1. Tommy J. Curry cautions that King’s vision of the Beloved Community was not identical to Royce’s; he argues that the two versions are in fact incompatible (2018, 190–97).

2. There have been a number of articles and conference presentations on this debate; the “Symposium on Curry’s Another white Man’s Burden,” 2021, Pluralist, 16(2), provides an overview of the debate, along with six papers and a review of Curry’s book.

3. Scholars could for example acknowledge the objectionable baggage of Royce’s phrase, then subsequently and deliberately reject using the example in their own discussions of Roycean loyalty.

4. More broadly, Royce seemed to embrace the notion of a singular “Western civilization” rooted in Greek, Roman, and Judeo-Christian history.

5. Royce rightly observed that “Such objects as ‘the modes of action’ have never been regarded heretofore as logical entities in the sense in which classes and propositions have been so regarded. But in fact our modes of action are subject to the same general laws to which propositions are subject” (1913a, 131).

6. In his 1905 “Foundations” paper, Royce observed “the ‘yes-no’ relation—the earliest exact relation defined by the human mind” (1905, 386; 1905a, 6).

7. Royce noted that the \(O\)-relation was initially proposed as the “symmetrical copula” of “inconsistency” in the logical algebra developed by Christine Ladd-Franklin in 1883 (1905, 384). If \(A\) is inconsistent with \(B\), then if \(A\) is true, \(B\) is false or \(A\) implies not \(B\). Note that unlike the material conditional \((A \supset B)\), the implication entailed by the inconsistency relation is a strict condition \((A \Rightarrow B)\).

8. A complement is defined as a term obversely related to another such that if \(\beta\) is a collection of modes of action and \(O(\beta \:q)\), then \(q\) is a complement of \(\beta \). A resultant is a compatible relation such that if \(O(\beta\: q)\) and \(O(q \: r)\), then both \(r\) and \(\beta \) are obverses of \(q\) and so related to each other such that \(r\) is a resultant of \(\beta \).

9. This principle is a central commitment of the neo-Hegelian idealism that Royce shared with other late 19^th century Anglo-American idealists where negation is generative and implied by the existence of individuals. If there exists an \(x\) there must also exist something \(\neg x\). One of the central claims of the realist philosophers in their opposition to idealism was that logic should contain no generative principles but instead should map the relation of existing things (the objects of empirical study). Negation then is a propositional characteristic but not an ontological one. For Royce, since logic applied equally to propositions and objects or actions, negation was a real and generative property (Pratt, 2011).

10. See Robert Burch (2011) for a discussion Royce’s late work on the tetradic relations (not discussed here).

11. That is, the conditionals are strict conditionals of the sort proposed by Royce’s student, C. I. Lewis. It will be seen later that the conditionals are more complex and, rather than being strict conditionals related by necessity, conditionals in System \(\Sigma\) are conditionals related by shared parameters (and so understood relationally).

12. See Royce’s extended discussion of \(F\)-relations (1905, 405 ff.).

13. Royce argued that the \(F\)-relation is simply an \(O\)-relation in another form (1905, 387). From an agency perspective, this seems incorrect since the \(F\)-relation also represents action carried out and alternative possibilities lost. It may be that Royce’s reductive view of \(F\)-relations is a claim about what is needed to produce action. \(F\)-relations, even as they mark actual accomplishments, arise on the basis of possibilities that are framed and known through O-relations. In the Foundations paper Royce noted that “logical relations can be indifferently stated as \(O\)-relations, or stated as \(F\)-relations … In fundamental meaning all these relations spring from a common root” (1905, 387). His student, Henry Sheffer challenged this conclusion (Sheffer, 1908; Scanlan, 2011; Pratt, 2011).

14. While the strict conditional \(\Box (\neg C \supset B)\) solves the shared parameter issue of the material conditional by asserting a necessary connection, the \(\Sigma\) version links \(\neg C\) and \(B\) through the propositional parameter \(A\) that must hold in whatever possible world where \(\neg C \supset B\) is true. On this model, since each propositional parameter either holds or doesn’t in each world, when \(A\) is a parameter, the \(\neg C \supset B\) is true, but when \(B\) is the shared parameter, it is not.