Reasons for Action: Justification, Motivation, Explanation

Why should the UN intervene in this international crisis? Why did the Ancient Egyptians mummify their dead? Should Huck Finn have helped Jim escape and, if so, why? Why is she selling her car? What shall we do this evening? Questions like these that explicitly or implicitly ask for reasons, specifically reasons for action, are ubiquitous. Most contemporary philosophers who have sought to understand the nature of reasons for acting start by distinguishing two kinds: “normative” reasons—that is, reasons which, very roughly, favour an action; and “motivating” reasons—which, again roughly, are the reasons for which someone acts. There are, in addition, reasons that explain an action without favouring it or having motivated the agent.

A clear understanding of reasons for acting in their favouring, motivating and explanatory functions is of relevance to the philosophy of action, ethics, political philosophy and the philosophy of law. The essential issues about these reasons: what they are, and how they relate to each other and to actions, are of wider concern.

This entry examines the various accounts that philosophers have given of these different kinds of reasons and their interconnections, as well as the disagreements among them about these matters. The focus will be on reasons for acting—commonly called “practical reasons”. For the most part, the entry will leave aside questions about reasons for responses other than actions—for instance, reasons for believing, wanting, and feeling. This is not to deny that a central question in the theory of reasons concerns the possibility of a unified account of reasons that comprises reasons for any kind of response.

• 1. The Variety of (Practical) Reasons
• 2. Normative Reasons
  • 2.1 The Ontology of Normative Reasons
  • 2.2 The Constitution of Normative Reasons
  • 2.3 Normative Reasons, Morality, Metaethics and Deliberation
• 3. Motivating (and Explanatory) Reasons
  • 3.1 The Ontology of Motivating Reasons
  • 3.2 Acting for a Motivating Reason
    • 3.2.1 Knowing one’s reason
    • 3.2.2 Taking considerations as reasons: the guise of reasons
• 4. The Relationship between Normative and Motivating Reasons
  • 4.1 Normative Reasons and Guidance
  • 4.2 Acting for a Normative Reason
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. The Variety of (Practical) Reasons

People engage in practical reasoning: they deliberate about what to do and how to do it. And they often act in light of or guided by reasons—which can then feature in an explanation of their actions and, sometimes, justify them. These ideas go back to Plato (Protagoras and Republic, Book 4) and Aristotle (Nicomachean Ethics, Bks VI and VII, and De Anima, III.10; see Price 2011) and they have been a constant theme in the history of philosophy. In the eighteenth century, David Hume and Immanuel Kant offered radically different views on the role and importance of Reason (the faculty of reason) in guiding and justifying our behaviour. Their contributions remain influential today, but in the past sixty years, the focus of discussion has shifted from the faculty of reason to reasons: roughly, considerations that guide or justify our actions. In the philosophy of mind, interest in reasons arose from the thought that intentional actions are done for reasons—a view connected to Elizabeth Anscombe’s Intention (1957) and explicitly defended by Donald Davidson in his influential paper “Actions, Reasons, and Causes” (1963). In the field of ethics and normativity, broadly understood, interests in reasons arose especially from questions about the authority of morality (as in, e.g., Nagel 1970; Foot 1972, Williams 1979), as well as from connections between reasons and notions such as justification, obligations, excuses, rationality, and moral worth—among others.

As mentioned in the introduction, contemporary authors tend to distinguish between “normative” and “motivating” reasons. Jonathan Dancy (2000), who discusses the history of this distinction, notes that this contemporary classification doesn’t always map neatly onto their alleged ancestors, for instance, Francis Hutcheson’s (1728). Whatever its history, the distinction is now accepted by most if not all contemporary philosophers who write on this topic (representative examples include Raz 1975; Smith 1994; Scanlon 1998; Dancy 2000; Schroeder 2007; Alvarez 2010; Parfit 2011; Markovits 2014; Lord 2018; McHugh & Way 2022).

A normative reason is a reason (for someone) to act—in T.M. Scanlon’s phrase, “a consideration that counts in favour of” someone’s acting in a certain way (1998: 17). A motivating reason is a reason for which someone acts—a reason which guides their action. Since we can often explain what a person does by citing their reasons, motivating reasons are sometimes also called “explanatory reasons”. However, recent authors tend to distinguish motivating and explanatory reasons and there are good grounds for doing so (see section 3).

How should this distinction be understood? On an influential view (Baier 1958; Dancy 2000; Hieronymi 2011), this is just a distinction concerning different things reasons can do. Dancy writes:

When I call a reason “motivating”, all that I am doing is issuing a reminder that the focus of our attention is on matters of motivation, for the moment. When I call it “normative”, again all that I am doing is stressing that we are currently thinking about whether it is a good reason, one that favours acting in the way proposed (Dancy 2000: 2–3).

The thought here is that talk of different kinds of reasons can be understood in terms of the different roles that reasons can play. These different roles become apparent when we attend to different questions we can ask about reasons. For instance, we may ask whether there is a reason for the Chancellor to introduce a “sugar tax” for drinks and ask also what the Chancellor’s reason for introducing such a tax was. The first is about reasons that favour actions (normative), the second about reasons that guide agents (motivating). Note that the same reason may answer both questions. For example, that the tax will reduce child obesity may be both a reason for the Chancellor to introduce a “sugar tax” (normative reason) and the Chancellor’s reason for doing so (motivating reason). But people don’t always act for the reasons that favour their doing something—even when they do what the reasons that apply to them favour. A corrupt Chancellor may be motivated to introduce a sugar tax because it will benefit her husband’s low-sugar drinks company—but that is not a normative reason for her, as Chancellor, to introduce that tax. If this way of understanding talk about different kinds of reasons is right, perhaps the picture is more complex than the dichotomy of “normative vs. motivating” reasons suggests—as will be discussed in section 3.

A seemingly stronger, although consistent, interpretation of the distinction treats normative and motivating/explanatory reasons as entities of different ontological kinds. Accordingly, normative reasons are objective and mind-independent: they are facts, or truths, or “worldly” things, such as states of affairs, etc.; motivating reasons, by contrast, are subjective and mind-dependent: mental entities such as mental states of agents—or their contents. These issues will be explored further below.

The following section focuses on normative reasons. Section 3 focuses on motivating reasons and section 4 discusses the relation between normative and motivating reasons.

2. Normative Reasons

A reason is said to be a “normative reason” for someone to act because it favours their so acting: it supports, or makes a case for, or helps justify, that course of action. More can be said about what this amounts to by focusing on two roles normative reasons can play.

First, normative reasons play a deontic role: they explain an action’s deontic status for someone—that is, whether, all things considered, she ought, must or may do that thing. If a reason favours my doing something, then I have a pro tanto reason to do it: it is to that extent right for me to do it. But there may also be a reason against my doing it: a pro tanto reason not to do it. The fact that a joke is funny may be a reason to tell it; but that it will embarrass someone may be a reason against. So, I have a reason to tell the joke and a different reason not to tell it. Whether, all things considered, I ought to tell the joke depends on whether either of the reasons “outweighs” or otherwise “defeats” the other: if the reason for telling the joke is outweighed by the reason against it, then I ought not tell the joke. If neither defeats the other, then, I may tell it—but it’s not the case that I ought to tell it.

Second, normative reasons play a deliberative role: they are things it’s appropriate to pay attention to in deliberation. When considering whether to tell the joke, I should take into account both that it’s funny, and that it’ll embarrass someone. And if the latter reason outweighs the former, and I deliberate well, I’ll decide not to tell the joke, precisely because it will embarrass someone. (In that case, this consideration will be my motivating reason. Thus, the deliberative role of normative reasons makes them potential motivating reasons. More on this in section 3).

Can we say more about what exactly normative reasons are, given these two roles they can play? This question raises two issues: (i) an ontological one about what sort of entities can be normative reasons for action; and (ii) a constitutive issue about what it is for an entity of the relevant sort to favour a particular course of action. We address them in turn, before discussing some further issues about normative reasons.

2.1 The Ontology of Normative Reasons

When it comes to ontology, ordinary language is liberal. We say that your upcoming birthday, or the weather, or your wish to see red squirrels, is a reason to visit the Isle of Wight. This might suggest that events, things, and states of mind, among other kinds, can all be normative reasons. But such reason claims can be rephrased using “that” clauses. For instance, that the weather will be nice, that it’s your birthday, or that you want to see squirrels can be a reason to visit the Isle of Wight (Schroeder 2007: 20–21). Moreover, only what is the case can favour or justify actions: if the weather won’t be nice on Sunday, then the weather doesn’t support visiting then. Consequently, philosophers tend to hold that normative reasons are facts (Raz 1975; Scanlon 1998; contrast Fantl & McGrath 2009; Gibbons 2010; Howard 2021).

This apparent consensus is complicated by two issues. First, some philosophers distinguish between “objective” and “subjective” (or sometimes “apparent”) normative reasons. Roughly, objective reasons are the facts that count for or against acting: considerations an informed adviser would take into account. Subjective reasons are things you believe and that might make it reasonable to act. Since you might act reasonably on false beliefs, subjective reasons cannot be facts (Schroeder 2008; Parfit 2011; see also Fogal & Worsnip 2021). This entry will continue to use “normative reason” to mean “objective normative reason” unless otherwise indicated.

The second complication is that there is disagreement about what facts are: are they concrete or abstract entities? Is a fact the same as the corresponding true proposition, or is it the “truth-maker” of the proposition? Among those who hold that normative reasons are facts, some identify reasons with true propositions (Darwall 1983; Smith 1994; Scanlon 1998; Alvarez 2010; Setiya 2014; Lord 2018; or with “the truth of a proposition” (Hyman 2015). Others reject this view; for example, Dancy (2000, 2018) and Mantel (2018) do so on the grounds that propositions are abstract and representational (they represent the way the world is) but, they say, reasons must be concrete and non-representational (they are “ways the world is”). These problems are complex and have many ramifications. For present purposes, this entry will ignore them and continue to speak of normative reasons as facts.

2.2 The Constitution of Normative Reasons

The second issue is what it is for an entity of the relevant ontological category to favour an action. Given our assumption that normative reasons are facts, the issue is thus what it is for a fact to be a normative reason for a particular agent to undertake a particular course of action? What is it for, say, the fact that the joke is funny to “favour” my telling it? This question asks for an account of the relation that obtains between a fact, a way of acting, and an agent, when that fact is a reason for that agent to act in that way. (A relation that may have further relata—e.g., time and circumstances [Skorupski 2010; Scanlon 2014]).

Some hold that no informative answer to this question is possible: the idea of a reason is primitive. Although we may offer metaphors, such as that reasons “count in favour” of actions, these metaphors don’t explain reasons in more basic terms (Hampton 1998; Scanlon 1998, 2014; Dancy 2004; Skorupski 2010; Parfit 2011). Others disagree. Very broadly, we can distinguish three (not mutually exclusive) groups of views among the latter.

The first group aims to characterise reasons in terms of their deontic role, i.e., their capacity to determine the deontic status of actions. (This approach has roots in W.D. Ross’s characterisation of prima facie duties—roughly, moral reasons—as features that make an action obligatory in the absence of conflicting duties (1939: 19; for discussion see Dancy 2004: 18–20)). The most prominent contemporary version of the view is due to John Broome (2013: ch. 4). Broome begins with the idea that a reason is an explanation of why you ought to do something. However, this seems not to allow that reasons can be defeated (though see Nebel 2019). Broome thus introduces the idea of a “weighing explanation”: an explanation of an act’s deontic status that appeals to considerations for or against the action. Broome proposes that a reason to act is a consideration that plays the “for” role in such an explanation (2013: 53; for discussion see Brunero 2013, 2019).

The second group of views aims to characterise normative reasons in terms of their deliberative role: to be a reason is to be a fact that it is appropriate to consider in deliberation, or on the basis of which it is right to decide what to do. Bernard Williams can be read as endorsing such a view in proposing that a subject has a reason to act only if he could reach the conclusion to so act “by a sound deliberative route from the motivations he already has” (1989: 35, see also Williams 1979). Although Williams developed this idea in a broadly “Humean” way (see below), the core idea of understanding normative reasons in terms of their deliberative role is independent of these commitments. For instance, one may hold that a reason is a fact you would be motivated by in so far as you are rational (Korsgaard 1986), or one for which your rational counterpart would want you to act (Smith 1994; Manne 2014) or a premise of good reasoning (Setiya 2014; Way 2017; McHugh & Way 2022). For further variants, see, e.g., Street 2008; Markovits 2014). Kearns and Star’s (2008, 2009) proposal that a reason to act is evidence that you ought to so act can also be understood in this way, if we take practical deliberation to aim to figure out what you ought to do (Star 2015, 2018a; see also Raz 1978: 5ff; Whiting 2021: ch.2).

A third group of views understands normative reasons in terms of a relation between reasons and certain types of ends. “Desire-based” versions of this view, which take inspiration from Hume’s remarks about reason and the passions, take the relevant ends to be the intentional objects of desires. On a simple desire-based view, a reason for you to act is a fact that helps explain why acting that way would achieve something you desire. For instance, the fact that there will be dancing at the party is a reason for Ronnie to go to the party, because it helps explain why going to the party will help Ronnie to do something he wants to do—namely, dancing (Schroeder 2007; see also Williams 1979, 1989; Alan Goldman 2009; Markovits 2014; Manne 2014, 2016). “Value-based” versions understand reasons in terms of a relation to good, or valuable, ends. This view is associated with Aristotle who links the right in practical reason with what is conducive to the good (Nicomachean Ethics) and was prevalent among medieval philosophers (e.g., Thomas Aquinas, Summa Theologiae, 1a, q.82). A simple formulation takes reasons to be facts that explain why acting in a certain way would achieve some valuable end (Finlay 2014; Maguire 2016). Other versions invoke other relations to the valuable, such as respect for it (see also Anderson 1993; Raz 1999, 2001, 2011; Wedgwood 2017; Sylvan 2021. For a recent discussion see Kiesewetter 2022).

These different approaches to characterising normative reasons can be assessed in various ways: for instance, with reference to how well they accommodate the deontic and deliberative roles of normative reasons; or to their implications concerning what reasons we have in particular cases. Each approach faces challenges on these and other fronts, some of which are outlined below.

One very general issue worth noting is that an account of “the reason relation” should arguably be general: it should apply not just to reasons to act but also to reasons to believe, want, and feel (e.g., Kearns & Star 2009: 219–22; Gibbons 2010; Way 2017: 255). There doesn’t seem to be a difference in the relation we are invoking when we say, for instance, that the fact that there’s going to be an election is a reason both to register to vote and to fear things are going to get worse. Rather, one fact stands in the same relation—of favouring or supporting—to both an action and an emotion. So, the different accounts should be assessed according to how plausible they are, not just as accounts of reasons to act, but of reasons for these other types of response too.

2.3 Normative Reasons, Morality, Metaethics and Deliberation

However we characterise normative reasons, they raise a host of interesting and important issues, which intersect with other areas of practical philosophy. This section will briefly outline three such issues, and then say a little more about a fourth.

First, there are questions about the relationship between reasons and morality. A traditionally central question is whether we all have good reason to do as morality requires. This question is especially pressing for desire-based accounts of reasons and for certain versions of the view that reasons should be understood in terms of their deliberative role. For it certainly seems possible that doing what morality requires may not serve any desire a person has and may not be anything to which there is “a sound deliberative route from the motivations he already has” (Williams 1989:35; see entry on reasons for action: internal vs. external). Beyond this issue, there are important questions about what, if anything, is distinctive about moral reasons (see, e.g., Scanlon 1998; Darwall 2006; Southwood 2011). And there are questions about whether the theory of normative reasons has any implications for normative ethics (see, e.g., entry on moral particularism and moral generalism).

Second, there are questions that intersect with discussions in metaethics about how normativity fits with the non-normative world. For instance, can the relation of being a normative reason be analysed in naturalistic or descriptive terms? Do normative reasons depend on us in some way? Are judgements about reasons even in the business of ascribing properties at all? While questions of this sort have traditionally been raised about moral properties—e.g., moral rightness and wrongness—many recent philosophers have come to see them as general questions about normative facts. Accordingly, much recent metaethical work has focused not on morality but on normativity, and sometimes on normative reasons in particular (see entry on normativity in metaethics).

Third, there are questions about how normative reasons play their deliberative role, such as: What makes for good deliberation, or reasoning? What is involved in responding to a normative reason? What kinds of evaluations turn on the normative reasons we act for? These questions take us into moral psychology and action theory. Some of them are explored in section 3 and section 4.

Fourth, there are questions about how normative reasons play their deontic role, that intersect with questions in normative ethics. How do the various reasons for and against a course of action combine to determine whether someone ought or may undertake it? A simple proposal is that whether someone ought to act in a certain way depends on how all the reasons for and against so acting weigh up in comparison to all the reasons for and against the alternatives (see, e.g., Berker 2007; Schroeder 2007). But this already raises a host of questions.

To begin with, is it really the case that all the reasons bearing on an act are relevant to determining its deontic status? Above we said that normative reasons are facts. The combination of these two ideas leads to some surprising results. Suppose, to take a well-known example of Judith Thomson’s (1990: 299), that due to an extraordinary and unforeseeable coincidence, flipping the light switch when you get home will cause a small lightning flash in your neighbour’s home, badly burning them. This fact seems to strongly count against flipping the switch. So, all else being equal, you ought not flip the switch. However, since the harm to your neighbour is entirely unforeseeable, many people (though notably, not Thomson; see also Graham 2011) find this conclusion hard to accept.

In light of such concerns, some philosophers endorse an epistemic constraint, either on normative reasons (Dancy 2000: 56–9; Kiesewetter 2017; Markovits 2010: 219), or on the reasons relevant to deontic status (Setiya 2014; Lord 2018). On this “perspectivist” view, a fact must fall within your epistemic perspective—you must know it, or perhaps be in a position to know it, or reasonably believe it, etc.—if it is to bear on what you ought to do. Others distinguish between types of deontic status. In Thomson’s example, it seems plausible that, relative to all the facts, you ought to refrain from flipping the switch; but, relative to the facts you know, or to your beliefs, you may flip the switch. These different verdicts play different roles in our thought and practices: for instance, what we ought to do relative to all the facts may be what we aim to discover through deliberation and advice, while what someone ought to do relative to what they know, or perhaps believe, is more closely tied to assessments of rationality, and merit and culpability (Schroeder 2008). Given these distinctions, the deontic role that reasons play should be refined: objective reasons determine deontic status in the former contexts, while subjective reasons determine it in the second (Schroeder 2007; Parfit 2011; Fogal & Worsnip 2021).

However, these issues are settled, reasons’ deontic role raises further, more fundamental, questions. How exactly do the relevant reasons determine deontic status? In many cases, it is natural to appeal to metaphors of weight and strength: my reasons to complete my report are stronger than my reasons to take the day off and enjoy the sunshine, so I ought to keep working. The amusement the joke will bring is outweighed by the embarrassment it will cause, and so I ought not tell the joke. What should we make of these metaphors? They seem to have limitations. For instance, reasons are claimed not to combine in a simple additive way, or to vary with context, or to be sometimes incomparable (see, e.g., Dancy 2004, 2018; Bader 2016; Cullity 2018; and the entry on incommensurable values). An important question is thus how an account of reasons’ weights can make sense of those observations (Schroeder 2007: ch.7; Horty 2012; Nair 2021; McHugh & Way 2022: ch.5).

Another worry is that the metaphor of weight and strength is inappropriate in portraying the relation between some reasons. For instance, a longstanding idea is that some moral reasons—say, that so acting would be taking an innocent life—“silence”, rather than “outweigh” competing reasons (McDowell 1978; for a related idea see Raz 1975, 1989, and Raz 2021 on “exclusionary reasons” in the Other Internet Resources). More generally, it is not clear how the proposal encompasses the full range of considerations that can bear on deontic status—for instance, obligations to others, rights, commitments, ideals. Finally, the proposal builds in “maximisation”: we ought to follow the weightiest reasons. But very often it seems okay to do less than the best—for example, when the best would be supererogatory, or an alternative would be good enough. Nor is it clear how to accommodate a distinction between what we ought to do and what we must do. Such concerns have led some to refine the simple proposal, or pursue alternatives (Raz 1986; Gert 2004, 2007; McElwee 2011; Lord & Maguire 2016a; Snedegar 2016, 2018; Maguire & Snedegar 2021; Tucker 2022; Whiting 2021: ch. 3).

3. Motivating (and Explanatory) Reasons

Motivating reasons are the reasons for which we act—the reasons that motivate us. Motivating reasons can thereby explain our actions. However, motivating reasons should not simply be equated with the reasons that explain our actions.

Consider the behaviour of Othello in Shakespeare’s play of the same name. Othello kills Desdemona guided by the belief, induced by jealous Iago, that she has been unfaithful to him. The tragedy of the play lies in the fact that Desdemona is innocent: she loves Othello and is faithful to him. Clearly—and putting aside whether infidelity could ever favour murder—there is in Othello no reason that favours the murder: no normative reason for Othello to kill Desdemona, since she is not unfaithful. Still, there are two things that seem true about Othello’s killing of Desdemona. One is that he is motivated to kill Desdemona by the (putative) fact that she has been unfaithful. The other is that his action can be explained by citing the fact that he believes that Desdemona has been unfaithful. So here we seem to have two quite different reasons: one that motivates Othello—the (putative) fact that Desdemona has been unfaithful; and one that explains his action—the (actual) fact that he believes that she has been unfaithful. We can distinguish, that is, between the reason that explains Othello’s action (the fact that he believes that Desdemona has been unfaithful) and the reason, or apparent reason, that motivates him to act (Desdemona’s alleged infidelity itself).

Accordingly, we should distinguish in general (at least) three kinds of reasons: normative, motivating and explanatory, corresponding to whether a reason favours, motivates, or explains an action. This sits well with the suggestion (in section 1) that the distinction between normative and motivating reasons is drawn on the basis of the different questions that reasons can answer. For there seem to be at least three distinct questions about the relation between reasons and actions. There are questions about whether there is a reason that favours someone’s action (normative); questions about the considerations—(putative) facts—in light of which someone act (motivating); and also questions about what reasons explain an action (explanatory). This threefold classification is explicitly accepted and defended by various authors (Baier 1958; Alvarez 2007, 2009, 2010; Hieronymi 2011); and it is implicit, sometimes using different terminology, in discussions by others (Smith 1994; Scanlon 1998; Mantel 2014).

This use of “the motivating reason” for the consideration “in light of which” someone acts is of course somewhat stipulative.

First, talk of “the agent’s motivating reason” typically involves some simplification. For one thing, a consideration in light of which one acts will figure in deliberation in combination with other considerations. For example, that I won’t have time to hoover later may motivate me to hoover early in the morning only in combination with other considerations, for instance, that the house needs hoovering today. My reason then is, arguably, a combination of at least two considerations: that the house needs hoovering today and that I won’t be able to do it later. This point is relevant to questions about the relation between normative and motivating reasons (see section 4). Moreover, an agent may be motivated to act by more than one consideration in a different sense: I may hoover the house early in the morning both because I won’t have time to do it later and also because it will annoy my inconsiderate neighbour. Alternatively, I might take myself to have those two reasons to hoover early but act motivated only by one of them (this point is central to Davidson’s (1963) influential argument that motivating reasons are causes of intentional actions). Finally, I may consider something that counts against acting, for instance, that hoovering early will also disturb my other, very considerate neighbour. If I still decide to hoover early, I do not act for that “con reason” but, arguably, I am still guided by it in some sense, if I give it some weight in my deliberation (Ruben 2009).

Talk of motivating reasons is stipulative also in excluding some things that might reasonably be assumed to be motivating reasons. For instance, someone’s goal or intention in acting (to grow vegetables, to become rich) are motivating factors but, because they are not considerations in light of which one acts, do not fall under the category “motivating reasons” as here understood (but see Audi 1993; Howard 2021). Similarly, a state of desiring (such as wanting to have one’s revenge), or a motive or emotion (for instance, jealousy) can be states “that encompass motivation”, to use Mele’s phrase (2003). Nevertheless, they are not motivating reasons as understood here. Rather, the considerations (if any) in response to which the person desires, or feels the emotion, will thereby be the person’s motivating reasons. To continue with our example, Othello’s jealousy and desire to kill Desdemona is based on the thought that she is unfaithful to him. This consideration is Othello’s reason both for wanting to kill her and his reason for doing so.

But what exactly is a motivating reason, thus understood? What kind of entities can be considerations in light of which someone acts? And what kind of relation must hold between an agent and an entity of the relevant kind for it to be the reason for which she acts? Section 3.1 addresses the former question, while section 3.2 examines the latter.

3.1 The Ontology of Motivating Reasons

In the literature on the theory of action until the turn of the twentieth century, the dominant view was that motivating reasons are mental states of the agent’s—a view sometimes called “psychologism”. Davidson 1963 is often cited as the locus classicus of psychologism, and the view was also influentially defended in Smith 1994: ch. 4; see also Wallace 2003, Pryor 2007, Turri 2009, Gibbons 2010. Davidson characterises an intentional action as an event—a bodily movement—caused “in the right way” by a combination of two mental states: a “pro-attitude” (roughly, a desire) and a belief. Davidson called this combination of mental states the agent’s “primary reason” (1963: 687).

Psychologism is appealing. First, when an agent acts for a reason, he acts motivated by some end towards which he has a pro-attitude and guided by a belief about how to achieve that end. To return to our example, Othello murdered Desdemona motivated by the desire to defend his honour and guided by his belief that the latter demanded Desdemona’s death, given her unfaithfulness. Second, for a reason to motivate, you must have the right sort of “epistemic contact” with that reason: you must know or believe the consideration that constitutes that reason. Both these points appear to support the view that the reasons that motivate are agents’ mental states.

However, these arguments don’t suffice to establish psychologism. In fact, there are forceful arguments against the position. A simple point, highlighted in the Othello example, is that reflection on the considerations that agents take as reasons for acting, and on what they typically give and accept as their reasons, counts against psychologism. As Othello deliberates about what to do, even while in the grip of jealousy, his reasoning does not include considerations about whether he believes this or that but rather about what Desdemona has or has not done. The things that Othello considers and responds to are not his mental states but rather facts, or alleged facts, about the world around him, in particular about Desdemona.

Another important argument turns on the idea that any account of motivating reasons must meet what Dancy (1995; 2000) calls “the normative constraint”:

This [normative constraint] requires that a motivating reason, that in the light of which one acts, must be the sort of thing that is capable of being among the reasons in favour of so acting; it must, in this sense, be possible to act for a good reason (2000: 103; see also Raz 2011: 27).

Dancy’s point is that psychologism fails to meet this constraint—in fact, he says, psychologism has the consequence that “the reasons why we act can never be among the reasons in favour of acting” (2000: 105). Why? In order to act for a good reason (in Dancy’s sense), we need to act for a reason that is or could be a fact—for Dancy, something that is or could be the case. But psychologism does not meet this constraint because a mental state is not, not could it be, a fact. In short, Dancy thinks that you act for a good reason only if your motivating reason is a normative reason that favours your action, or it is at least a consideration which, if true, would or could favour it (see Heuer 2004 for a helpful explanation).

A variant of psychologism avoids this objection by claiming that motivating reasons are “psychological facts”—that is, facts about the agent’s mental states. For instance, on this view, Jo’s reason for running is the (psychological) fact that she believes that she’s late. This position appears to meet Dancy’s constraint, at least formally: psychological facts are facts. But the view is unsatisfactory because, although we are occasionally motivated by facts about our psychology—as when someone decides to see his doctor because he is convinced he’s being pursued by the Security Services (Hyman 1999)—most motivating reasons are not psychological facts: they are (putative) facts about all sorts of things.

Alternatively, it may be argued that psychologism meets Dancy’s normative constraint because it holds that motivating reasons are mental states whose contents correspond to normative reasons. It is a mistake to assume that meeting the constraint requires the identity of normative and motivating reasons (Mantel 2014).

To determine the success of this response we need to disambiguate it. On the one hand, the response can be taken to argue that the reasons that motivate us are the contents of our mental states of believing. This meets the normative constraint (on this view, one can act for a good reason) but this does not vindicate psychologism because the contents of mental states are not themselves mental states: they may be propositions, or facts, etc. If, by contrast, the response is construed as simply asserting that a mental state with the right content can be a good reason for acting (in Dancy’s sense), then it is not clear how this engages with Dancy’s objection.

The above and other arguments (see, e.g., Stout 1996; Stoutland 1998; Hyman 1999, 2015; Raz 1999; Dancy 2000, 2008; Williamson 2000; Bittner 2001; Schueler 2003; Hornsby 2007, 2008; Alvarez 2008, 2009, 2010; McDowell 2013) suggest that being motivated by a reason is not being motivated by, or acting in light of, or guided by, a mental state. Accordingly, psychologism is now a minority view.

There are currently two main alternatives to psychologism: “factualism” (motivating reasons are facts) and “propositionalism” (motivating reasons are true or false propositions).

Each face difficulties. For factualism, a central problem concerns “error cases”: cases like Othello’s, where the agent is motivated to act by a false consideration. In the example what motivated Othello, what he would give as his reason—that Desdemona has been unfaithful—is false. And so, Othello cannot act in light of the fact that Desdemona has been unfaithful since there is no such fact. A possible response is that, in error cases, the agent is motivated by something that he treats as a reason but which is in fact merely an “apparent reason” (Alvarez 2010).

Propositionalism, it seems, can accommodate this problem: in error cases, the positions holds, agents act for a reason that is a false proposition that the agent believes. So, in the example above, Othello’s reason is the (false) proposition about Desdemona, which he believes. Note his motivating reason is not his believing that she’s unfaithful, which would bring us back to psychologism, but what he believes. According to this proposal, then, Othello did act for a reason: a putative fact that the agent takes to obtain. The view is defended or endorsed by many, including Dancy (2000, 2008, 2014), Hornsby (2007, 2008), Setiya (2007), Schroeder (2008), McDowell (2013), Comesaña & McGrath (2014), and Singh (2019).

Against this, it has been argued that the proposal leads to paradox or infelicitous claims. As Unger puts the point:

it is inconsistent to say “His reason was that the store was going to close, but it wasn’t going to close”. (1975: 208)

If so, the response that in error cases the agent’s reason is a false proposition is problematic.

But is this anything other than a terminological dispute? After all, if some philosophers choose to call false propositions that motivate “motivating reasons”, while others choose to call them “apparent reasons”, that seems perfectly unobjectionable. The substantial issue behind this disagreement seems, then, whether the notion of a reason we apply in different contexts is a unified notion; and, if it is, what aspect or features of reasons, if any, are essential or central to that notion—for instance, that they can determine deontic status, that they can explain (all sorts of things), or that they can be used in reasoning. If the former two are taken to be central, then it follows that a false proposition cannot be a reason. In contrast, the view that the central feature of reasons is that they can be premises of reasoning allows for more latitude so as to include false propositions as reasons.

3.2 Acting for a Motivating Reason

Motivating reasons are considerations in light of which we act. However we conceive of them ontologically, there are issues about what it takes for an agent to act for a motivating reason.

3.2.1 Knowing one’s reason

Most accounts of acting for a motivating reason require as a condition that the agent be in some kind of epistemic relation to the reason that motivates her. One view is that this epistemic relation is belief: for an agent to act for the reason that p, the agent must at least believe that p. It is this thought that led some to psychologism.

More recently, some have argued that, at least when someone acts for a reason that is also a fact, the agent needs to know and not merely believe the relevant fact, if they are to act in light of it. The view is defended by Unger (1975), Hyman (1999, 2011, 2015), Williamson (2000, 2017), Hornsby (2007, 2008), and McDowell (2013). The basic thought is that, if the agent does not know the fact, she cannot be guided by it (Hyman), or respond rationally to it (McDowell). The relationship between the agent’s acting as she does and the relevant fact will be fortuitous, a matter of luck or coincidence. To illustrate, suppose someone believes on a hunch that Pegasus will win the Grand National, and so places a large bet. Even if Pegasus does win, the person was not guided by the fact that Pegasus will win; they just got lucky (Hyman 1999: 447). The same may be true when an agent acts on a belief that is both true and justified. Suppose someone believes that it is 5pm because they glance at what—unbeknownst to them—is a stopped clock, and so leave for their appointment. Even though it actually is 5pm, they are not guided by this fact—they just got lucky. (This point extends Gettier’s (1963) famous arguments that justified true belief is not sufficient for knowledge; see entry on the analysis of knowledge).

These arguments remain contentious. For example, Dustin Locke (2015) uses so-called “fake-barn” cases to argue that we can act in light of a fact without knowing it. Suppose a man is driving in the countryside and sees a (real) barn ahead. Unbeknown to him, he’s driving in “fake-barn country”, which is littered with fake barns: barn façades designed to look like real barns. It is widely held that, although the man is looking at a real barn, he does not know that it’s a barn (Alvin Goldman 1967). Nonetheless, Locke argues, he might, for instance, drive towards the barn guided by the fact that it’s a barn. Thus, being guided by a fact does not require knowing it. For further views and discussion, see Hawthorne 2004; Brown 2008; Neta 2009; Dancy 2011, 2014; Lord 2018; Hawthorne & Magidor 2018, Whiting 2021: ch.5.

3.2.2 Taking considerations as reasons: the guise of reasons

As we have seen, motivating reasons need not be normative reasons: we don’t always act for good reasons. However, an influential and attractive view is that they must be taken to be normative reasons. As Davidson (1963) puts it, when an agent acts for a motivating reason then “from the agent’s point of view there was, when he acted, something to be said for the action” (1963: 691; see also Darwall 1983: 32; Scanlon 1998: 23). The view is a relative of the ancient idea that all action takes place “under the guise of the good”—that whenever we act intentionally, we take what we are doing to be in some way good. This view is defended by Anscombe (1957), Stampe (1987), Quinn (1993), Raz (1999), Schueler (2003), and Oddie (2005), amongst others. Indeed, if we assume that taking there to be a normative reason to act involves taking acting in that way to be good, the view embraces the guise of the good thesis. Nonetheless, this assumption may be questioned and some claim that a “guise of reasons” view that does without it has advantages over the guise of the good (Gregory 2021).

There are important questions about how exactly these views are to be understood. For instance, what is it to “take” a consideration to be a normative reason? On one natural view, to take a consideration to be a normative reason is just to believe that it is a normative reason (Gregory 2021). Another view is that taking a consideration to be a reason is a quasi-perceptual state of that consideration’s seeming to be a reason (compare Stampe 1987; Oddie 2005; Tenenbaum 2007; Moss 2012), and yet other contenders have emerged in the recent literature (Tenenbaum 2008; Schafer 2013; Singh 2019).

Much of the debate concerning the guise of reasons and the guise of the good has focused on putative counterexamples—cases in which, it is claimed, someone acts intentionally or for a reason without taking any consideration to count in favour of what they are doing. To take a few representative examples, some claim that negative emotions such an anger or frustration might lead us to do what we recognise to be in no way good, as when someone shouts at or destroys an “uncooperative” household appliance (Stocker 1979; Hursthouse 1991). Others claim that we can be motivated to act in ways we take to be entirely bad, and indeed be so motivated precisely because we take the action to be bad—as when Milton’s Satan declares “evil be thou my good” (Velleman 1992). And others suggest that animals and young children might act for reasons, while lacking the conceptual sophistication to represent their actions as good. Various responses have been offered to these examples. For instance, some take cases of negative emotions to undermine the view that we act only in ways we believe to be good, but not the view that we act only in ways that, at the time, appear good (Tenenbaum 2007). Others emphasise the varieties of ways in which something can be good, or a reason—thus for instance, while Milton’s Satan might be motivated by what he takes to be morally bad, he may still do what he takes to be good in other ways (Anscombe 1957; Tenenbaum 2007). And there has been much debate on “expressive actions”, for example, on whether actions done out of strong emotions are intentional or done for reasons (see Bennett 2021 for an overview).

Since arguments by counterexample are often inconclusive, recent discussions have focused more on what role the guise of reasons, or the guise of the good, might play in a satisfying account of what it is to act for reasons. Thus Setiya (2007) argues against these theses on the grounds that they play no role: he claims that the central task for an account of what it is to act for reasons is to explain our distinctive knowledge of our own actions, and that this can be provided without any appeal to the guise of reasons, or the good. However, many other theorists have thought that there are indeed principled reasons for action theory to accept one of these theses. Perhaps the most important argument appeals to the idea that, in stating an agent’s motivating reasons, one shows the agent’s action to be intelligible in a distinctive way—a way characteristic of rational creatures. Proponents of this argument suggest that explanations of agent’s actions which don’t reveal the way the agent took so acting to be good, or supported by reasons, fail to do this. To adapt a famous example of Warren Quinn’s, someone who turns on a radio because of a brute disposition to do so, without seeing anything to be said for doing so, seems not to be acting for a reason. Articulations of this idea in the service of the guise of reasons, or the good, can be found in Anscombe 1957; Davidson 1963; Quinn 1993; Scanlon 1998; for recent developments and discussions, see Copp and Sobel 2002; Gert 2003: ch.9; Schapiro 2009; Setiya 2010; Schafer 2013; Sinhababu 2017: ch.7; Gregory 2021: ch.4.

4. The Relationship between Normative and Motivating Reasons

This section discusses some of the many interesting issues about how normative and motivating reasons relate to each other. One cluster of questions (section 4.1) centres on the guiding role of normative reasons. A second (section 4.2) focuses on what it is to act for normative reasons, and the significance of doing so.

4.1 Normative Reasons and Guidance

An attractive and popular idea is that normative reasons are supposed to guide us, in deliberation and in action. That is what normative reasons seem to be for. But how should we spell out this thought? One way is normative: a reason is a fact that we ought to be moved by, or that it is rational, or appropriate, or good reasoning, to be moved by. This might be called the “deliberative condition” on normative reasons. Another way is descriptive: normative reasons must be facts by which you can be moved: they must be potential motivating reasons. Call this the “ability condition” on normative reasons. Often these ideas are combined: normative reasons must be facts that you are able to be moved by through sound deliberation, or in so far as you are rational (Nagel 1970; Williams 1979, 1989; Korsgaard 1986; Smith 1994). Call this the “combined” condition.

We might ask which of these conditions, suitably refined, best captures the initial thought, or is most plausible on reflection. Rather than engage with this directly, this section will illustrate how the differences between them matter by looking at ways in which the three versions have been put to work. Since the deliberative condition has been discussed in section 2, this section will mostly focus on the ability and on the combined conditions.

The most famous appeal to the combined condition is found in Williams’ (1979, 1989) case for a broadly Humean view of normative reasons—at least on one common reading of that much contested argument (see entry on reasons for action: internal vs. external). As noted in section 2, Williams claims that we have reason to do only what we could be motivated to do via a sound deliberative route. Since Williams also finds it plausible that what we can be so motivated to do will vary with our desires (broadly construed), he concludes that our normative reasons will also vary accordingly. One problem with this argument is that whether sound deliberation exhibits this relativity depends on what exactly sound deliberation involves (Korsgaard 1986; Hooker 1987). Some Kantians hold that sound deliberation will lead anyone, whatever their motivations, to the same conclusions—in particular, to do what is morally right (Smith 1994; Korsgaard 1996; Markovits 2014). Williams (1989) concedes this point, while noting that the burden is on Kantians to make their case. In so far as one is unpersuaded by Kantian efforts, Williams’ argument may thus retain some force.

The ability condition is often appealed to in support of an epistemic constraints on normative reasons, or perspectivism about what we ought to do. The basic idea is that a normative reason must fall within an agent’s epistemic perspective (e.g., they must know it or be in a position to; see section 2), if they are to be able to be moved by it. This argument turns on a fairly strong interpretation of the ability condition. In one sense, I am able to be moved by a reason if I might be motivated by it, were I to become aware of it. In another sense, I am not able to be moved by a reason if I am not right now aware of it. Compare: in one sense, I am able to drive, as I sit here typing in my office; in another sense, I am not able to do so, since my car is several miles away. The first sense depends only on my having the ability to drive; the second on my also having the opportunity (what J.L. Austin (1956) called the “all-in sense of ‘can’”). The argument for perspectivism requires that we understand the ability condition in the more demanding sense. It is unclear whether this version of the condition is well-motivated (for discussion see Way & Whiting 2016; Lord 2018: ch. 8).

A version of the ability condition features in Dancy’s influential argument against psychologism about motivating reasons. As discussed in section 3.1, Dancy claims that since it must be possible to act for a good reason, motivating reasons must be of the same ontological category as normative reasons—they must be facts, or putative facts. This argument requires only a very weak version of the ability condition, since it involves no commitments about the conditions under which normative reasons might actually motivate us.

These examples illustrate some of the different ways in which the initial attractive idea—that normative reasons are supposed to guide us—can be elaborated, and how those differences might matter. Some philosophers, however, reject all forms of this idea. This is largely because of putative examples of “elusive” or “self-effacing” reasons: roughly, normative reasons that would not survive if you were to respond to them. The most familiar example is that of Nate, who loves successful surprise parties but hates unsuccessful surprise parties (Schroeder 2007: 33; 165–66). If there is a surprise party waiting for Nate at home, then that seems a reason for Nate to go home. After all, an informed friend might advise Nate to go home by saying, “although I can’t tell you what it is, there’s a very good reason for you to do so!” But Nate cannot go home for the reason that there’s a surprise party there; this would require him to be aware that there’s a surprise party, which would spoil the surprise, and thus undermine the reason. That there’s a surprise party waiting for Nate thus seems to be a normative reason that is not a potential motivating reason. A fortiori, it is not a reason he could be motivated by through sound deliberation. (For other examples and references, see McKeever & Ridge 2012; Markovits 2014; Way & Whiting 2016; Rossi 2021).

There are other putative counterexamples to these conditions which are not based on self-effacing reasons. Julia Markovits (2011: 48) describes the case of Captain Sullenberger, who successfully, and without any loss of life, emergency-landed an Airbus 320 that had lost all thrust in its engines. Sullenberger said afterwards that he was not thinking of the potential loss of life and suggested that it would have been a distraction to do so. Of course, the threat to life was a normative reason for him to act as he did but, it might seem, not one it made sense for him to deliberate in terms of.

The most common response to these objections is to deny that such counterexamples are genuine. For example, even if the surprise party waiting for Nate is not a reason for him to go home, it might nonetheless make it good for him to go home, be a reason for others to encourage him to do so, a reason for him later to regret not doing so, etc. Moreover, related considerations, such as that Nate would enjoy going home, might be reasons for him to go home. For some, these observations suffice to capture our intuitions about the case (Kiesewetter 2016: 769–71; Paakkunainen 2017: 68–70). Others hold that the cases call for particular interpretations of the ability and combined conditions. For instance, perhaps Nate can be motivated by the surprise party in so far as he can go home on account of his discreet but better-informed friend’s advice (McKeever & Ridge 2012; Sinclair 2016; for alternative interpretations see Smith 1994; Way & Whiting 2016; for discussion see Rossi 2021).

Debate over these questions goes on. And while it can be tempting to dismiss such examples as artificial or peripheral, they may have significant implications. For example, some take them to underscore the need to sharply distinguish the deontic and deliberative roles, concluding that there is no unified concept of a normative reason that can play both roles (Wedgwood 2015).

4.2 Acting for a Normative Reason

Regardless of whether all normative reasons must be potential motivating reasons, we do sometimes act for normative reasons. What is involved in this? What does it take to act for a normative reason?

The answer might seem straightforward. Dancy writes,

[i]n the best case, there is some good reason for doing the action, and the reason that motivates the agent coincides with that reason. (2000: 3)

This suggests that when the fact that p is a normative reason for you to act in a certain way, you act for that reason when you act in that way and your motivating reason for doing so is the fact that p. However, even if we allow ourselves the notion of an action motivated by the fact that p—see section 3.2—there are further complications.

Consider: the house is on fire and a child is trapped inside. This is a normative reason to run inside and help the child escape: the child’s life matters and you can save it. Suppose that you do run inside and that your motivating reason is that you can help the child escape the fire. But suppose you are so motivated not because you are concerned for the child, but because you expect praise and reward for your action. Do you then act for the reason that the child is trapped inside the house? In a sense you do, since you run in to help the child escape. But, in an important sense, you don’t, because you do not respond to this fact as the moral reason it is—one connected to the value of the child’s life. (This example is due to Markovits 2010: 227; for other examples, see Lord 2017; Way 2017; Singh 2020; Howard 2021).

What is missing? In this example, the problem seems to be that you don’t act from the right kind of concern: you don’t desire to save the child for their own sake. Perhaps, then, acting for a normative reason, in this special sense, requires acting from the right kind of desire. This idea is developed in different ways by Markovits (2010: 227ff), Howard (2021), and especially by Arpaly and Schroeder (2014). Alternatively, perhaps acting for a normative reason requires acting from a certain kind of normative knowledge—e.g., knowledge that your motivating reason is a normative reason, or knowing how to treat a normative reason appropriately. Versions of this view are developed by Lord (2017; 2018: ch.5), Isserow (2019), and Singh (2020). Further views have also been developed (Mantel 2014: ch.3; Way 2017; Fogal & Worsnip 2021; Whiting 2021: ch.5).

One reason this issue matters is because of its bearing on questions about responsibility. Whether we act for normative reasons often seems to matter for whether we merit credit or praise for doing what we ought to do. The example above illustrates this. The person who runs into the house, since the child is inside, but from the desire for a reward does the right thing but not in a way that is a credit to them, or for which they deserve praise. Kant famously put this by saying that in such a case the action lacks “moral worth”—though the issues are not specific to morality.

How exactly do the reasons for which we act bear on moral worth? On the right reasons view, moral worth depends on acting for the right reasons, that is, the normative reasons that make so acting morally right. On this view, if the person had responded to the child’s need as the moral reason that it is, their action would have had moral worth. This view, which in some ways develops Aristotelian themes, though not necessarily in terms of virtue, is influentially defended by Nomy Arpaly and Julia Markovits (Arpaly 2002; Markovits 2010; Arpaly & Schroeder 2014). The view has many attractions but as this case illustrates, it turns crucially on the notion of acting for a normative reason and thus requires a satisfactory account of what this amounts to. This shows how longstanding questions about responsibility are bound up with unresolved questions about the relationship between normative and motivating reasons.

The above is an overview of a range of problems about practical reasons and their widespread significance. It should be sufficient to show how the problems and their many ramifications reach into many aspects of our lives and have important consequences for our understanding of ourselves as rational agents.

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Acknowledgments

Thanks are due to Connie Rosati and to Sigrún Svavarsdóttir for their very helpful suggestions for improvement on earlier versions of this entry.