The Epistemology of Religion

First published Wed Apr 23, 1997; substantive revision Sun Oct 26, 2025

This entry focuses on two topics, evidentialism and disagreement. They are related because one reaction to the latter could be return to the former. Both are general epistemological topics but seem especially pertinent to religion, which not merely provides examples but introduces further considerations: privacy, problematic expertise, moral implications, the sensus divinitatis, religious experience, the idea of faith as gift and faith as commitment.

Evidentialism is the initially plausible position that a belief is justified only if “it is proportioned to the evidence”. For example, suppose a local weather forecaster has noticed that a wetter than average Winter has been followed in 85% of cases by a hotter than average Summer. Then, assuming for simplicity that the records are reliable, the forecaster is justified in believing with less than full confidence that this Winter, which is wetter than average, will be followed by a hotter than average Summer. But evidentialism implies that it would not be justified to have full belief, that is belief with 100% confidence. Again, consider someone who has a hunch that this Summer will be hotter than average but cannot justify that hunch further. Hunches are not considered evidence, so the belief is not considered justified. If, hunches about the weather have mostly turned out correct then the belief would be considered justified. For although hunches are not considered evidence, memories about them are, as are the observations that corroborated past hunches.

Evidentialism implies that full religious belief is justified only if there is conclusive evidence for it. It follows that if the arguments for there being a God, including any arguments from religious experience, are at best probable ones, no one would be justified in having a full belief that there is a God. And the same holds for other religious beliefs, such as the belief that God is not just good in a utilitarian fashion but loving, or the belief that there is an afterlife. Likewise it would be unjustified to believe even with less than full confidence that, say, Krishna is divine or that Mohammed is the last and most authoritative of the prophets, unless a good case can be made for these claims from the evidence.

Evidentialism, then, sets rather high standards for justification, standards that the majority do not, it would seem, meet when it comes to religious beliefs, where many rely on “faith”, which is more like the hunch about the weather than the argument from past climate records. Many others take some body of scripture, such as the Bible or the Koran as of special authority, contrary to the evidentialist treatment of these as just like any other books making various claims. Are these standards too high?

This century has seen a turn in the debate, with emphasis on the implications of disagreement, “How can sincere intelligent people disagree? Should you not, therefore, suspend judgement?” Unless, that is, your belief meets evidentialist standard but not those of the ones with whom you disagree.

1. Simplifications

Epistemology is confusing because there are several sorts of items to be evaluated and several sorts of evaluation. Since the topic of this article is the epistemology of religion not general epistemology it will be assumed that what is being evaluated is something related to faith, namely individual religious beliefs, and that the way of evaluating religious beliefs is as justified or unjustified.

This entry, therefore, concentrates on questions such as, “Is it justified for Fatima to believe in God?”, “Is it justified for Richard to believe in the Trinity?”, or “Is it justified for Ramanujan to believe that Krishna is a human incarnation of the divine?” It ignores such questions as whether these beliefs count as knowledge or whether these beliefs are scientific. It also ignores disputes between coherence theorists and foundationalists and disputes over whether belief is voluntary. Although these have some implications for the epistemology of religion they are primarily topics in general epistemology.

Although the topic is religious belief the same questions can be asked about faith in the absence of belief, where the standards might be more lax. For example Schellenberg (2009) has argued that it is not justified to believe in a personal God, not justified to have faith in a personal God , not justified even to believe in something ultimate but it is justified to have a religious attitude of faith in something ultimate. Finally, and more controversially, this entry concentrates on Western epistemology of religion, which is not, however, the same as the epistemology of Western religion. Note, though, that epistemological disputes between Hindu and Buddhist philosophers over a thousand years ago are much the same as those considered here.

2. The Rejection of Enlightenment Evidentialism

Most contemporary epistemology of religion may be called post modern in the sense of being a reaction to the Enlightenment, in particular to the thesis of the hegemony of evidentialism. (Compare Vanhoozer 2003.) Hegemony is discussed below, but first consider evidentialism. This is the initially plausible position that a belief is justified only if “it is proportioned to the evidence”. Here several sorts of evidence are allowed. One consists of beliefs in that which is “evident to the senses”, that is, beliefs directly due to sense-experience. Another sort of evidence is that which is “self-evident”, that is, obvious once you think about it. Evidence may also include the beliefs directly due to memory and introspection. Again moral convictions might count as evidence, even if not treated as self-evident. But in order to state the sort of evidentialism characteristic of Enlightenment thought, it is stipulated that no beliefs asserting the content of religious or mystical experiences count as evidence. For example, if Fatima had an experience that she would describe as of the presence of God she should not treat Gods presence to her as a piece of evidence. That does not prevent the claim that someone has had a religious experience with a certain content from counting as evidence. For example, the fact that Fatima had an experience as if of God’s presence would be a piece of evidence. Likewise the fact that various people report miracles counts as evidence.

Evidentialism implies that no full religious belief (i.e. a religious belief held with full confidence) is justified unless there is conclusive evidence for it, or it is self-evident. The content of religious experience has been stipulated not to count as evidence. Even if, as Descartes held, the existence of God is self-evident, beliefs such as Richard’s in the Trinity and Ramanujan’s in the divinity of Krishna are not. So the only available evidence for these beliefs would seem to be non-religious premises, from which the religious beliefs are inferred. Therefore, the only way of deciding whether the religious beliefs are justified would be to examine various arguments with the non-religious beliefs as premises and the religious beliefs as conclusions.

According to evidentialism it follows that if the arguments for there being a God, including any arguments from religious experience, are at best probable ones, and if, as most hold, God’s existence is not self-evident then no one would be justified in having full belief that there is a God. And the same holds for other religious beliefs. Likewise, it would not be justified to believe even partially (i.e. with less than full confidence) if there is not a balance of evidence for belief.

In fact it seems that many religious believers combine full belief with “doubts” in the sense of some reasons for doubting, or they combine partial belief with what they take to be weighty reasons for disbelief. According to evidentialism this is not justified. Other believers consider that, on reflection, they have little reason for doubting but that they have almost no positive evidence for their religious beliefs. According to evidentialism this too is unjustified. This raises the question, how can we adjudicate between an epistemological thesis which might otherwise be believed and a religious belief which that thesis implies is unjustified? The Enlightenment assumed two related, hegemony theses, those of epistemology and of evidentialism. The hegemony of epistemology states that (a) human beings can discover the correct epistemology in isolation from discovering actual human tendencies to form beliefs, and so (b) there is an overriding reason to use the correct epistemology (once discovered) to correct the above-mentioned tendencies. The hegemony of evidentialism adds to the hegemony of epistemology the further thesis that (c) evidentialism is the correct epistemology. If, according to evidentialism, full or even partial religious beliefs are unjustified, then, given the hegemony of evidentialism there is an overriding reason to reject those beliefs. Perhaps the clearest exponent of this position is Clifford whose use of moral vocabulary conveys well the overriding character of the reasons epistemology is said to provide. His position is summed up in the famous quotation: “It is wrong always, everywhere, and for anyone, to believe anything upon insufficient evidence” (Clifford 1879: 186).

At the other extreme from Clifford is the position of fideism, namely, that if an epistemological theory such as evidentialism conflicts with the holding of religious beliefs then that is so much the worse for the epistemological theory.

The rejection of the hegemony of epistemology is quite compatible with holding a hegemony thesis for a fragment of epistemology. Such a fragment might, for instance, contain the principle of self-referential consistency, relied upon by Plantinga (1983: 60). This states that it is not justified to have a belief according to which that belief is itself not justified. Consider, for instance, the extreme case of the person who believes that no belief is justified unless it can be proven from premises everyone agrees upon.

Postmodernism implies more than being post modern in the above sense. For it is the rejection of the hegemony of even a fragment of epistemology. That might seem agreeable to fideists. Postmodernism tends, however, to trivialize fideism by obliterating any contrast between faith in divine revelation and trust in human capacities to discover the truth. (For a discussion of fideism and postmodernism see Stiver 2003.)

Much contemporary epistemology of religion seeks to avoid the extremes both of the Enlightenment thesis of the hegemony of evidentialism and of fideism. It is thus post modern without necessarily being postmodernist. Call the injunction to avoid these extremes the problematic of contemporary epistemology of religion.

3. Evidentialism Defended

One response to the problematic is to separate evidentialism from the hegemony of epistemology. Evidentialism may then be defended by noting how we implicitly rely upon evidentialist principles in many different areas of enquiry, or by noting which principles generalise various particular examples of justified and unjustified reasoning. Such a defence of evidentialism is part of the project of some contemporary philosophers who seek to attack theism in favour of agnosticism and/or atheism. This defence may well be implicit in Flew’s famous “The Presumption of Atheism” (1972). It is more explicit in Scriven’s Primary Philosophy (1966, ch 4). Scriven and Flew are relying on the Ockhamist principle that, in the absence of evidence for the existence of things of kind X, belief in Xs is not reasonable. This they can defend by means of examples in which non-Ockhamist thinking is judged not to be justified. So even if the whole of evidentialism is not defended, the Ockhamist fragment of it may be.

Not surprisingly the reliance of non-theist philosophers on evidentialism has been criticised. First there is an ad hominem. Shalkowski (1989) has pointed out that these defenders of evidentialism tend in fact to be atheists not agnostics, yet a careful examination, he says, of the examples used to support Ockham’s Razor show that either they are ones in which there is independent evidence for denying the existence of Xs or ones in which suspense of judgement seems to be the appropriate response, not denial. This shows critics of religious belief are not intellectual superiors correcting the mistakes of their inferiors, but disputants.

Another criticism is Plantinga’s claim that evidentialism is self-referentially inconsistent for there is no evidence for evidentialism (Plantinga 1983: 60). This might be met in either of two ways. First, it could be said that all that is being defended is the Ockhamist fragment of evidentialism and that this is not itself vulnerable to Ockham’s Razor. Or it could be argued that deriving an epistemology from a wide range of examples is evidence for it. To be sure this is far from conclusive evidence. But even a less than full belief in an epistemological thesis which showed theism to be unjustified would be damaging. This may be illustrated using an example with artificial numerical precision: 80% confidence in an epistemology which showed that no degree of belief in theism greater than 60% was justified is incompatible with a degree of belief in theism greater than 68%. The person in question could have a degree of belief of in the conjunction of theism and the (80% likely) epistemology of no greater than 48% (80% of 60%) and a degree of belief in the conjunction of theism and the denial of that epistemology of no greater than 20% (since that epistemology has a probability of 80%).

4. Natural theology

Theistic philosophers may grant evidentialism and even grant its hegemony, but defend their religious convictions by providing the case which evidentialists demand. Here the details of the arguments are not within the scope of an article on epistemology. What is of interest is the kind of argument put forward. For a start there is the project of demonstrating God’s existence. (See Craig 1979, Braine 1988, Miller 1991.) To show the justifiability of full belief that there is a God it is sufficient (a) to have a deductively valid argument from premises which are themselves justifiably held with full belief unless defeated by an objection and (b) to have considered and defeated all available objections to either the premises, the conclusion or any intermediate steps. Some of the premises of these arguments are said to be self-evident, that is, obvious once you think about it. (E.g., the denial of the explanatory power of an infinite causal regress, or the principle that the existence of any composite thing needs to be explained). And that connects with the problem of disagreement: Does somethings being self-evident to you justify your full belief in it even if you know of those of equal or greater intellectual ability to whom it is not self-evident? The affirmative answer is tenable provided we distinguish genuine self-evidence from plausible intuition.

Many natural theologians have, however, abandoned the search for demonstrative arguments, appealing instead to ones which are probable, either in the sense of having weight but being inconclusive or in the sense of having a mathematical probability assigned to them. Notable in this regard are Mitchell’s cumulative argument (Mitchell 1973) and Swinburne’s Bayesian reliance on probability (Swinburne 1979). In a popular exposition of his argument Swinburne appeals instead to an inference to the best explanation (Swinburne 1995; see also Forrest 1996, 2025). While there are differences of approach, the common theme is that there is evidence for theism but evidence of a probable rather than a conclusive kind, justifying belief but not full belief.

5. The Relevance of Newman

Although pre-dating the current debate, Newman’s rejection of Locke’s and Paley’s evidentialism is relevant to the problematic of contemporary epistemology of religion. First he quite clearly rejected the hegemony of epistemology. His procedure was to examine how in fact people made up their minds on non-religious issues and argue that by the same standards religious beliefs were justified. As a result he qualified evidentialism by insisting that an implicit and cumulative argument could lead to justified certainty. (See Mitchell 1990.)

Newman’s position has two interpretations. One, which differs little from Swinburne’s probabilistic approach to natural theology, asserts that the consilience of a number of independent pieces of probable reasoning can result in a probability so high as to be negligibly different from certainty. If, to use an example Newman would not have liked, Aquinas’s five ways were independent and each had probability 75% then taken together their probability is about 99.9%. One difficulty with this interpretation is that even a highly probable argument differs from a demonstration in that the former is vulnerable to probabilistic counter-arguments. Thus a probabilistic version of the Argument from Evil might subsequently reduce the probability from 99.9% down to 75% again.

The other interpretation of Newman’s position is to say that evidentialism falsely presupposes that there are fine gradations on a scale from full belief through partial belief to partial disbelief to full disbelief. Newman claims that human beings are not like that when it comes to those beliefs which form part of religious faith. In such cases the only available states are those of full belief and full disbelief or, perhaps, full belief, and lack of full belief. Of course someone can believe that theism has a probability between 90% and 60%, say, but that could be interpreted as believing that relative to the evidence theism has a probability between 90% and 60%, which, in turn, is a comment on the strength of the case for theism not the expression of a merely partial belief.

If Newman is right in this regard then evidentialism is slightly wrong. Instead of requiring belief to be proportioned to the evidence, full belief is justified if the case for it holds “on the balance of probabilities”. Hence a natural theology consisting of merely probable arguments, such as Swinburne’s, can still show full religious belief to be justified.

Aquino (2012), however, provides a more nuanced reading of Newman, advocating an ïntegrated theoretical and practical wisdom as the justification for non-inferential beliefs.

6. Fideism

Another reaction to the problematic is religious fideism, the thesis that religious faith is an exception to ordinary epistemological constraints, perhaps because the believers think of themselves as chosen by God with their faith as a gift. That version merely shifts the epistemological problem, although Kierkegaard’s position (1983) is more sophisticated, as is Wittgensteinian fideism (Phillips 1992). This asserts thesis that there are various different “language games”, and that while it is appropriate to ask questions about justification within a language game it is a mistake to ask about the justification of “playing” the game in question. In this way epistemology is relativised to language games, themselves related to forms of life, and the one used for assessing religious claims is less stringent than evidentialism. Here there seems to be both an autonomy thesis and an incommensurability thesis. The autonomy thesis tells us that religious utterances are only to be judged as justified or otherwise by the standards implicit in the religious form of life, and this may be further restricted to Christianity or Hinduism, or any other religion (Malcolm 1992). The incommensurability thesis tells us that religious utterances are unlike scientific or metaphysical claims and so we are confusing different uses of language if we judge religious utterances by the standards of science or metaphysics (Phillips 1992). Stress on the autonomy thesis brings Wittgensteinian fideism close to the fideism of many religious conservatives, but stress on the incommensurability thesis brings it close to the extreme liberal position of Braithwaite (1955), namely that religion is about attitudes not facts, which would, of course, be rejected by religious conservatives.

Perhaps the most obvious criticism of Wittgensteinian fideism is that even if the underlying theory of forms of life and language games is granted, it is an historical fact, itself justified by the criteria of the “game” of history, that the tradition to which the majority of Jews, Christians and Muslims belong to is a form of life with heavy metaphysical commitments, and in which such utterances as “There is a God” are intended as much like “There is a star ten times more massive than the Sun” as like “There is hope”. So Wittgensteinian fideism is only appropriate for such religions as Zen Buddhism and for some, relatively recent, liberal strands of Judaism and Christianity which have rejected the traditional metaphysical commitment (as in Cupitt 1984).

The Wittgensteinian position could be modified to allow a metaphysical “language game” with its own criteria for justification etc, and in which natural theology should be pursued. Then the Judeo-Christian-Islamic “language game” would be part of this larger, autonomous metaphysical “language game”. That modified account would cohere with the historical fact of the metaphysical commitment of that religious tradition. In that case, though, it would seem that, not just the Judeo-Christian-Islamic “language game”, but all serious intellectual enquiry should also be treated as parts of the one “game”, with one set of rules. Thus Wittgensteinian fideism would have been qualified out of existence.

Even if you reject Wittgensteinian fideism you might still take a lesson from it. For it must surely be granted that religious utterances are not made in a purely intellectual way. Their entanglement with commitment to a way of life and their emotional charge might help to explain the fact, if it is one, that those who take religion seriously, whether believers or not, do not in fact have a continuous range of degrees of confidence but operate instead with full belief or full disbelief. For, normally, emotionally charged beliefs are either full on or full off, and in abnormal cases tend to be divided rather than partial. Thus, confronted with conflicting evidence about whether your affection is reciprocated you are far less likely to suspend judgement than to oscillate between full belief and full disbelief. Likewise it seems more normal to oscillate between full belief in God in moments of crisis and full disbelief when things go well than to suspend judgement at all times. This ties in with the Newmanian modification of evidentialism, mentioned above.

Recently, Pritchard (2017) has distinguished religious fideism from quasifideism, which Mackie would have called a “companions in guilt” thesis (1977:39), that accepts a fideist position but without any religious exceptionalism. He bases his epistemology on Wittgenstein’s idea of a “hinge commitment”, an arational presupposition of rational belief. A more restricted quasi-fidesim is advoated by Bishop (2007) in his defense of Jamesian “passional choices” in situations of “evidential ambiguity” and by Forrest (2019) who defends commitment in the face of intellectual dilemmas.

Reformed epistemologists, such as Wolterstorff (1976) and Plantinga (1983) reject evidentialism , arguing that beliefs are warranted without Enlightenment-approved evidence provided they are (a) grounded, and (b) defended against known objections. Such beliefs may then themselves be used as evidence for other beliefs. What grounding amounts is, however, contestable: Plantinga proposes that S’s belief that p is grounded in event E if (a) in the circumstances E caused S to believe that p, and (b) S’s coming to believe that p was a case of proper functioning (Plantinga 1993b). It should be noted that the term “warrant” used elsewhere in philosophy as a synonym for “justified” (as in “warranted assertibility”) is used by Plantinga to mean that which has to be adjoined to a true belief for it to be knowledge. (See Plantinga 1993a). Accordingly the most pressing criticism of Plantinga’s later position is that it largely ignores the question of justification, or reasonableness which, as Swinburne explicates it (Swinburne 2001) amounts to whether the religious beliefs are probable relative to total evidence. Here it should be noted however that this requirement does not imply that we are aware of our evidence. Moreover, the evidence can be of a rather private kind that is hard to articulate even for academic philosopher, and the reasoning from that evidence implicit. (See van Inwagen 1994). It could happen then religious believers are mistaken in thinking religious experience grounds their beliefs, because those beliefs, based on implicit reasoning from evidence they cannot articulate, are part of the cause of the experience rather than the other way round (Katz 1978).

Reformed Epistemology results in a stand-off between theists and de-bunkers of religion: if atheist naturalism is correct then theism would not be the result of proper functioning, but if God exist it is. As Moon has pointed out, however, we may draw the conclusion that the de-bunker has failed to undercut religious belief (2016: 21–22).

While the details of grounding might be controversial it may be assumed that reformed epistemologists assert that ordinary religious experiences of awe, gratitude, contrition, etc., ground the beliefs implied by the believer’s sincere reports of such experiences, provided they can be said to cause those beliefs. Such grounded beliefs are warranted provided they can be defended against known objections. They can then be used as evidence for further religious beliefs. Thus if religious experience grounds the belief that God has forgiven you for doing what is wrong to other humans beings, then that is evidence for a personal God who acts in a morally upright fashion. For, it can be argued, only such a God would find anything to forgive in the wrongs you do to your fellow human beings.

Jerome Gellman (1992, 2017) draws our attention to the experience of godlessness. This is occasioned by, but not inferred from, the evils that surround us. If Reformed Epistemology is correct this would seem to ground atheism in the same way that the experience of forgiveness can ground theism.

One difference between reformed epistemology and fideism is that the former requires defence against known objections, whereas the latter might dismiss such objections as either irrelevant or, worse, temptations. Included in the objections are not only those such as the Argument from Evil that seek to rebut, but arguments from sociology and, more recently, cognitive science that seek to undermine by proposing a naturalistic cause for basic religious beliefs. For instance, Barrett (2004) posits a HADD (hyperactive/hypersensitive agency detection device), suggesting that a sensitive agency detection device functions properly if the goal is survival but is hypersensitive if the goal is truth. This hypersensitivity then explains the human tendency towards supernatural beliefs, undermining the proper basicality of those beliefs. Clark and Barrett (2011) suggest that this hypersensitivity could itself be part of the divine plan. An alternative, Bayesian, theistic response would be that HADD exaggerates a properly basic probability for theism that is neither high nor too low prior to further evidence. This justifies a part evidentialist, part reformed, program of assessing the all-things-considered probability resulting from the effect of evidence on this basic probability.

7. Religious Experience, Revelation and Tradition

Reformed epistemology might be thought of as a modification of evidentialism in which the permissible kinds of evidence are expanded. Notable in this context is Alston’s work arguing that certain kinds of religious experience can be assimilated to perception (1991). The difference is that religious experience is more private, personal, emotionally charged and variable than paradigmatic cases of perception. Consider a world in which the majority are tone deaf and the minority who are not are divided between lovers of just one of Gregorian chant, Wagner or Ravi Shankar,and who deride the others as mere noise. Perception has privileged epistemic status. Hence, it is not just a verbal dispute as to whether religious experience is perception or, because God is not the right sort of thing to be perceived, merely somewhat analogous to perception. (See So 2015; Netland 2022; Perrine 2025). Moser’s treatment is not open to that objection. For he draws our attention to the experience of being guided about how we are to live and in our search for meaning (2019).

The difference between reformed epistemology and Enlightenment-style evidentialism is also shown by a consideration of revelation and inspiration. An evidentialist will consider arguments from the premiss that it is said such and such was revealed or the premiss that so and so claimed to be inspired by God, but a reformed epistemologist might allow as warranted those religious beliefs grounded in the event of revelation or inspiration. Thus Mavrodes has argued that any belief due to a genuine revelation is warranted, and has discussed several modes of revelation (Mavrodes 1988). Zagzebski argues that this would have the unacceptable consequence that warrant, and hence knowledge, becomes totally inaccessible either to the person concerned or the community (Zagzebski 1993a: 204–205). For instance, Mavrodes would probably not consider Ramanujan’s belief that Krishna is divine as warranted, but even if Mavrodes is correct Ramanujan would have no access to this truth about the unwarranted character of his own beliefs. A similar criticism could be made of beliefs grounded in religious experience. In both cases, the question of whether a belief is genuinely grounded in religious experience or is genuinely grounded in inspiration is one that several religious traditions have paid attention to, with such theories as that of discernment of spirits (Murphy, 1990, ch 5).

In what may be called “counter-reformed epistemology” it could be allowed that a belief can be warranted if grounded in a religious tradition. (See Zagzebski 1993b.) Such a belief would have to be caused in the right sort of way by the right sort of tradition. As in the previous cases we might note that such grounding should be partially accessible to the believer. Rather little work has been done on this extension of reformed epistemology, but the social dimension of warrant has been noted (Zagzebski 1993a).

More recently Plantinga (2000) has defended a rather different account of divine inspiration, which he calls the Aquinas/Calvin model. This relies upon the doctrine of “original sin” claiming that most humans suffer from a cognitive-affective disorder, but that as a result of Redemption the Holy Spirit heals us so that we are able to function properly, and come to believe the Christian revelation in an immediate, non-inferential manner. In this way the Aquinas/Calvin model supports the Christian metaphysics, which in turn supports the Aquinas/Calvin model. Presumably it will be granted that the probability, y, of the Aquinas/Calvin model given Christian metaphysics is significantly less than 100%, because there are rival Christian models. As a consequence, the probability of Christian metaphysics is less than x/(1−y) where x is the probability of Christian metaphysics given the falsity of the Aquinas/Calvin model. Hence Plantinga’s proposal can succeed only if either y is near 100% or x is not too small.

8. Religious Disagreement

How can sincere intelligent people disagree? Should not both disputants suspend judgement? To be sure, sometimes those who disagree with you are your intellectual inferiors in some respect. Consider, for instance, someone who insisted that π was precisely 22/7. Those who know of and can follow a proof that π is an irrational number may justifiably dismiss that person as a mathematical ignoramus. The case of interest, however, is that in which no such inferiority is on public display. This is referred to as a situation of public epistemic parity. Feldman (2007) criticizes the relativist solution to the problem, namely that there is not always a unique reasonable doxastic attitude to a given proposition in a given epistemic situation. He also rejects unargued dismissal, and reaches the conclusion that in situations of epistemic parity disputants should suspend judgement. Many, however, agree with van Inwagen who, in his autobiographical “Quam Delicta” (1994), implies that it is justified for both parties in a dispute to appeal to what is privately available to them. Such private assertions of epistemic superiority are often expressed by saying that someone “just does not get the point”. Typically, not getting the point requires a cognitive blind-spot. It is not that you know there is a point you cannot grasp, which reasonably requires some deference to those who claim to grasp it; you fail to see there is a point. A somewhat different response to Feldman is that of Forrest (2019), who argues that when the cases for and against a thesis are of different kinds we may sometimes commit to the thesis, because non-comparability is not the same as epistemic parity.

Even when not restricted to religion the problem is often motivated by religious disagreement. See for instance Schellenberg’s moderate skepticism (2007), Pittard’s reply (2019), and Buchak’s argument that sometimes beliefs are rationally maintained in the face of disagreements that would have prevented any initial rational acceptance (2021).

I call the thesis that the general case for suspense of judgement fails to apply to religious faith religious exceptionalism. First, suppose we reject it. Then, because conciliationists modify their own initial beliefs when they encounter peers who disagree, they should re-consider the widely rejected consensus gentium argument for theism (and maybe for an afterlife), perhaps like Netland (2020: 240–41) restricting it to the experience of the divine. Concilationists will, however, grant greater weight to those, dead or alive, whom they regard as experts. Presumably the experts on religion are not philosophers, among whom we may include scientists when philosophizing. For their expertise is only in laying out the various arguments as clearly as they can, which is a preliminary to the assessment of those who disagree. The only possible religious experts are the authorities that represent a tradition or the authors of scriptures held to be authoritative. If we disagree about who if anyone is a religious expert appeal to expertise is circular. (Compare Pittard 2021.)

One reason for religious exceptionalism might be the appeal to divine inspiration, as a source of private epistemic superiority, as in Plantinga’s “Aquinas/Calvin” model (Plantinga 2000). It is hard to see, though, how this could apply to disputes between two religions that both rely on the role of divine inspiration. More recent discussion is contained in the anthology Religious Disagreement and Pluralism (Benton and Kvanvig (2021): Callahan (Ch 2) and Blanchard and Paul (Ch 6) argue that the embedding of religious beliefs in our understanding of ourselves and the world around us is a reason for not deferring to others (Compare Moser 2019); Goldberg (Ch 3) points out that even if, accepting Reformed Epistemology as the general theory of justified or warranted belief, we permit unargued grounds for religious faith, these might be defeated by disagreement;King (Ch 7) warns against the intellectual arrogance seemingly displayed by apologists; Domandy (Ch 10) implicitly replies to King that apologists display loyalty not arrogance, but argues that this loyalty is often misplaced; Pittard (Ch 8) argues that conciliationism is circular unless we can recognize peers, and I would add experts, independently of what we believe on the topic in question; Kvanvig (Ch 9) argues that faith is not primarily intellectual (Again compare Moser 2019); Finally, Choi (Ch 11) argues against reliance on majority opinion in religious disputes.

9. Concluding Remark

Recent epistemology of religion may be interpreted as the rejection of the hegemony of epistemology in favor of the Just More Argument thesis, namely that any attempt impartially to judge philosophical debate on a contested topic merely results in further contributions to that debate.

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  • –––, 2025, The Essence of Catholicism: Religious Commitment within the Bounds of Humanism, London: Bloomsbury Publishing.
  • Geivett, R.D., and B. Sweetman, 1992, Contemporary Perspectives on Religious Epistemology, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Gellman, Jerome, 1992, “A New Look at the Problem of Evil”, Faith and Philosophy, 9: 210–216.
  • –––, 2017, “A Surviving Version of the Common-sense Problem of Evil: A Reply to Tweedt”, Faith and Philosophy, 34: 82–92.
  • Katz, Steven, 1978, “Language Epistemology and Mysticism”, in Mysticism and Philosophical Analysis, S. Katz (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Kelly, Thomas, 2005, “The Epistemic Significance of Disagreement”, in J. Hawthorne and T. Gendler Szabo (eds.) Oxford Studies in Epistemology, (Volume 1), Oxford: Oxford University Press: 167–196.
  • Kierkegard, Søren, 1983, Fear and Trembling in Fear and Trembling / Repetition: Kierkegaard’s Writings 6, ed. and trans. Howard V. Hong and Edna H. Hong, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Kraft, James, 2007, “Religious Disagreement, Externalism, and the Epistemology of Disagreement: Listening to Our Grandmothers”, Religious Studies, 43: 417–432.
  • Mackie, John Leslie, 1977, Ethics: Inventing Right and Wrong, Harmondsworth: Penguin Books.
  • Malcolm, Norman, 1992, “The Groundlessness of Belief”, in Geivett and Sweetman 1992, 92–103; reprinted from Reason and Religion, Stuart C. Brown (ed.), Ithaca: Cornell university Press, 1977.
  • Mavrodes, George I., 1988, Revelation in Religious Belief, Philadelphia: Temple University Press.
  • Miller, Barry, 1991, From Existence to God: A Contemporary Philosophical Argument, London: Routledge.
  • Mitchell, Basil, 1973, The Justification of Religious Belief, London: Macmillan.
  • –––, 1990, “Newman as a Philosopher”, in Newman after a Hundred Years, I. Ker and A. G. Hill (eds.), Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Moon, Andrew, 2016, “Recent work in Reformed Epistemology”, Philosophy Compass, 11(12): 879–891.
  • Moser, Paul K. 2019, Understanding Religious Experience: From Conviction to Life’s Meaning, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Murphy, Nancey, 1990, Theology in an Age of Scientific Reasoning, Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • Netland, Harold A., 2022, Religious Experience and the Knowledge of God: the Evidential Force of Divine Encounters, Grand Rapids: Baker Books.
  • Perrine, Timothy, 2025, “Perceptual Reports and the Impossibility of Perceiving God”, The Philosophical Quarterly, doi:10.1093/pq/pqaf018
  • Phillips, D. Z., 1992, “Faith, Skepticism, and Religious Understanding”, in Geivett and Sweetman 1992, 81–91; reprinted from D. Z. Phillips, Faith and Philosophical Enquiry, London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1970.
  • Pittard, John, 2019, Disagreement, Deference, and Religious Commitment, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Plantinga, Alvin, 1983, “Reason and Belief in God”, in Plantinga and Wolterstorff 1983, 16–93.
  • –––, 1993a, Warrant: The Current Debate, Oxford: The Clarendon Press.
  • –––, 1993b, Warrant and Proper Function, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • –––, 2000, Warranted Christian Belief, Oxford: Oxford University Press
  • Plantinga, Alvin and Nicholas Wolterstorff (eds.), 1983, Faith and Rationality, Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
  • Pritchard, Duncan, 2017, “Faith and Reason”, Royal Institute of Philosophy Supplement, 81: 101–118.
  • Schellenberg, John, 2007, The Wisdom to Doubt: A Justification of Religious Skepticism, Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • ––– 2009, The Will to Imagine: A Justification of Skeptical Religion, Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • Scriven, Michael, 1966, Primary Philosophy, New York: McGraw Hill.
  • Shalkowski, Scott, 1989, “Atheological Apologetics”, American Philosophical Quarterly, 26: 1–17.
  • So, Daniel, 2015, “Can God Be Perceived? A Phenomenological Critique of the Perceptual Model of Mystical Experience”, Sophia, 60: 1009–1025.
  • Stiver, Dan, 2003, “Theological Methodology”, in Kevin Vanhoozer (ed.), Cambridge Companion to Postmodern Theology, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 170–185.
  • Swinburne, Richard, 1979, The Existence of God, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • –––, 1996, Is There a God?, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • –––, 2001, “Review of Warranted Christian Belief by Alvin Plantinga”, Religious Studies, 37: 203–214.
  • Wolterstorff, Nicholas, 1976, Reason within the Bounds of Religion, Grand Rapids: Eerdmans.
  • Vanhoozer, Kevin, 2003, “Theology and the Condition of Postmodernity: A Report on Knowledge (of God)”, in Kevin Vanhoozer (ed.), Cambridge Companion to Postmodern Theology, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 3–25.
  • Van Inwagen, Peter, 1994, “Quam Dilecta”, in God and the Philosophers, T. V. Morris (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 31–40.
  • Zagzebski Linda, 1993b, “Religious Knowledge and the Virtues of the Mind”, in Zagzebski (1993b): 199–225.
  • –––, 1993b, Rational Faith: Catholic Responses to Reformed Epistemology, Notre Dame, IN: Notre Dame Press.

Other Important Works

  • Audi, Robert and William J. Wainwright (eds.), 1986, Rationality, Religious Belief, and Moral Commitment, Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • Dougherty, Trent and Tweedt, Chris, 2015, “Religious Epistemology”, Philosophy Compass, 10: 547–59.
  • Feldman, Richard and Ted Warfield (eds.), 2011, Disagreement, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Geivett, Douglas R. and Brendan Sweetman (eds.), 1992, Contemporary Perspectives on Religious Epistemology, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Howard-Snyder, Daniel (ed.), 1996, The Evidential Argument from Evil, Bloomington: Indiana University Press.
  • Plantinga, Alvin, 1998, “Religion and Epistemology” in E. Craig (ed.), Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Volume 8), London: Routledge.

Other Internet Resources

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