acquire ab initio.” See Gallagher (2005) for the connection between the developmental research and phenomenological conceptions of self-consciousness. For a more extensive discussion of the similarities between the non-conceptual self-awareness and the phenomenological view, see Zahavi (2002).

2. For some interesting attempts at articulating the differences and similarities between the standard higher-order accounts, Brentano’s two-object account, and the non-objectifying approach of the phenomenologists, cf. Kriegel and Williford (2006), and Kriegel (2006).

3. Anna Giustina, has recently defended what she calls an acquaintance theory of phenomenal consciousness. On this proposal, what makes a mental state conscious is the fact that its subject is acquainted with the mental state in question, where acquaintance is understood as a metaphysically and epistemically direct relation (2022, 2). Giustina also speaks of how acquaintance illuminates the first-order representation and how the acquaintance relation is unique and only to be found in conscious minds (2022, 22, 26). We would read such statements as testifying to an increasing rapprochement with the phenomenological account.

4. Given the complexity involved in discussions of the self and self-consciousness, given that available concepts of self target bodily, narrative and reflective components, and given that the relevant neuroscience reflects multiple self-related phenomena (involving both the Default Mode Network and the Salience Network) – a complexity which is acknowledged by those who argue against the universalist claim on the basis of alleged ego dissolution in instances of hallucinogenic or meditation experiences (e.g., Letheby & Gerrans, 2017) – it is not always clear that minimal prereflective self-consciousness is absent. Indeed, some of the relevant empirical studies of “absent” self-consciousness depend on subjective reports of non-dual experiences (e.g., Dor-Ziderman et al. 2013; Nave et al. 2021), and it is difficult to understand how such reports would be possible without a form of “witness” consciousness or “reflexive awareness” (Dunne 2011, 74)that could well be interpreted as a form of prereflective self-consciousness. See Zahavi (2014, 2018, 2019) for further discussion. For discussions of these issues in the context of Buddhist meditation practices, see Gallagher 2023, Chapter 9; Gallagher et al. 2023).

5. Husserl’s analysis is not inconsistent with the concepts of ecological perception and sensory-motor “affordances” as they are later worked out in Gibsonian psychology. My actual and potential bodily movements specify the possible uses for things that I encounter in the world. This kind of analysis is further developed in Merleau-Ponty’s phenomenology of perception and embodiment. This view on perception also shares some obvious similarities with the recent so-called enactive approach to perception. Compare Husserl’s views with the following programmatic statement by Alva Noë: “Perception is not something that happens to us, or in us. It is something we do. Think of a blind person tap-tapping his or her way around a cluttered space, perceiving that space by touch, not all at once, but through time, by skilful probing and movement. This is, or at least ought to be, our paradigm of what perceiving is. The world makes itself available to the perceiver through physical movement and interaction. … [A]ll perception is touch-like in this way: Perceptual experience acquires content thanks to our possession of bodily skills. What we perceive is determined by what we do (or what we know how to do); it is determined by what we are ready to do. In ways I try to make precise, we enact our perceptual experience; we act it out” (Noë 2004, 1).

6. Some analyses of schizophrenic experiences of thought insertion or delusions of control claim that the pre-reflective sense of agency is disrupted in such symptoms (Frith 1992; Gallagher 2004). This has led to an ongoing debate about whether it is the sense of agency or the sense of ownership that is missing in these symptoms, or whether the disruption occurs on a reflective level, or whether we should think of such delusions as involving extra experiences of alienation (e.g., Bortolotti & Broome 2009; Billon 2013; Billon & Kriegel 2014).