Reason and Religious Commitment

First published Tue Nov 5, 2024

This entry explores six general approaches to the reconciliation of reason and religious commitment and the relations among them. Though it touches on the intellectual status of theism and the rational credentials of Christianity, these are not its central themes. Instead, it addresses the supernatural or transcendent reference that makes religious commitment at once philosophically interesting and philosophically problematic, examining the main ways of seeking to remove the latter feature without imperiling the former.

1. Preliminaries

Religion is a hallmark of human life. It appears today in many guises: Hindu, Jewish, Buddhist, Christian, Islamic, and so on. Sometimes forgotten, but important to consider when filling in the “and so on”, are the various strands of Indigenous religiousness around the world, which may offer a glimpse of what religion was like long before the so-called major world religions emerged.

Taking such ordinary and accepted examples of religion as our guide, and against the backdrop of what is known about human commitments, we may formulate an account of religious commitment. Religious commitment, let us say, is exemplified by all and only those who intentionally join in the practices of some such tradition or way of life, positively engaging with its thought-forms and structuring their lives by its goals—goals such as awakening to the Buddha-nature or realizing the character of Christ or alignment with what’s ultimately real (cf. Audi 2011: 8–9). “Positive engagement with religious thought-forms” will often enough involve belief of religious propositions. But it need not do so: religious commitment is often sustained through periods when the religious are in doubt about the truth of religious propositions and sometimes is even entered into in that mode—here consider those whose positive emotional response to religion is strong enough to offset intellectual concerns, or the pragmatic choosing of such a commitment by some religious skeptics. Philosophers have recently noticed this fact and analyzed it in terms of such propositional alternatives to believing as accepting (Alston 1996), trusting (Audi 2011), and assuming (Howard-Snyder 2013). Whatever the worth of their analyses, the fact is clear. And so propositional religious belief should not be made a requirement of religious commitment.

A similar point applies to faith. A devoted Buddhist or Taoist or Hindu might or might not exhibit religious faith, but surely does evince religious commitment. The notion of commitment is the more fundamental, religiously. That so much attention has been given to the concept of religious faith in philosophy of religion may reflect no more than the dominance of theistic forms of religion, whose adherents speak of faith, in the imagination of Western philosophers (Sikka 2017).

One could think of religious commitment more broadly still, stretching “some such” in the expression “some such tradition or way of life” to the point where commitments quite dissimilar to those ordinarily called religious, such as the commitment of the fictionalist, who has decided to treat religion like a particularly engrossing novel, or of the dedicated nature-lover, or even that of the activist or the positive thinker, may count as religious given strong enough attendant fervor or perhaps a special grandeur of conception. With such stretching one might easily locate instances of religious commitment that no one would find rationally problematic. Some of these, no doubt, would be worthy of philosophical discussion. But if we went that route we would miss what it is about religion that has made it look problematic to many philosophers. And this entry is about how one can try to show that appearance to be deceiving. Thus we will need to keep our understanding of religion within more familiar bounds.

So what gives rise to the appearance just mentioned? This we can identify by noticing that, with ordinary religion as our guide, we will regard the religiously committed as taking on board the idea that something transcendent of the natural world is fundamental in reality (or at any rate more fundamental than the dimensions of reality accessible to science). And not just anything transcendent either: something transcendent that embodies surpassing value and can greatly enhance human life. Call this religious transcendence.

Given the greater mobility of people and ideas, an increasingly sophisticated understanding of history, and advances in science and technology, claims about religious transcendence have in many domains been set back on their heels—and this whether we imagine them believed or only accepted, trusted, or assumed. One of these domains is philosophy. But at the same time its transcendent reference makes religion philosophically interesting. A life grounded by religious commitment is a distinctive option for those to consider who contemplate axiological issues about how to live a good life or how to attain meaning in life. And were religious claims about transcendence to win rational support, the many philosophers who embrace metaphysical naturalism, which entails the falsity of all such claims, would be set back on their heels. In either context, metaphysics or axiology, we would have a result of great philosophical significance if it turned out that reason is not opposed to religious commitment. For then the religious option would be a live option and rightly regarded as worthy of serious consideration. No doubt there are other areas of philosophy, too, where religion would make its presence felt in that eventuality.

As the allusion above to the influence of science and the popularity of naturalism already suggests, the ranks of the philosophically minded include many who don’t think religion’s presence should be felt in philosophy. Some insist that right-thinking people will suppose there to be something wrong with religion and wish to have nothing to do with it. Others have ceased thinking about religion altogether. However religion still provokes interest and has its defenders in philosophy, who, whether from private sentiment or a sense of public duty, because of a maverick streak or the love of creative challenge, explore ways of reconciling reason and religious commitment. What they have in mind may involve a rational justification for those already religiously committed to remain so, or a justification for entering into a religious commitment for the first time, generating the intention and the other behavior that bring it into being. We can therefore think of a reconciliation of reason and religious commitment as enabling either or both of these results to be achieved.

How may such a reconciliation be attempted? It is possible to distinguish six main ways. The first three, which involve, respectively, appeals to argument, experience, and testimony, have been pursued largely within the confines of the most widely subscribed forms of traditional religion—though we will see that this is far from an absolute limit. The last three, which will have us exploring, in turn, the themes of ineffability, pluralism, and evolution, seek to open our minds to other vistas.

2. The Way of Argument

It is sometimes said that no one has ever become religious in response to an argument. But even if that eminently doubtable statement were true, the construction of arguments with the aim of establishing or making probable the truth of some religious proposition would remain an obvious and natural way of trying to make religious commitment rationally unproblematic. If we were able to do as much as that by reasoning, then reason could hardly object to our consorting with the proven or probabilified proposition.

A religious proposition that philosophers have often approached with this aim, certainly in the West but also elsewhere (e.g., in ancient India), is a proposition at the root of much traditional religion: the claim that there is a God, an all-powerful, all-knowing, and all-good creator of any universe there may be. Of course one might want the whole tree or at least a branch, not just the root. But the idea of God we see here is by itself substantive enough to do a good deal of work in philosophy (e.g., in the regions of metaphysics concerned with fundamental explanation) and can give shape to a religious commitment involving such things as prayer and spiritual contemplation. So if one has provided sufficient rational support through reasoning for the idea that God exists, one might claim to have effected a basic reconciliation of reason and religious commitment.

Unfortunately, however, a good many of the arguments on offer in this connection are not really arguments about the religious idea of God at all. Though they may be of interest, philosophically, for other reasons, they therefore provide no basis for a God-centered religious commitment. Take, for example, the classical teleological or design argument (Paley 1802). An intellectual powerhouse a couple of centuries ago, before it was subdued by Darwin, this argument, even if successful, would show no more than that a supernatural intelligent designer exists. There is metaphysical content here, about something that allegedly exists or is real, but nothing axiological (to do with its value) or soteriological (to do with how it might heal and positively transform our lives). The best-known cosmological argument, similarly, rests content with the notion of a being that can’t not exist, a necessary being, that is distinct from the cosmos or universe and responsible for its existence (Leibniz 1714). Even if we were rationally compelled to use the notion of a necessary being to explain the existence of our apparently non-necessary or contingent universe—and the classical objections to this move (Hume 1779) are as well known as it is—we might still reasonably wonder whether we had proved the existence of God. Of the big three classical “theistic” arguments, only Anselm’s ontological argument (Anselm 1077), focused not on explanation but on facts about the nature of the divine alone, brings into view anything like the value-laden properties needed for a religious conception of transcendence. But the greatest possible being referenced by it might conceivably be something quite different from a personal creator possessed of all power, knowledge, and goodness. Now this last point needn’t produce any worry at all for people willing to contemplate a religious commitment not specifically centered on traditional theism (sections 5–7 will feature plenty of examples), and so investigation of ontological arguments might fruitfully continue among those promoting the way of argument. A more serious worry is that these arguments, including even the quite sophisticated instances found in recent philosophy, are embroiled in difficulties such as an apparent tendency to beg the question or to invite quite non-religious parodies that seem equally strong (see, e.g., Everitt 2004, Oppy 1995, and Sobel 2004).

As one might expect, contemporary theistic philosophers have noticed the problem about a scarcity of religious content. They have responded in two main ways. The first response involves extending the classical sort of argumentation, moving it closer to religious terrain with reasoning intended to allow the inference that God exists. Consider the ancient Arabic kalām cosmological argument, recently returned to popularity (Craig 1979), which speaks vaguely of the universe having a beginning which something caused. To it one may add premises stating that only a personal being able to exercise free will could have caused the beginning of the existence of our universe (for this and other examples of such augmented reasoning, see Craig & Moreland 2009). But while such premises, perhaps with the help of others even more conspicuously religious, may allow the problem of religiously limited inferential power to be overcome, another liability familiar to those who work with arguments, that of questionable plausibility in one’s premises, is often thereby introduced. Such extensions have generally been no more convincing for those not antecedently committed to them than the reasoning they extend (for criticism of the kalām extension, see Morriston 2000).

It is in this context that we can understand the significance of the second response to the problem about scarce religious content—the Bayesian approach that entered the philosophy of religion in the 1970s. This approach involves an inductive or probabilistic reformulation of traditional arguments aimed precisely at providing support for the existence of God as religiously understood. Here many of the traditional arguments, teleological, cosmological, and so on, are converted into more modest confirmational arguments, each of which is intended to add to the probability of the full theistic conclusion, regarded as an explanatory hypothesis in the Bayesian way. And these various confirmational arguments, taken together or cumulatively, are supposed—sometimes with some help from religious experience—to make that hypothesis overall probable (Swinburne 2004; for a significant Bayesian version of specifically teleological reasoning that exploits “finetuning” results in physics, see Collins 2009).

Where the Bayesian approach runs into trouble is in its probability assignments, which are often controversial. Should we, for example, take the existence of a complex physical universe to be more likely on the hypothesis that God exists than on its denial? When we consider that its denial, the claim that God does not exist, is equivalent to a huge disjunction, which says that this or that or some other nontheistic possibility is realized, we may well find it hard to tell (Draper 2016a). One of the most disputed issues in this area concerns the important matter of how probable the God-hypothesis is before its power to explain the various phenomena of experience is taken into account. Clearly, unless this “intrinsic” or “prior” probability is judged to be reasonably high, any number of arguments that increase the probability of that religious hypothesis might even jointly be insufficient to bring its overall probability to the level that the theist needs it to attain. Now the simplicity of a hypothesis, which is to say its relative lack of complexity, may be thought to determine its prior probability and to allow for everything needed in the theistic case (Swinburne 1997, 2004). But the first half of this proposal is controversial (Grünbaum 2008, Sober 2015, Willard 2014) and other proposals on the determination of prior probability in the case of God’s existence challenge the second half (Draper 2016b, Poston 2020). Discussion of these matters continues, as it should.

Another traditional application of the way of argument involves the notion of odd or unusual events, which the arguer seeks to show are realized in a manner inviting supernatural explanation and the label “miracle”. Such argumentation, its philosophical advocate may note, lends itself to use in various religious contexts. Not just God, but other possible deities and also human beings able to command religiously transcendent power, might be able to perform miracles if there is a religiously transcendent dimension to reality, thus bringing rational credibility to the associated religious propositions and to religious commitments based on them.

But this version of the argumentative approach faces problems, too. One is that its use in “various religious contexts” generates an inconsistent set of religious claims, all supported in just the same way—by what appear to be miracles. The eighteenth century philosopher David Hume saw this, arguing that the force of any one religious miracle claim is therefore canceled by that of the rest (Hume 1748). Another interesting problem concerns the justice of such events, which, at least if religiously relevant, are likely to involve a healing or some other positively evaluable event that leave many sufferers or otherwise needy people who face much the same troubling circumstances out in the cold (Overall 1985). The religious community hoping to make use of such events in the intellectual domain had better be one that can tolerate such apparently arbitrary discrimination.

Quite apart from these issues, there is a cluster of problems concerning the very idea of a miracle that any proponent of miracle-based argumentation must work to solve. These arise because a miracle of the relevant kind must be more than just an astonishing and unusual event: the religious argument requires what Hume called a violation of natural law—in more contemporary terms, a “nonrepeatable counterinstance” to a law of nature (Hume 1748; Swinburne 1970: 26). Only this invites a supernatural explanation. And even if one does not think, as Hume did, that the evidence supporting the notion that such an event has occurred can never be stronger than the evidence supporting a contrary view made available by the law itself, one would still need to show that our understanding of natural regularities has indeed been contravened—that no laws of nature known to us will cover the event. For another thing, one would need reasonable support for the view that the “law” violated is a true law, and not one that might be replaced by science in the future. Finally, one would need reason to suppose that invoking a religious entity or power by way of explanation puts us further ahead, intellectually, than regarding any real violation as a freak event whose occurrence is a brute fact with no explanation at all. Perhaps a premise stating or implying that all these conditions have been satisfied will one day be satisfactorily defended, but we shouldn’t expect this to be an easy job. (For relevant discussion, see Mackie 1982 and Swinburne 1970.) Indeed, here we have a fine illustration of the challenge to traditional religious thought represented by the progress of science.

The way of argument, as we have seen, though rightly advertised as potentially a direct route to establishing concordance between reason and religious commitment, faces a number of difficulties. And we haven’t even mentioned the vulnerability it must accept to arguments on the other side of the religious question, however the latter is answered—if the answer is theistic, these will of course be arguments against theism such as the argument from evil (for recent work on this, see Draper forthcoming) and the hiddenness argument (Schellenberg 2015). Such difficulties might be overcome in the future, though there is no reason for theists or others in the religious community to be sanguine on this point. (A noteworthy attempt to resolve the main issues concerning theism through a dialogue more careful and respectful than most is Rasmussen & Leon 2019.) What religious people might also hope the future will bring is more modest and (thus) more promising argumentation: reasoning aimed, not at establishing the rational credibility of specific, detailed religious propositions like those found in much traditional religion, but at supporting the barer, more general claim that there is a religiously ultimate reality, or that some religiously transcendent reality exists. Such reasoning might have to include reference to alleged experience of the reality in question, which, given the phenomenological content of such experience, would immediately deliver a connection to value-related and thus religiously relevant considerations. (This need not produce any overlap with the way of experience, discussed below, which as we’ll see does not involve arguing from premises about religious experience to a religious conclusion.) It’s worth noting that even the modest claim about religious transcendence, precisely because of its religious character, gives us much more to work with than just the notion that there is something beyond nature. Should this religious proposition be made convincing by argument, there would be clear consequences for living to which one might reasonably bind oneself in a religious commitment—if only the consequence that one ought devotedly to seek a fuller understanding of the nature of this reality that by definition embodies, and can transmit to human life, surpassing value.

3. The Way of Experience

It is easy to see how an appeal to special experiences might seem a natural recourse when credentials are sought in the context of religion. From time immemorial, saints and seers have claimed a closer proximity to the divine than ordinary experience affords. But in the context of philosophy one may labor to locate its relevance. Here the sentiment felt more frequently is that of John Locke, who derided “enthusiasm” free of rational oversight (1690 [1975] IV.19.2). Nevertheless, in the last few decades an experiential approach has found its way to the center of attention in philosophical discussions of religious credentials, too. And the religious experiences not just of seers and saints but of ordinary people in the midst of day to day life have come to be viewed as highly relevant.

This shift was precipitated by the work of philosophers who take their cue from what lived religious commitments are really like, maintaining that there need be no mismatch between how such commitments are actually rooted, when as so frequently their source is religious experience rather than argument, and what will prove satisfying to reason in the context of philosophy. On this approach, even when religious persons are unable to find other beliefs from whose content the content of their religious beliefs can successfully be inferred, deductively, inductively, or abductively, in the manner emphasized by the way of argument, the latter beliefs may still be grounded directly in experiential circumstances, whether these should involve receipt of a dramatic vision apparently of religious realities or only a humble background sense apparently of God’s sustaining presence.

One way of describing what’s said to be rationally permitted here is the following: even when religious believers don’t believe on the basis of propositional evidence, their religious beliefs can appropriately be basic, alongside other basic beliefs (beliefs not based on other beliefs) that we legitimately form, such as the belief, in the midst of calculation, that 2 x 3 = 6 or, as noon approaches, that one is feeling hungry or, looking out a window, that it’s snowing outside. Epistemological strictures that would rule this out can be argued to be self-refuting or arbitrary in some way (Plantinga 2000). Or one may focus specifically on the beliefs sent our way by the senses, arguing that there is an analogy between sensory experience and perceptually structured religious experiences such that if—as most philosophers would accept—the former can rationally justify sensory belief, the latter can rationally justify the parallel sort of religious belief (Alston 1991, Wainwright 1973a). In further defense of this view it has been maintained that support for the reliability of fundamental belief-forming practices like the sensory belief-forming practice is inevitably circular: the support that can be adduced always ends up including premises drawn from the practices themselves (Alston 1991). Why do we accept such practices, despite this circularity? Because they are “firmly established, psychologically and socially” (Alston 1991: 149–151). But this is also true of the religious practice of forming beliefs in response to religious experience. Again—or so it may be held—an instructive analogy.

It is worth noting at this point an interesting connection between the way of experience, as thus far illustrated, and the way of argument discussed above. Although the former is supposed to represent an alternative to the latter, it too will often involve the development of arguments. The difference is that the arguments it will involve are arguments against attempts to defeat the rational justification purportedly offered by experience rather than arguments for the truth of any religious claim. What’s supposed to rationally justify believing religious claims when one employs the way of experience is, appropriately enough, experience not argument. However to make the experiential justification stick in the face of objections to it, successful arguments against objections will often be needed, and the philosopher following the way of experience ought to be able to supply them.

Let’s now consider what would usually be regarded as the two most difficult objections to the experiential approach, and some of the reasoning on which such a philosopher might draw when responding. The first objection argues against religious experiential beliefs in much the same way that Hume argued against accepting miracle reports: the apparent force of their support is canceled by the similar support available to religious people holding experiential beliefs with incompatible content. (For relevant discussion, see Goldberg 2014, Johnson 2020, Pittard 2019, Quinn & Meeker 2000, and Schellenberg 2007.) The Christian claims that her soul has been saved by God, the Buddhist that there is no soul and no God, and both appeal to experiential support for their beliefs!

The problem here, it may be thought, arises because there is no trans-religious system of shared beliefs about the world useful for weeding out false claims, to which the Buddhist and Christian might appeal in order to resolve the dispute between them (Alston 1991). Suppose that’s so. What should religious practitioners do in its absence? Everyone sit tight, hoping that fuller illumination will come in time? That’s one option. Slip from belief into doubt as you contemplate the force of the conflict in your evidence and promote a much deeper and wider religious investigation, hoping to help bring such illumination? That’s another. It may seem that if we follow the second suggestion, which pays more visible respect to reason, we must give up the way of experience. But, interestingly, that is not the case. This is because of what was said in section 1 about how a religious commitment can manage without belief of any religious claim, substituting for belief something like a voluntary acceptance or trust or assumption or imaginative assent. Here we may add that the psychological effects of a religious experience can survive the loss of beliefs initially engendered by it. Someone who has a religious experience may, for example, find herself with a richer sense of what’s possible in reality that lingers even after she no longer believes those possibilities to be real. Wishing to explore such possibilities, she may choose to continue following the path marked out by religious experience even when in doubt, with the non-doxastic (nonbelieving) adoption of some alternative propositional attitude a central part of this chosen condition.

But would it be reasonable to behave like this? Arguably, it could be. (For a defense of such behavior in a specifically Christian context, see Alston 1996 and Howard-Snyder 2017b.) Doubt is the respect one pays to reason. And here one has paid it. So in this scenario there is no longer any belief for which one might be expected to have epistemic (truth-oriented) support, and the rules of the game change. Now pragmatic considerations—considerations having to do with the benefits, for oneself and/or others, associated with such a commitment—come into their own, introducing their own quite different reasons into the discussion. The pragmatic value of a religious commitment may be considerable (Schellenberg 2009). Hence these reasons may seem to strongly support its continuance.

Perhaps, though, it will seem that the shift from belief to a non-doxastic attitude is too small a shift to be able to offer reason all the respect it deserves in these circumstances, given that the same specific religious propositions are still in view and in some sense treated as true—and this despite the evident competition from other specific propositions similarly supported. If so, there is yet another move available to the advocate of the experiential approach that may facilitate a rational religious commitment. This would involve seeing what everyone’s religious experience suggests as a quite general possibility, one general enough to be consistent with the falsehood of all the detailed religious beliefs that have ever been held (Franks Davis 1989). And it would mean seeking to adjust one’s commitment so that, while remaining pragmatically valuable, it centers on this more general content rather than on any specific religious proposition. What might the general content be? One option is to take our cue from the end of the preceding section, where a new argumentative focus on the claim that there is a religiously ultimate reality, or that some religiously transcendent reality exists, was considered. The move we have been exploring might be seen as bringing religious experience into the same neighborhood.

A second objection to the experiential approach was promised. It is this. Religious experiences can be naturally explained—for example, neurologically, as suggested by the fact that qualitatively similar experiences have been produced through appropriate stimulation of the brain (Fales 2019, 2021). Why then would someone believe that such an experience was putting them in touch with God or some other transcendent reality? The point needn’t be that this could not be the case, with God, say, using a subject’s brain to generate the experience. It might rather be that given our knowledge of the brain’s ability to produce such experiences independently—surely we don’t think God is at the mercy of a brain probe?—anyone in the grip of a religious experience is faced with the question: How do we know this isn’t one of those times? (Schellenberg 2007). The experience can’t give us an answer to this question; it is only the occasion for its being posed. As such it will rationally lead us into doubt as to the source of the experience rather than engendering religious belief. Or so it may be said.

This objection again illustrates how science has become a thorn in the side for religion. How may the advocate of the way of experience respond? One response has it that sensory experiences can be explained in much the same way, and yet this does not prevent us from reasonably relying on them in the context of the sensory belief-forming practice. The objector, so it may be said, is imposing an arbitrary double standard (Alston 1991). An important difference, however, which may seem to make the double standard appropriate rather than arbitrary in this case is that we cannot function as human beings, and nor can we so much as get started in inquiry, without sensory beliefs. Nothing like this is true for religious beliefs (Schellenberg 2007). Millions have lost them, precisely through inquiry—inquiry of the sort that religious beliefs themselves often serve to stifle. Discussion of this and other relevant issues continues—see, for example, Barrett 2007, Cunningham 2011, Fales 1996, Gellman 2001, Jordan 1994, and Wainwright 1973b. Notice that even if our second objection appears forceful, religious practitioners will still have available to them the same additional responses we noted before, which involve shifting from a doxastic to a non-doxastic form of religious commitment, and from epistemic to pragmatic considerations as support. (If we were talking about whether religious belief can be justified, the discussion might have ended earlier, but religious commitment is more resilient.) Notice that experience may still rule the day if one activates one of these alternative responses. For it may be because of what religious experience has revealed in the way of religious possibilities and benefits that one does so.

4. The Way of Testimony

John Locke, as we saw at the beginning of the preceding section, expressed a certain wariness about religious experience. But the alternative he had in mind, when, good Protestant that he was, he took his turn at defending a Christian commitment, was not strictly argumentative. There is a third alternative to consider in the traditional repertoire, when seeking to shore up the rational credentials of religion, which Locke stresses when speaking of how the revelation of God makes its way to us via many decidedly more ordinary communicants, who may nonetheless have earned our trust (1690 [1975] IV.18.3). He did not entrust himself entirely to the way of testimony when defending religious commitment, but others might. Our question now is how we might try to make this work.

At first, one may wonder how the way of testimony could work, since even if we go with one of the more robust recent definitions, all one sees in testimony is someone giving expression to information, intending to pass it along (Lackey 2008). For us to become interested, or so it initially appears, the information expressed would have to be religious in nature—about (religiously) transcendent things. And it’s not obvious how someone telling you that God is real or that Jesus is the way to God or that following the Noble Eightfold Path will engender enlightenment or some other such thing could all by itself give you a reason of any significant force to believe what they’re communicating or otherwise take it on board in a manner relevant to the origin or retention of a religious commitment.

Here we will be reminded of how very much we rely on testimony in everyday life. We could hardly do without it while feeding ourselves, finding cures when ill, getting around in the world, or understanding the world’s past. We use it all the time, and most epistemologists simply take it for granted that testimony can be a source of rational belief, even if just how it functions as such is still somewhat unclear (Audi 2004, Greco 2020, Fricker 2004, Lackey 2008, Sosa 2010). What’s coming into view is an analogy argument analogous to the argument about sensory and religious experience examined in the preceding section: if we accept that testimony can be a source of reasonable belief in ordinary contexts, as of course we do, we should accept that it can be a source of reasonable belief in religious contexts, too.

This argument is still too blunt for anyone to have given it just that form, even if we add that the word “can” is significant and demands sensitive treatment. Indeed, a number of distinctions will need our attention as we seek to clarify how the way of testimony might best be articulated and defended. The first one raises an early problem for our new approach. Are we thinking about the generation through testimony of a reason to believe some information or about the transmission by means of testimony of information that was originally certified on independent grounds? (Greco 2020 makes the distinction in these terms.) If the former, then inquiry into the quality of the testimony has to be undertaken and turned into a good argument for the reasonableness of trusting it, which is to say that what starts out as a testimonial approach must, if it hopes to be convincing, be converted into an instance of the argumentative approach. If the latter, then advocates of the way of testimony can’t really hope to be able to pacify reason unless they can first confirm the original and independent certification, and the way of testimony is again prevented from being able to deliver the goods all by itself. Either way, or so it may be said, the testimonial approach can’t be made to work as advertised.

Many lines of thought about possible collaborations between the way of testimony and other ways might depart from this point. But let’s not give up on the way of testimony as a self-sufficient resource just yet. Perhaps other distinctions will help us resolve the dilemma. There is, for example, a very pertinent distinction between individual and social contexts of inquiry. Social forms of epistemology (the study of knowledge and justified belief), including the epistemology of testimony, have taken off in a big way in recent years, and this phenomenon has rightly prompted philosophers to be more sensitive to how social factors contribute to the rational justification of our beliefs. Many would now say that the facts about our interaction as human beings are such that in the absence of reasons to distrust someone, we normally have reason to take their word for it when they tell us something is true, instead of being required to embark on some inquiry into their trustworthiness (Goldman 1999, Plantinga 1993, Williamson 2000). But in that case we have reason to doubt whether the receipt of testimony must always prompt a search for arguments supporting the latter’s quality if it is to be generative of rational justification, as would be required for the dilemma posed above to have any force.

The issue lurking here about what exactly we should demand of testimonial justifications remains controversial, though the less demanding view on which this response relies is today common among epistemologists. We might seek to add to its plausibility by teasing out some details about how that word “normally” applies. But right here one can also sense the presence of a problem: the supernaturalist or transcendent content of religious propositions, considered in the midst of everything else we take on testimony, certainly looks quite exceptional, and so perhaps we have good reason to make an exception in the religious case, asking for more or more diverse forms of support here than we normally would. In which case the dilemma is reinstated.

But once again the right distinctions may save the day for the way of testimony. We need to look more closely at what exactly the testimonial approach is supposed to support, and when we do we will notice, from the distinction mentioned at the end of section 1, that the options include both the origination of a religious commitment and its retention. We should also remember the non-doxastic option already referred to several times in previous sections. So suppose that what we want to offer rational support to is the retention of a religious commitment through the adoption, when in doubt, of a non-doxastic propositional attitude that takes the place of the religious belief one has lost. In the preceding section we saw how pragmatic considerations may come into play at this point. So suppose further that the person in question is told about the benefits of thus retaining a religious commitment by someone who has experienced it. Isn’t this testimony? Notice that yet another distinction is now required: between testimony that conveys religious propositions and testimony that conveys other content like that concerning the pragmatic benefits of a religious life. What we are seeing is that our quite natural initial assumption that relevant testimony must be of the former kind is false. And this opens up new room to maneuver for the way of testimony. For with talk of the pragmatic benefits of a certain style of living we are back in a more ordinary domain, in normal circumstances, where even the critic may be willing to allow that the less demanding view of testimonial justification mentioned above applies.

Thus with a few adjustments, one arguably can find some work for the way of testimony to do. But is this all it can do? We might well wish for something more robust—something that would enable religious propositional content to be relevantly communicated. But here a number of difficulties loom.

Let’s start with another dilemma, which can be posed using the origination-retention distinction. Suppose you are considering whether to form a religious commitment for the first time, and entertain the thought of testimonial support. Surely what will immediately come to mind is the cacophony of diverse and conflicting religious voices from around the world. Whose testimony should you accept, if anyone’s? There appears to be no way for testimony alone to help you out in such a case, providing rational support for religious commitment by the non-demanding route we opened up in order to defuse the first dilemma. You aren’t part of a religious social group already, and so can’t make use of any lenience in that respect suggested by recent work in social epistemology. Careful further investigation clearly seems to be required. And now suppose that you are part of a religious social group, and are only looking for the support needed to retain your commitment (suppose it to be a believing commitment, in line with our present concern to investigate a more robust role for the way of testimony). Might you lean on the testimony of others in your community to gain a rational boost for your flagging confidence in the relevant religious propositions? It seems not, for here too there is an inhibiting factor. As a participating member of this religious community, you have already accepted all the religious testimony that others in your group are in a position to share. How then can it be brought into play now? That would be redundant. Thus we have our new dilemma: either way, whether we’re thinking about starting or about keeping a religious commitment, religious testimony by itself is not going to be enough to get you reason’s approval.

One might object to what’s said here by noting that there do seem to be people who take up a religious commitment for the first time while in an important sense part of a religious community—namely, the young, who frequently become devoted to a religious life by trusting the word of a parent or friend or teacher. But the way of testimony would not produce a very interesting result about rational support for the initiation of a religious commitment if it had to lean on someone’s immaturity to acquire it. So there is reason to restrict our attention on the initiation side to adults capable of thoughtful reflection, and to evaluate the present dilemma with this restriction in mind.

On the other side, the side of retention (which might of course become relevant for those who were drawn into a religious life in their youth), a different possible response may be noted. The content of religious testimony is not just the conjunction or total set of all the religious propositions your group adheres to, which you have already taken into account. It can also include, among other things, what your religious community, considered collectively, is communicating to you about the mistakenness of your course when you move in the direction of relinquishing the commitment that, until recently, you have gladly shared with them. In such circumstances, you might conscientiously treat your community as an authority, judging it more likely that you will be aligned with the good and the true as you would see it after ideal reflection if you take the word of your community on this matter than if you try to figure things out for yourself, relying on what your own mind is telling you now (Zagzebski 2012).

What should we say about this response? It does suggest that a more subtle view of religious testimony is needed than one finds on the second side of our second dilemma. But it’s also true that the response is led by the point it emphasizes into dangerous territory. As a commentator has recently put it, relying on the authority of one’s community in the way here described

provides all of the resources for rendering rational the beliefs of paradigmatically irrational communities, such as white supremacists, cults, and terrorists

and

fails to provide the resources for rationally rejecting an authority’s testimony when what is offered is obviously false or otherwise outrageous. (Lackey 2017: 217)

On balance, then, it is questionable whether the response can succeed, and we are left with nothing that might generate a more robust role for the way of testimony than the one discussed earlier, in connection with non-doxastic religious commitments.

However discussion continues, as it should. Among the questions worth considering in the future, as can be seen after investigation of our first three, more-or-less traditional, ways of trying to make religious commitment rationally unproblematic, are whether and how these various approaches might be combined. Each faces challenges, but maybe they can work more successfully together. Perhaps, for example, stronger future arguments for theistic conclusions will in some way make use of theistic religious experience. Something like this has already been attempted in the context of the most prominent Bayesian version of the argumentative approach (Swinburne 2004). And maybe if testimonial reports about God’s ways found in theistic traditions were in the future to agree more fully, they could rationally facilitate the step from bare theism to a more detailed theistic perspective for someone convinced by argument of the truth of the former. Or perhaps, moving in a less conventional direction, some future argument for one of the more general religious propositions will be complemented by a more widely experienced sense of a divine presence, with the rationality of a corresponding religious commitment buttressed by the testimony of many to its benefits. Various hybrid possibilities involving the three approaches together may now suggest themselves—and perhaps all the better given the clearer view we have achieved of each separately.

5. The Ineffabilist Way

Our new way is linked to a line of thought found in a number of quite different traditional religious communities, Buddhist, Hindu, and Christian, among others (for examples, see Hick 1989 [2004]). But to gain sight of this option, one must as it were stand off to one side of what has most commonly drawn attention in these communities, letting one’s eyes get used to the dark. Thus with it we begin our move away from approaches that recommend themselves within the bright and busy center of traditional religiousness.

What becomes visible from this adjusted perspective are some quite basic religious reasons for thinking of the divine as ineffable—as in some way or to some extent beyond the power of rational, discursive thought to conceive or language to describe. Given the transcendence of the divine and the sort of transcendence we’re dealing with here, so reflection may suggest, it is through an openness to the opaque and by spiritual means that contact with the divine will be made, with this contact being of a distinctive sort, involving knowledge from direct acquaintance generated by mystical religious experience rather than propositional knowledge (knowing-that). If this is what the religious can say, then what may appear to recommend itself is also a new way of protecting a religious commitment from rational criticism (additional to any suggested by reflection on mystical religious experience itself). Indeed, it may seem that religious transcendence works for us in this regard: the very transcendent greatness of the divine, and the sort of response to it that a discerning religiousness will affirm, make an ineffabilist religious commitment appealing—and the religious commitment of an ineffabilist must surely be off limits for reason. What is there for reason to object to where religion is silent?

Now it’s certainly true that if a religious community is chary about describing the divine, there will be less in its midst for reason to get a grip on or its teeth into. But a problem immediately presents itself with respect to what is still being affirmed here: How can a religiously transcendent reality truly be ineffable if we can say this much about it: that it is religiously transcendent and ineffable (Alston 1956)? This is a pretty basic rational problem, one involving apparent inconsistency.

Evidently we need to give some more attention to how the ineffability claim may be interpreted. Does the ineffabilist really have to maintain that nothing can truly be said by way of a description of the divine? Attempts have been made to remove the rational troublesomeness of so radical a claim (Alston 1956, Gäb 2017, Hick 1989 [2004], Jones 2016, Sells 1994, Smart 1958), though without clear success. It is perhaps fortunate, then, that religious thinkers haven’t often wanted to go that far. Although they will often say things that lend themselves to the absolutist interpretation—here is an example from the fifteenth century German thinker Nicholas of Cusa: “In Himself God is ineffable and beyond all that can be named or spoken of”—from the other side of the mouth they will often say things that soften it. Nicholas, for one, in the same breath said that “as Creator, God is trine [sic] and one” (1453 [1990: 681], Klibansky & Bascour 1970). Another example: the first lines of the Taoist scripture, the Tao Te Ching, are usually regarded as paradigmatically ineffabilist: “The Tao that can be expressed is not the eternal Tao” (Tao Te Ching [1982: 17]). And yet a few lines further on, in this and dozens of other translations, the inexpressible Tao is said to be the source of heaven and earth.

In the present context it’s helpful to note that ineffabilism has been brought into view only because it may help us solve a philosophical problem. An advocate of the ineffabilist way, as we are construing it, need say no more than is required to elicit reason’s toleration or support for a religious commitment. So, especially since even some religious ineffabilists are giving us the green light, let’s see if something less than absolute ineffability might make religious sense and also allow that goal to be reached.

Here are five formulations of a less-than-absolute or limited religious ineffabilism worth considering.

  1. We can know that what makes the divine divine must be very great, worthy of the highest evaluation possible, but the features that merit this appellation are ineffable.
  2. Although we can know some of the properties a divine reality would have, and indeed must have, facts about what it is like for those properties to be instantiated or realized in the divine are ineffable.
  3. While the non-relational properties of God are out of reach, ineffable, we can have knowledge of God’s relational properties: for example, we can know that the universe depends for its existence on God.
  4. It is the correct understanding of the divine nature that is forever unavailable to us: even if some things about the divine can be known, the most general and fundamental truths about the divine nature are so distant that they are ineffable, and so the divine nature cannot, even in a basic way, be “comprehended” by the human mind.
  5. The divine nature is infinitely great, and although some of this greatness is accessible to us and describable, no matter how far a human being may reach in its ability to rationally and linguistically embrace it, there must, given human finitude, always be a limit—beyond which lies the divine ineffability.

(1) still seems quite radical; notice that on its view we probably ought even to withhold the descriptor “transcendent”. (2) is plausible enough. For example, suppose we think the divine is a personal God, who forms intentions. What it is for God to intend something might still be rather different from what it is for us, and indeed beyond description (Alston 1989: 198). But ineffability here borders on the banal and obvious, applying as it does even to the everyday experiences of finite beings: How can you really describe what it’s like from the inside for you to form an intention? (3) is suggested by, among others, Maimonides, who distinguishes between attributes of God’s essence and attributes of God’s action (1190 [1963]: I, 53). But while contemplation of the latter might no doubt feed a religious stance, it distracts us from ineffability per se—if the one who undertakes it is managing both rationally and religiously, this is not in virtue of ineffability, the way of managing to be explored in this section, but in spite of it. (4) is interesting, exploiting as it does the distinction, common these days, between knowledge, which can be isolated and atomic, and understanding, which involves making connections across various items of believed and true information, seeing how things fit together into a larger picture (Grimm 2018, Kvanvig 2003, Zagzebski 1996). How could we ever have access to the facts that bring within reach the “larger picture” of God? (5) is also appealing—it could be regarded as a more plausible version of the idea behind (1)—and even indicates a certain sensitivity to reason in what it says about the unbridgeable gap between finite and infinite. Nicholas of Cusa seems to have something like it in mind: “God is so great that there is no end of his Greatness. Hence, he is greater than everything conceived and knowable” (1462 [1998: ch. 12, N. 32]). And (4) is compatible with (5): the facts beyond the greatness-conceivability limit mentioned by the latter could be precisely those, or among those, access to which is required for the understanding referred to by the former.

So let’s take (4) and (5) together and reflect on them a little further. In particular, how could it be argued that religious commitment evades rational critique if we accept these two together or in conjunction? The basic idea, presumably, is going to be that any rational criticism of a religious commitment which includes acceptance of this conjunction can be rejected as rash and unreliable, since now we’d have to say that the truths about the nature of a divine reality that are inaccessible to us on account of its unfathomable depths, if we could add them to what we already know, might very well lead to an understanding that requires us to qualify or renounce the criticism. Lacking any good reason to rule this out, objectors cannot forcefully press their objections. (Notice how the situation here is different from that of the traditional theists featured in section 2, who suppose that a basic understanding of the divine nature is attainable by combining the idea of ultimacy with the idea of a personal agent.) Reason can’t get a serious grip on—can’t even properly understand—the idea giving shape to an ineffabilist religious commitment, and so its framing of a clear and convincing critique of that idea is infinitely postponed.

But our theme is religious commitment, and this might invite criticism even if no religious idea does. Here, for example, is a criticism it will surely be tempting to make: How can the commitment of a religious person even have any shape if they go the ineffabilist route?

This, however, must now be easier to answer, given that our ineffabilist isn’t looking to deprive the religious idea that there is a divine reality of all content, willing as she is to think of such a reality as being, at least, transcendent and unsurpassably great. Reason may need more information than this to know whether its critiques are on track, but religion can manage just fine without it. Indeed, right here one can see a distinctive shape for religious commitment emerging: humbly acknowledging human ignorance, not distracted by the pursuit of propositional understanding or overly concerned about belief states attained or absent, we submit to meditation and contemplation prescribed by those who have gone before and eventually gain a deeper experiential sense of a wondrous reality seemingly responsive to our efforts and luring us further on. (A sense of ineffable greatness nurtured by mystical experience can be very motivating.) Using whatever we receive, in individual exploration and communal interaction, we engage in a pursuit that must, if successful, be everlasting—pursuit of a unity mimicking the unified understanding that reason seeks, which too lies on the further side of all our efforts. Employing the language of our community (though perhaps treating much of it as useful fiction), we seek an ever deeper integration of the physical, emotional, social, aesthetic and other aspects of our being under the notion of a wondrously elusive divine reality that (metaphorically) is calling all things to unity with itself.

This is one way of describing the basic features of a livable, if austere, ineffabilist religious commitment that has gone some way toward a reconciliation with reason. Just how it is described will vary depending on which tradition or religious community one has in mind. But it does appear that all who belong to a religious community can be given an ineffabilist interpretation to work with, if they are willing to stand with the ineffabilist to one side of conventional opinion, taking in the view from there. (Of course not everyone will be willing, so not everyone’s religious commitment is going to be benefited here.) Solid arguments for metaphysical naturalism would still pose a serious problem for this approach—as indeed for any of the other approaches discussed in this entry. But, as intimated in section 1, naturalism’s cultural advancements have come in a manner that does not conspicuously feature arguments: with the path to naturalism apparently smoothed by science, relatively few naturalists have felt the impulse to seek reasoning that would prove or probabilify their view. In any case, such reasoning is unlikely to be available anytime soon (a justification for this position will be suggested in section 7).

6. The Pluralist Way

We’ve had occasion, more than once, to notice how conflicts among the commitments of the religious, especially at the intellectual level, can be exploited by those who think ill of such commitments. In the same connection, we have seen how a religious commitment that de-emphasizes details, in one way or another focusing on general rather than specific ideas about the divine, apparently can avoid the problem. Is it also possible to avoid it by in some way—the right way, if there is one—focusing precisely on the diverse and apparently incompatible details of religion around the world? A pluralist approach to the reconciliation of reason and religious commitment will work with this idea, aiming to turn a problem into a solution. Its advocates will not just sidestep the problem of religious conflict, as we have seen it is possible to do, but seek to make a form of religiousness that incorporates religious diversity both religiously and rationally appealing.

This is a tall order. But by meeting its demands religion apparently would indeed have a more universally applicable way of making peace with reason. That is because the problem of religious disagreement is arguably the most basic problem facing those who would defend the ordinary sort of religious commitment, resplendent with details. After other problems are solved, there is still this one. No matter how strong the support for your own specific religiousness appears (for example, on the basis of argument) when you ignore others, it will be countered when you allow them in, for now you have the obligation of investigating their implicit claim against you—the intellectual process here recapitulates the historical. And if this problem is solved, others may go away too. For to reach such a solution to the problem of religious disagreement, the religious situation must be reconceived. And assuming the non-viability of an exclusivist reaction to other examples of religiousness, as almost everyone who takes the investigative obligation mentioned above seriously supposes we should do (see, e.g., Byrne 2019, Hick 1989 [2004], McKim 2012, Smart 1996, and Smith 1992), any religiousness that incorporates this solution will in some way have to become more welcoming of views other than its own. Which means that any specific religiousness may eventually be able to claim much more than just its own religious argument and experience and testimony as support for a religious form of life! Hence the attractiveness of the pluralist way.

How might we try to make it work? The best-known so-called pluralist view in the philosophy of religion forwards a religious hypothesis that borrows from Kant’s distinction between the “noumenal” and “phenomenal” realms—roughly, reality as it is in itself and as it appears to us (Kant 1781). On this view the nature of the divine, the ultimate “Real”, is “transcategorial” (Hick 2008: 5), which is to say incapable of being captured in terms of any human categories. The various conflicting religious claims are therefore all on a level, equally bad at indicating the true nature of the divine. However on the present view they are also on a level in a more positive sense, by being equally good at helping to mediate what the religious call salvation, facilitating the “transformation of human existence from self-centeredness to Reality-centeredness” (Hick 1989 [2004: 240]). This common experience of salvation, so it is said, invites the hypothesis that while the conflicting claims are culturally conditioned and none may be regarded as literally true, their adherents, by following them, are still responding to the same transcendent Real, which is present to all of them as they are salvifically transformed (Hick 1989 [2004]).

This view has been quite influential, but certain aspects of it have also faced discerning criticism (see, e.g., Howard-Snyder 2017a, McKim 2012, and Plantinga 2000). In the present context, three main points beg to be made. First, by adopting a Kantian strategy and construing the Real as transcategorial, the advocate of this view is apparently buying into part of the ineffabilist approach—and endorsing absolute ineffabilism, to boot, which in the preceding section we found to be problematic. One cannot really even think of the transcendent reality as good or as salvific in any available sense if one takes this line (McKim 2012), and so—by our own definition here—it cannot if thus conceived be regarded as religiously transcendent. Second, although that problem may be avoided if the view is reinterpreted or revised in such a way as to reflect one or another of the more limited ineffabilist views discussed in section 5 or something like the more general content-retaining religious views mentioned in sections 3 and 4, this would deprive it of any independent value and so prevent it from representing a distinct “way” of reconciling reason and religious commitment. Third, although that problem could be avoided if the emphasis on integrated diversity advertised by a “pluralistic hypothesis” were to come through successfully, it is in fact widely viewed as a weakness of the view we are discussing that it sacrifices any truth-oriented engagement with the diverse claims of religious communities around the world in order to reach its results. Members of these communities are being asked to completely alter their conception of what’s going on when they utter or hear indicative religious sentences expressing the details of their intellectual commitment (indeed, to drop the idea that the propositions these sentences express are literally true) instead of being offered a way of harmonizing or working toward a harmonization of their distinctive picture of the religious realm with the distinctive pictures of others.

We should therefore consider whether there is a view that does credibly offer as much as that. Initially it’s not at all clear that one can successfully make a case for this since—despite the famous tale of the blind men and the elephant—the claims about transcendence of different religious communities do conflict (our reference to Christianity versus Buddhism in section 3 affords an example) and apparently cannot be fitted together under the suggestion that each identifies a “part” of the divine, just as each of the blind men has identified a part of the elephant. That, indeed, is why the view we have just been discussing asks religious people to make the big sacrifice that involves giving up a truth-oriented construal of their diverse understandings. However to deal with this issue a view of the sort we are seeking may emphasize, not the present availability of concordance, but rather working toward harmonization or concordance, with everyone counseled to treat their specific religious views differently from the more general idea of religious transcendence—to in some way be willing to “sit loose” from the former, open to the thought that they may need to be revised or dropped in order to reach the goal of concordance, harmonization, integration under the latter, which all the religiously committed by definition accept. It is important to notice here that treating specific views differently from others when engaging them from a truth-oriented perspective need not mean sidelining or rejecting or ignoring them, and so we are not simply returned to the idea that religious people might flee to a more general level when facing attack on specifics.

Various contemporary writers can be seen as developing such a bi-level and investigative pluralist proposal, for they speak of tentativeness in one’s specific religious beliefs or of reconceiving one’s specific religious beliefs as non-doxastic positions or of some other such thing, always against a presumed backdrop of agreement about there being something religiously transcendent as well as ongoing inter-religious discussion as to its nature and the practical consequences of its existence (Byrne 1995, Cobb 2006, McKim 2012, and Schellenberg 2017 are examples). What we see here is indeed just a way of developing, or a small extension to, one of the most popular responses to religious diversity in the philosophy of religion today, namely, inclusivism, which seeks to be friendly to many religious stances while remaining committed to one. Although that sort of response is in the literature generally defined by contrast with pluralism, it is hard to make this distinction inviolable. Just as you may skip over an article online because it’s not your thing, while recognizing its merits in the broader scheme of things, so you may choose a religious community and set of religious ideas as more suited to your own temperament and needs while allowing that others are, objectively, equally worthy of development and defense in the context of a broader conversation of positions. Since all need development, why not make your own contribution here? Thus it seems that in an important sense the inclusivist can be a pluralist. In any case, inclusivism can be an example of the slightly different thing we are presently discussing: the pluralist way of reconciling reason and religious commitment. An inclusivist of the sort coming into view here sticks to the specifics of her religious tradition or form of life, hoping that without changing too much in that package, the central features of other commitments may in time come to be harmonized with it. So long as a grappling with what other religious commitments have to offer in the context of one’s own and a true openness to change in service of theoretical integration remain present, there is no reason to see this as being at odds with the pluralist way.

Interestingly, something rather like this conception of an appropriately pluralist stance is already present in the work of a fifteenth-century figure we found reason to mention in the preceding section—Nicholas of Cusa. Ahead of his time, with a very modern sensibility about the badness of violence and the need for conspicuous generosity toward the most alien-seeming of alternative views, Nicholas, a Christian, sought

a better theoretical framework within which even all the other religions (not only the monotheistic ones) could be integrated with their partial perspectives on divine truth. (Riedenauer 2022: 168)

He recognized that perhaps only in the future, after various specific religious claims had been changed or adjusted, added or lost, could this goal be achieved, therefore counseling that in the present such specifics be treated as preliminary or conjectural—not even exempting Catholic theology from this concession (Riedenauer 2022: 171, 178). Nicholas apparently saw himself not just as responding to pragmatic or religious considerations in championing his view but also as answering to reason, which seeks, so far as possible, to bring diversity under unity—in this case, under the ineffable and “utmost unity which is God” (Riedenauer 2022: 169).

Some today might object that an appropriately deep pluralism will allow the ultimates of different religious traditions to remain plural instead of seeking to reduce them to one thing, as Nicholas appears to do. They advocate the permanent acceptability of a distinction between, for example, personal, impersonal, and cosmic religious ultimates (Cobb 2006). But even here there is a concern for unity insofar as these three are thought to exist in mutual dependence, with “no contradiction” between them (Cobb 2006: 70, 72). In any event, it may be observed that where the aim is a way of making peace with reason, a bi-level, investigative pluralism aimed at religious unity should appear attractive, if only because it reflects a concern parallel to one central in science, which today is often viewed as the very embodiment of reason—namely, a concern for eventual theoretical integration and consensus. With this concern the pluralist takes perhaps her biggest step toward a form of religiousness “both religiously and rationally appealing”.

7. The Evolutionary Way

By taking up with evolutionary ideas, which are still most commonly associated with biological evolution, a defense of religious commitment might seem to be consorting with the enemy. But it is only certain conservative forms of monotheistic religion that are obviously damaged by Darwin’s discoveries. Though the Darwin-inspired disputes about evolution and religion have received a great deal of attention, deceiving many into thinking that some general assault on religion was in the works, we should not be thus fooled. Instead we should remind ourselves that in addition to conservative monotheistic religion there is non-conservative; that in addition to the monotheistic traditions there are traditions that reject monotheism; and that one must be mindful not only of established traditions but also of various new religious movements (some harking back to a religiousness that came long before the religions), not to mention all the novel ways in which, without giving up transcendence, religious commitment may present itself in the future. By the time we get this far, we may be more open to the possibility that evolutionary ideas could even provide rational aid and sustenance to religious commitment, rather than delivering a universal debunking. It will help if, with a similar move toward broadmindedness, we notice that not all evolutionary ideas are Darwinian—in addition to biological evolution there is cultural evolution, and also cosmological evolution.

The latter has figured in recent discussion. By the turn of the twenty-first century it had become popular in certain regions of the culture to turn awe at our complex unfolding universe into a religious attitude, and this tendency is connected to serious academic writing by some currents of thought visible in process philosophy and theology, especially in “emergentist” forms of panentheism, which—often inspired by the work of Alfred North Whitehead (1929)—locate the evolving cosmos within a transcendent divine reality (for examples, see Clayton & Peacocke 2004, Cobb 1965, Griffin 2014, Jantzen 1998, and McFague 2001). This sort of writing is aimed, in part, at showing how panentheistic variations on traditional religious commitment can be in harmony with, and even illuminated by, the most modern and up-to-the-minute scientific thinking about the evolution of the cosmos. Thus it represents an evolutionary way of seeking the reconciliation of reason and religious commitment.

Like other ways of seeking that result, this version of the evolutionary way faces pushback from exclusively naturalistic thought, which may be expected to find such religious elaborations of scientific themes unnecessarily complicating. Why mar the clean simplicity of a world regarded as everywhere natural with talk of transcendence? If there appear to be phenomena evidently real, such as consciousness, that fit poorly or awkwardly within an exclusively naturalistic picture, we should be prepared to give the community of inquiry more time to make them fit, perhaps by means of new concepts, or else acknowledge that our own intellectual competence, precisely as evolved beings within a natural world, only goes so far (see Kitcher 2014, Nagel 2102, and McGinn 1993). One way or another, the naturalist will say, the extravagance of an appeal to transcendent divine realities must be avoided.

Of special interest is a naturalistic rejoinder that will be regarded as religious in contexts where religiousness is viewed as detachable from the emphasis on transcendence (for reasons given in section 1, the present context is not one of them). It is due to the neglected early twentieth-century British philosopher Samuel Alexander, who inspired Whitehead. Alexander was sensitive to facts about biological evolution, but when thinking about God in Space, Time, and Deity (1920), he had in mind a grander cosmological sort of evolution.

Within the all-embracing stuff of Space-Time, the universe exhibits an emergence in Time of successive levels of finite existences, each with its characteristic empirical quality. The highest of these empirical qualities known to us is mind or consciousness. Deity is the next higher empirical quality to the highest we know. (Alexander 1920: 345)

But deity is not God. Rather, for Alexander, deity is a quality possessed by God. And nor is deity just the “next higher empirical quality to the highest we know”. Deity is a quality newly configured at each new and higher level in the continual forward motion from materiality to life to consciousness and so on of a universe with a nisus—that is, an impulse or drive—toward deity. And God? “God is the whole world as possessing the quality of deity” (1920: 353). Though Alexander appears to think of God in more than one way, God thus conceived is apparently Space-Time as a whole when regarded as possessing the tendency to proceed through stages of progressive evolutionary change. This God can be said to be “in process towards” future qualities of deity (1920: 394). And the religious life? “[I]t is religion to do our duty with the consciousness of helping to create [God’s] deity” (1920: 299). In other words, through progressive work in the various departments of human life we may see ourselves as aiding in the next stage of the evolution of God.

Alexander’s view is unique. Its conceptual core is not pantheism, since deity on this view is not equally in every part of the universe, and it is not panentheism, since Alexander is a naturalist who finds nothing divine beyond the universe. It is not theism—though sometimes, and misleadingly, it is called emergent theism—because it is not clear that the imagined infinitely progressive universe will produce anything like what we today have in mind when we think of a powerful supernatural agent; certainly there will be none that exists from the beginning and is its source. There is, remarkably, no common category in which to place this view. My reason for introducing it here is twofold: that it has been neglected, and that it shows how naturalism can mount its own forms of emergentism, which may when fully considered seem grand enough to function as rivals to the emergentism of a transcendence-involving panentheism (Thomas 2016). Thus the naturalist has more than one move to try in resisting our first example of the evolutionary way. If the Alexandrian move remains in the end unsatisfying for the religiously inclined, it will be because moves like the panentheist’s have succeeded in convincing them that something more than a natural, empirical reality is needed to engage and satisfy us in the religious realm.

What a naturalistic emergentism like Alexander’s suggests, beyond what was stressed in the foregoing, is that along with every other evolutionary emphasis, we should be open to an emphasis on the evolution of religion. A second version of the evolutionary way develops precisely this emphasis: it applies evolutionary thinking to religion. But it does so in a manner that, so it says, gives new life to the transcendent hopes that our first version of the evolutionary way is also unwilling to relinquish, even in the face of options as interesting as Alexander’s.

Here again it is not just biological evolution that is in view—though references to the geological timescale undergirding Darwinian thought are plentiful. Instead cultural evolution looms large. Less well understood than its biological cousin, cultural evolution has been receiving a growing share of attention recently (for relevant examples, see Buchanan & Powell 2018, Creanza et al. 2017, Lewens 2015, and Richerson & Boyd 2005). Like any evolution, cultural evolution is just a form of change, but most would allow that sometimes, in fits and starts, cultural change is developmental, resulting in some improvement to our life together. And it is this developmental aspect of cultural change that is exploited by our second evolutionary option, which invites us to think about it at the macroscale or species level. Our species, so it tells us, is still at an early stage of its life on our planet. Quite obviously, the stage we have reached is early in a purely temporal sense. Homo sapiens is now about 300,000 years old. It would take another 200,000 years—one hundred times the length of the period separating us from Jesus of Nazareth—to get us just halfway to the average lifespan of mammal species on our planet. But our stage is also early developmentally, as measured by various aspirations cultural evolution has made salient—for example, the aspiration to overcome our violent tendencies. Judged against large cultural ambitions, our record of performance leaves a good deal to be desired. In relation to the exploration of transcendent possibilities in particular, such things as dogmatism, sexism, violence, and inadequate investigation have conspired to hold us back.

So what can be done on behalf of a transcendence-oriented religious commitment with this idea of an early stage of human development, should we accept it? Well, since we are still at an early stage of human development, reason will instruct us to behave accordingly. In particular, we should be thinking about religion in a manner that is tailored precisely to such early-stage conditions. In other words, we have hit on a form of religious relativism, one that bids us judge whether anything religious is rationally appropriate in a manner that is relative to or dependent on how humans are situated at an early stage. We could therefore try to make religious commitment as understood in this entry, with its old transcendence-oriented core, rationally unproblematic by devising new forms of transcendence-involving religion—or revising old ones—in such a way as to meet the stage-relativist standard. And this, our new approach suggests, it will not be hard to do (Schellenberg 2013, 2019).

Call this approach to the reconciliation of reason and religious commitment early-stage religious relativism. The claim of early-stage religious relativism, as noted, is not just that it can yield a religious result pleasing to reason but also that it will be easier to do this in the relativist way than to defend religious commitment within an unrelativized frame of reference. After all, something less than belief, that is, some suitable non-doxastic attitude, will likely be part of a relativized religious commitment—it is too early in the relevant processes of human development for the confidence of religious belief—and nondoxastic religious attitudes are easier to defend than believing ones. Likewise, something other than a detailed notion of religious transcendence will likely be of primary importance at the present stage—it is too early for confident thought about religious details—and general conceptualizations are easier to defend than specific ones. Moreover, now it is not hard to see how the religious might defend a continuing emphasis on transcendence. Indeed, we are now encouraged to retain an emphasis on transcendence in religion, precisely because we have so much further to go in the project of spelling out its possible articulations. By thinking in the relativist way, therefore, even if not otherwise, so says our second version of the evolutionary way, we will find that reason and religious commitment can be reconciled.

There has been debate about what sort of nonbelieving religious attitude, if any, might fit an undeveloped stage of human development (Palmqvist 2019a, Schellenberg 2019). There has also been debate about what religious propositional content, if any, is appropriate to such an early stage. Should it be ultimism—the view that there is a metaphysically, axiologically, and soteriologically ultimate reality (Schellenberg 2009)? Perhaps ultimism, though quite spare, still claims too much and should be replaced by the Dutch notion of “ietsism”, which says only that there is something religiously transcendent (Elliott 2017)? Should we instead accept some suitably modified traditional religious account, because it offers the best chance of salvific religious experience (Palmqvist 2019b)? Perhaps, on the other hand, to have a truly evolutionary approach to religion we ought to reject the transcendent hopes allowed by early-stage religious relativism, endorsing instead a purely naturalistic evolutionary ontology (Rottschaefer 2016)?

Only the latter, naturalistic view threatens the ability of the new religious relativism to reconfigure discussion in a manner that is transcendence-friendly. In response, the early-stage relativist, as one might expect, will be inclined to say that it is too early for an intellectual commitment to naturalism! Given various shortcomings that have hampered our development in this regard, much serious religious investigation remains to be undertaken—too much for a naturalistic commitment, which is committed to the notion that no transcendent possibility will ever be realized, to be other than premature (Schellenberg 2009). The most intellectually optimistic naturalists, confident in the power of science, will of course disagree, thinking that the falsehood of all religious claims, known and unknown, can already be inferred. And they may moreover criticize as excessively skeptical the early-stage approach, finding unsatisfactory the reply that a great deal may be learned in the early grades at school though many additional years of learning lie ahead. Even the less confident naturalist may wonder why naturalism itself might not be a position worth developing and defending at an early stage of human development if embraced non-doxastically. Perhaps reason will be happy to accept such work from those without much in the way of a religious sensibility, even if it is also prepared to sanction the efforts of the early-stage religious relativist.

As we conclude this discussion of the six ways, it is important to note that many other versions of each of them (and indeed other ways) may be turned up by future investigation. As for these six: it may be useful, once again, to notice how—with the new ways of sections 5, 6, and 7 now brought into the mix—they might be thought to work well together, even if their independent powers appear subject to doubt. The limited ineffabilist thesis, if initially it seems rather austere, may appear less so (or less objectionably so) if taken on board in an evolutionary frame of mind and regarded as appropriate to an early stage of species-level development, with plenty of realistic hopes remaining for a later realization of consensus and convergence on at any rate some of the details of the divine, as described by our second version of the pluralist way. At the same time, the modesty we might learn to regard as appropriate to an early stage of development, which will no doubt strike some as delivering only a thin and impoverished form of religious commitment, can be enriched by the thought of incorporating an ineffabilist spirituality or engaging wholeheartedly in the pluralist project—perhaps by mobilizing ideas of cosmic evolution like those animating an emergentist panentheism. It is also realistic, and furthermore religiously encouraging, if we have as much time to work with as the early-stage relativist reminds us is available within an evolutionary frame of reference, to suppose that the more compelling testimony or widespread religious experience or effective argument imagined at the end of section 4 might eventually come to be. If such possibilities are realized, human beings in the far future will enjoy transcendence-oriented religious commitments with rational qualities quite unlike any that can be made available today.

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