1. The test functions could also be defined on a (paracompact) smooth manifold instead of \(\mathbb{R}^{n}\) or on a complex vector space with \(n\) dimensions \(\mathbb{C}^{n}\). For simplicity, we are only going to consider nonempty fixed open subsets \(\Omega \subset \mathbb{R}\), so our test functions will have only one variable. A multi index is used to handle multivariable functions, e.g., \(f(x,y)\).

2. Another advantage is that integrating a function over a set that contains a compact set means that boundary terms will vanish. This is useful because it allows for ordinary functions to be distributions under certain conditions and integrals are well-defined.

3. Distributions can also be defined using sequences and improper derivatives.

4. More precisely, a linear functional is a linear map from a vector space to its field of scalars, which is typically the real numbers or the complex numbers. For our purposes, we will assume the linear map is from the space of test functions to the real numbers.

5. There are some special cases where the multiplication of distributions is well-defined. For example, if two test functions have disjoint singular support, distribution multiplication is well-defined. There are also cases where the regularization of distributions results in a well-defined multiplication of distributions.

6. Franssens (2013, p. 73) presentation of Schwartz’ theorem allows for \(\mathcal{A} \subset D'(\Omega)\).

7. Intuitively, this should make sense. If \(x = 0\), then multiplying by \(0\) should equal 0. If \(x \neq 0\), then \(\delta(x) = 0\) so you are again multiplying by \(0\).

8. The existence of \(D\) which is linear and satisfies the Leibniz rule means \(\mathcal{A}\) is a differential algebra.

9. For example, the construction of a non-associative and non-commutative algebra of generalized functions that contain the distributions as well as measurable functions has been accomplished (see König (1953, 1955)).

10. The construction of the simplified Colombeau algebra depends on the use of a mollifier which is part of the regularization to create the “moderate” functions. That dependence can be handled by embedding the distributions into the full Colombeau algebra by using the set of all admissible mollifiers (see section 1.4 of Grosser et Al. ).