Supplement to Experiment in Physics
Appendix 5: Right Experiment, Wrong Theory: The Stern-Gerlach Experiment
From the time of Ampere onward, molecular currents were regarded as
giving rise to magnetic moments. In the nuclear model of the atom the
electron orbits the nucleus. This circular current results in a
magnetic moment. The atom behaves as if it were a tiny magnet. In the
Stern-Gerlach experiment a beam of silver atoms passed through an
inhomogeneous magnetic field (Figure 12).
In Larmor’s classical theory there was no preferential direction for
the direction of the magnetic moment and so one predicted that the beam
of silver atoms would show a maximum in the center of the beam. In
Sommerfeld’s quantum theory an atom in a state with angular momentum
equal to one
Figure 12.
Sketch of the Stern-Gerlach experimental apparatus. The
result expected for atoms in an
Sommerfeld’s theory also acted as an enabling theory for the experiment. It provided an estimate of the size of the magnetic moment of the atoms so that Stern could begin calculations to see if the experiment was feasible. Stern calculated, for example, that a magnetic field gradient of 104 Gauss per centimeter would be sufficient to produce deflections that would give detectable separations of the beam components. He asked Gerlach if he could produce such a gradient. Gerlach responded affirmatively, and said he could do even better. The experiment seemed feasible. A sketch of the apparatus is shown in Figure 12. The silver atoms pass through the inhomogeneous magnetic field. If the beam is spatially quantized, as Sommerfeld predicted, two spots should be observed on the screen. (The sketch shows the beam splitting into three components, which would be expected in modern quantum theory for an atom with angular momentum equal to one). I note that Sommerfeld’s theory was incorrect, illustrating the point that an enabling theory need not be correct to be useful.
Figure 13. The experimental result of the Stern-Gerlach experiment. The beam has split into two components. From Gerlach and Stern (1922a).
A preliminary result reported by Stern and Gerlach did not show
splitting of the beam into components. It did, however, show a
broadened beam spot. They concluded that although they had not
demonstrated spatial quantization, they had provided “evidence that the
silver atom possesses a magnetic moment.” Stern and Gerlach made
improvements in the apparatus, particularly in replacing a round beam
slit by a rectangular one that gave a much higher intensity. The
results are shown in Figure 13 (Gerlach and Stern 1922a).
There is an intensity minimum in the center of the
pattern, and the separation of the beam into two components is clearly
seen. This result seemed to confirm Sommerfeld’s quantum-theoretical
prediction of spatial quantization. Pauli, a notoriously skeptical
physicist, remarked, “Hopefully now even the incredulous Stern will be
convinced about directional quantization” (in a letter from Pauli to
Gerlach 17 February 1922). Pauli’s view was shared by the physics
community. Nevertheless the Stern-Gerlach result posed a problem for
the Bohr-Sommerfeld theory of the atom. Stern and Gerlach had assumed
that the silver atoms were in an angular momentum state with angular
momentum equal to one
The Stern-Gerlach experiment was initially regarded as a crucial
test between the classical theory of the atom and the Bohr-Sommerfeld
theory. In a sense it was, because it showed clearly that spatial
quantization existed, a phenomenon that could be accommodated only
within a quantum mechanical theory. It decided between the two classes
of theories, the classical and the quantum mechanical. With respect to
the particular quantum theory of Bohr and Sommerfeld, however, it
wasn’t crucial, although it was regarded as such at the time, because
that theory predicted no splitting for a beam of silver atoms in the
ground state
Although the interpretation of the experimental result was incorrect for a time, the result itself remained quite robust through the theory change from the old to the new quantum theory. It is important to remember that experimental results do not change when accepted theory changes, although certainly, as we have seen, their interpretation may change. Gerlach and Stern emphasized this point themselves.
Apart from any theory, it can be stated, as a pure result of the experiment, and as far as the exactitude of our experiments allows us to say so, that silver atoms in a magnetic field have only two discrete values of the component of the magnetic moment in the direction of the field strength; both have the same absolute value with each half of the atoms having a positive and a negative sign respectively (Gerlach and Stern 1924, pp. 690–691, FW)
Experimental results, as well as experiments, also have a life of their own, independent of theory.