1. For defenses of conservatism, see Sanford (1993), Hirsch (1993, 2002a, 2005), Markosian (1998a, 2008, 2014), Elder (2004, 2011), Simons (2006), Lowe (2007), Koslicki (2008), Gilmore (2010), Korman (2010, 2015b, 2020), Kriegel (2011), Carmichael (2015), Beebee (2017), McKenzie and Muller (2017), Pearce (2017), Remhof (2017: ch.8), Bowers (2019), Petersen (2019), Waetcher and Ladyman (2019: §1), Bird (2023), and Emery (2023: §6, forthcoming: §5.4). See deRosset (2020) on how (not) to formulate conservatism.

2. See van Inwagen (1990: 17) and Markosian (2000) for more on the relevant use of ‘object’. See Simons (1987: 11) on the reflexive use of ‘part’. See van Inwagen (1990: 29) for a more demanding use of ‘compose’, which prohibits things that share parts (e.g., my hand and fingers) from together composing something.

3. Hossack (2000), Dorr (2005), Grupp (2006), Contessa (2014), Brenner (2015a, 2015b, 2017, 2018a, 2018b, 2021, 2024), Thunder (2017),  Benovsky (2018), Caves (2018), and Kantin (2020) defend the microphysicalist version of nihilism. Horgan (1991: §2, 1993: §2), Horgan and Potrč (2000, 2008: Ch. 7, 2012), Rea (2001), Cornell (2016), and Builes (2021: §4) defend existence monism; see Sider (2007a), Goff (2012), Lowe (2012, 2013b), and Schaffer (2012) for criticism. Sidelle (1998: §§4–6), Turner (2011), and Le Bihan (2013, 2015, 2016) explore the extreme nihilist view that there are no objects; cf. Cowling (2014). See Siderits (2003: Ch. 4, 2007: 50–56), Jones (2021, 2023), and Zilioli (2024) for discussion of nihilism in the ancient Greek and Buddhist traditions. See Toner (2006), Williams (2006b: §5), Liggins (2008), Saucedo (2011: §6), Contessa (2014), Goldwater (2015), and Long (2019) on attempts to reconcile nihilism with the existence of ordinary objects; cf. Thunder (2023, 2024b). See van Inwagen (1990: 109), Merricks (2001: §1.1), Lowe (2005a: 527–531), Elder (2007: §1, 2011: §6.1), Williamson (2007: 219), Bennett (2009), Korman (2011), Tallant (2014), Brenner (2015a), Goswick (2018b: 147–148), Kantin (2020: §3), and Jones (2021: §2) for discussion of the ‘arranged K-wise’ locution.

4. See van Inwagen (1990: Ch. 9) on organicism. Other eliminativists who make an exception for (at least some) organisms, but who do not necessarily endorse organicism, include Hoffman and Rosenkrantz (1997), Merricks (2001: §4.6, 2017), Olson (2007: §§9.4–9.5), Koons and Pickavance (2017: §22.7), and McQueen and Tsuchiya (2023: §6). See Dowland (2016) for a related view which eliminates organisms but makes an exception for brains. See also Lowe (2011: §§8–9) and Evnine (2016a: Ch. 6) who affirm the existence of organisms and artifacts, but eliminate non-organic natural objects (like mountains).

5. The special composition question is due to van Inwagen (1990: Ch. 2); see Hestevold (1981) for a precursor, and see Markosian (1998a, 2008), Potrč (2002), Simons (2006: §§3–4), Kriegel (2008), Vander Laan (2010), Newman (2013), Silva (2013), Carmichael (2015), Beebee (2017), McKenzie and Muller (2017), Yang and Davies (2017: §11.2), Bowers (2019), Petersen (2019), Waetcher and Ladyman (2019: §3), Spencer (2021, 2023), te Vrugt (2021: §§2.1–2.5), Brenner (2022), Calosi (2022), Bird (2023), and McQueen and Tsuchiya (2023) for further discussion. See van Inwagen (1990: 138–140), Zimmerman (1999: 121–122), Merricks (2001: Chs. 4–5), Rea (2001: §2.2), Eklund (2002: §§4–5), Carroll and Carter (2005), and Wilson (2021: 211) on concerns about the stability of eliminativist views that make an exception for organisms.

6. For more on non-nihilistic eliminativism, see Unger (1979a, 1979c, 1980), Heller (1990: §§2.4–2.5), Hoffman and Rosenkrantz (1997: Ch. 5), and Van Cleve (2008: §2).

7. The example of trout-turkeys is due to Lewis (1991: 7–8). Proponents of universalism include Leśniewski (1916/1922), Leonard and Goodman (1940), Goodman and Quine (1947), Cartwright (1975), Quine (1981a: 10), Thomson (1983: 216–217), Lewis (1986: 212–213, 1991: §1.3), Van Cleve (1986, 2008), Heller (1990: §2.9), Jubien (1993), Armstrong (1997: 13), Sider (1997: §3.1, 2001a: §4.9), Rea (1998), Fine (1999: 73), Hudson (2000, 2001: §3.8, 2006: 636), Morreau (2002: 337), Varzi (2003), Bigelow and Pargetter (2006), Braddon-Mitchell and Miller (2006), Baker (2007: 191–193), Schaffer (2009b: 358), Sattig (2010a: §2.1.1), Varzi (2011: 145), Parsons (2013: 328), Noonan (2014: 1057), Sattig (2015: 13–14), Thomasson (2015: 221), Bricker (2016), Cotnoir (2016a, 2016b), Lando (2017: Part 3), Russell (2017: §§1–2), Byrne and Manzotti (2022: §4), Fairchild (2022a: 623), and Van Cleve (2023: 635). Critics include Comesaña (2008), Elder (2008, 2011: Ch. 7), Effingham (2011b, 2011c), Caulton (2015: §4), Bailey (2016) Evnine (2016a: §6.2.1), Saenz (2018), Inman and Pruss (2019), Builes and Wilson (2022: 2231), and Spencer (2023: 59–61); others will be cited below in connection with specific arguments.

8. The example of klables is due to Shoemaker (1979, 1988: 201). See Sider (1997: §3.3, 2001a: §4.9.3) and Campdelacreu (2010b) in defense of diachronic universalism; see Markosian (2004: §2), Balashov (2005, 2007) and Miller (2005: 321–322) for criticism. While many four-dimensionalists accept diachronic universalism, it is not entailed by four-dimensionalism (see Heller 1993), nor is it clear that it entails four-dimensionalism (see Lowe 2005b, Miller 2005, Heller 2008: 91–93, Kurtsal 2010, and Magidor 2015 and 2016: §3.1).

9. The example of incars is due to Hirsch (1976: §2, 1982: 32). Advocates of plenitudinism (or something in the vicinity) include Fine (1982: 100, 1999: 73), Sosa (1987: 178–179, 1999: 142–143), Yablo (1987: 307), Hawley (2001: 6–7), Bennett (2004: §4), Paul (2004: §IV), Hawthorne (2006: vii–viii), Johnston (2006: §17), Thomasson (2007: §10.3, 2015: §6.1), Eklund (2008: §4), Leslie (2011), Cameron (2014: 103–104), Inman (2014), Sattig (2015: 25), Cotnoir (2016b), Dasgupta (2016: §5), Barker and Jago (2018: 2984), Fairchild and Hawthorne (2018), Kriegel (2021), Kurtsal (2021), Dorr et al. (2022: ch. 11), Fairchild (2022a: 623), and Jago (forthcoming: §5). See Fairchild (2019), Dorr et al. (2022: §11.2), Kriegel (2022), Robertson Ishii and Salmón (2020), and Robertson Ishii (2022: 137–138) on how to (and not to) formulate plenitudinism. See Eklund (2006: 111–115), Olson (2007: 67–68) Elder (2011: §1.4), Evnine (2016b: §5.4), Fairchild (2017, 2022b), Spencer (2020), Builes (2022), Teitel (2022), and Linnebo (2024: §3) for criticism of various forms of plenitudinism; other critics will be cited below in connection with specific arguments.

10. Proponents of DAUP include Carter (1983), Zimmerman (1996: §4), and Hudson (2001: 88). For criticism, see van Inwagen (1981), Markosian (1998: 242–243), McDaniel (2007: 138–141), Carmichael (2020), Bird (2023: 685–686), and Mooney (forthcoming: §2).

11. Sorites arguments for eliminativism have been advanced by Unger (1979a, 1979b, 1979c), Wheeler (1979: §3), and Horgan and Potrč (2008: §2.4).

12. See Heller (1990: §2.8), Merricks (2001: §2.2), Horgan and Potrč (2008: §2.4), and Benovsky (2018: 10–14).

13. See Sanford (1979: §1), Tye (1990: §3), Elder (2000: §1), Sider (2001a: 188), and Thomasson (2007: §5.3).

14. See Unger (1979a: §3, 1979b: 128–130), Heller (1990: §§2.8–2.10), Williamson (1994: §4.6), and Horgan and Potrč (2008: 25–26). See Williamson (1994: Ch. 6) on the broader repercussions of embracing sorites reasoning.

15. The argument from vagueness is advanced by Lewis (1986: 212–213), Sider (1997: §3.1, 2001a: §4.9.1), Varzi (2005), Van Cleve (2008: §3), Lando (2017: ch. 13), and Castillo-Gamboa (forthcoming) in defense of universalism. See Heller (2000) for a related argument. See Noonan (2010) on the relation between Lewis’s and Sider’s formulations of the argument. Sider (1997: §3.3, 2001a: §4.9.3, 2008a: §4) shows how a structurally similar argument can be given for diachronic universalism; see Koslicki (2003: §3) and Balashov (2005: §3) for criticism. See Wallace (2014), Graham (2015), and Korman (2015b: 18–19) for modalized versions of the argument. 

16. See Markosian (1998a: 237–239, 2004: 668–669), Sider (2001a: 123–124 and 130–132), Merricks (2005, 2007), Hawthorne (2006: 107–109), Nolan (2006: 725–728), Simons (2006: 603–604), Smith (2006), Barnes (2007), Cameron (2007: 114–117), Tahko (2009), Kurtsal (2014, 2019), Korman (2015b: Ch. 9.3), McKenzie and Muller (2017: 236), Remhof (2017: §8.1), Inman (2018: §6.1), Brenner (2022: 101–102) for discussion of AV3. See Horgan (1993: §1), Markosian (1998a: §3), Hudson (2001: 22–25), Sider (2001a: 123–124 and 130–132), Gabriel (2017), and Spencer (2023: 61) on brute compositional facts.

17. Merricks (2005: §5) and Hawthorne (2006: 106–109) defend this sort of strategy. See Papineau (1993: §4.8), Tye (1996b), Antony (2006, 2008), Simon (2017b), Tye (2021), Hall (2022), and McQueen and Tsuchiya (2023: §7) on the possibility of borderline cases of consciousness.

18. See Howard-Snyder (1997: §4) and Sider (1997: 21–22, 2001a: 125–127).

19. Carmichael (2011) defends this line of response. For other attempts to secure vague composition without vague existence, see Smith (2005), Hawthorne (2006: 106), Baker (2007: 130–132), Donnelly (2009: §5), Effingham (2009), Elder (2011: §7.1), Wake (2011: §3), Woodward (2011: §3), Williamson (2013: 7 n.9), Nolan (2014: §5), Korman (2015b: Ch. 9.4), Korman and Carmichael (2016: §4.4), Magidor (2016: §3.2.2), Pearce (2017: §3), and Wu (2023: §5); cf. Gallois (2004: 652). See Kovacs (forthcoming a) for criticism.

20. For discussion of vague quantifiers and vague existence, see van Inwagen (1990: Ch. 19), Lewis (1991: 80–1), Hirsch (1999: 149–151, 2000: 42–43, 2002b: 65–66, 2004a: 663, 2008b: 376), Hossack (2000: 428), Sider (2001a: 128–130, 2003a, 2009a), Hawley (2002, 2004), Koslicki (2003, 2008: 34–40), Barnes (2005, 2013), Dorr (2005: 248 n.25), López de Sa (2006), Liebesman and Eklund (2007), Campdelacreu (2010a), Båve (2011), Woodward (2011: §5), Korman (2014b, 2015b: §9.5), Torza (2017), Loss (2018a), Goldwater (2020: §6.1), Rabin (2023: §5), Sud (2023), and Castillo-Gamboa (forthcoming).

21. The example of Piece and Athena is due to Paul (2006: 625). See Rea (1995) for discussion of the different varieties of constitution puzzles. See Fine (2003, 2006), Bennett (2004: 340–341), Frances (2006), King (2006), Paul (2010: 583), and Almotahari (2014, 2017, 2020) on versions of the puzzle that turn on putative nonmodal differences. See Wallace (2011a: 804–805) and Cameron (2014: 98–99) on the colocation of objects and their parts.

22. Heller (1990: §§2.4–2.7), van Inwagen (1990: 125–127), Hoffman and Rosenkrantz (1997: §5.2), Merricks (2001: §2.3), Olson (2007: §9.4), and Benovsky (2018: 20–22) advance the problem of material constitution as an argument for eliminativism; cf. Renz (2016). Rettler (2018) argues that embracing mereological nihilism is not sufficient to block the argument.

23. Proponents of constitutional pluralism include: Quine (1953: §1), Wiggins (1968, 2001), Perry (1970: §5), Kripke (1971: n.19), Chisholm (1973: 590–591 and 601–602), Doepke (1982, 1986b), Fine (1982, 1999, 2003, 2008), Hirsch (1982: 57–64, 2002a: §3, 2005: §5), Lowe (1983a, 1983b, 1989: Ch. 5, 2002, 2003b, 2009: Ch. 6, 2013a), Thomson (1983: §6, 1998), Simons (1987: Ch. 6), Yablo (1987), Heller (1984: 332–333), Johnston (1992, 2006: §8), Lewis (1993: 167–168), Tye (1996a: 222), Baker (1997, 2000, 2007), Hudson (2001: 57–61), McDaniel (2001: §3, 2004: §4), Paul (2002: §5, 2004: §IV, 2006), Moyer (2006), Thomasson (2006: §4, 2007: Ch. 4), Koslicki (2008, 2018a: Ch.4, 2018b), Mackie (2008), Cotnoir (2010), Crane (2012), Shoemaker (2012), Korman (2015b: Ch. 11), Evnine (2016a: §1.1.1), Lando (2017: Ch. 7), Needham (2017: Ch. 4), Longnecker (2018), Goldwater (2021), Guillon (2021), Ruben (2021), and Dorr et al. (2022: 100). The labels ‘pluralism’ and ‘monism’ are from Fine (2003).

24. The grounding problem is advanced by Heller (1990: §2.1, 2008: 94–97), Burke (1992), Sidelle (1992a: 288, 2014, 2016), Zimmerman (1995: §9), Olson (1996: §3, 2001, 2007: 161–162), Hawley (2001: 146–148), Merricks (2001: 39–40), Shagrir (2002), Noonan (2015), van Elswyk (2018: §5), Madden (2019), Campdelacreu (2016, 2021), and Zerbudis (2020b: 108–111, 2023). For responses to the problem, see Sosa (1987: 173–178), Baker (1997: §2, 2000: 185–189), Rea (1997b: §4), Corcoran (1999: 16–17), Lowe (2002), Wasserman (2002), Bennett (2004: §4), Hawley (2006: §4), Hawthorne (2006: 101–103), Johnston (2006: §9), Moyer (2006: §6.2), Paul (2004: 175–176, 2006: §5), Thomasson (2007: §4.4), Fine (2008), Koslicki (2008: 179–183, 2018a: Ch. 4, 2018b), Mackie (2008: 167–168), Sider (2008b), deRosset (2011), Einheuser (2011), Crane (2012: §5), Sutton (2012), Wilson (2013: 379), Sattig (2014: §IV), Korman (2015b: §11.3), Saenz (2015), Sattig (2015: §5.2), Evnine (2016a: §3.2.3), Jago (2016, forthcoming: §5), Korman and Carmichael (2016: §5.2), Barker and Jago (2018), Goldwater (2018: §4), Inman (2018: 177–178), Kurstal (2019: 217–218), Piras (2019: 75–76), Campdelacreu (2020), Kriegel (2021: 100–101), and Zerbudis (2020a). See Bennett (2004) for an argument that the grounding problem is best solved by embracing plenitudinism, and see her (2009: 70–71) for a grounding problem for monists.

25. The example is due to Spolaore (2012). For further discussion of same-kind coincidence, see Shorter (1977), Simons (1985), Doepke (1986a), Oderberg (1996), Hughes (1997), Fine (2000, 2008: 106), Hershenov (2003), Johnston (2006: §§9–10), Korman (2015b: §11.1.2), Evnine (2016a: §3.4.3), Ruben (2021: 258–261), Dorr et al. (2022: ch. 4), and Mooney (forthcoming: 10–12).

26. Phasalists include Ayers (1974: 128–129), Price (1977), Tichý (1987/2004: §3), Jubien (1993: 37–40, 2001: 7), Schwartz (2009: 621–622), Markosian (2010: 143–144), Biro (2018: 1134–1137, 2020), and Mooney (2023a, 2023b, 2024); see Olson (1996: §4, 2007: Ch. 3.2), Sidelle (1998: §2), and Korman (2015b: §11.1.1) for criticism.

27. Burke (1994a, 1994b, 1996, 1997, 2004) and Rea (2000) defend the doctrine of dominant kinds; cf. Moran (2018). See Denkel (1995), Lowe (1995), Noonan (1999b), Sider (2001a: 163–165, 2008a: §3.3), Stone (2002), Olson (2007: 161), and Korman (2015b: §11.1.2) for criticism.

28. See Lewis (1971, 1986: §4.5), Gibbard (1975: §5), Noonan (1988, 1991, 1993: §1), Sider (1996, 2001: ch. 5), Hawley (2001), Mackie (2007, 2008: §4), Fara (2008, 2012: §2), Cray (2014), Almotahari (2020: §4–5), and Noonan (2021) for the first version (or something in the vicinity); see Sidelle (2010: 121–122), Barker and Jago (2014), Korman (2015b: §11.1.3), and Mackie (2021) for criticism. See Heil (2003: 186–187) and Dyke (2008: 144–149) on the second version. See Sattig (2010a, 2015: Ch. 3) for an attempt to resolve the puzzle without denying any of MC1–MC4; see Korman (2015c) for criticism. See the entry on material constitution for a more detailed discussion of these issues.

29. This version of the puzzle of the Ship of Theseus—in which a second ship is constructed from the discarded planks—is due to Hobbes (1655: II.11.7). The reasoning here is due to Evans (1978) and Salmon (1981: 243–246). Those who do not find themselves gripped by this particular example may replace it with an example of an amoeba dividing in two (see Robinson 1985).

30. Van Inwagen (1990: 128–135), Hoffman and Rosenkrantz (1997: §5.4), and Hossack (2000: 428) put the reasoning to work in defense of eliminativism.

31. See Lewis (1988) and Stalnaker (1988: 349–350).

32. See Lewis (1976: §3), Robinson (1985), Simons (1987: §5.5), Shoemaker (1988: 208–209), Stalnaker (1988), Moyer (2008: §3), and Spencer (2020: 78–79).

33. See Lowe (1994: 113) and Hirsch (1999) on ST2; van Inwagen (1990: 251–252), Lowe (2011: 20–32), and Goldwater (2020: §5.1) on ST3; Parsons (1987: 8–11) and Thomasson (2007: §5.6) on ST4; Burke (1980: 405) on (ii); Schwarz (2014) on (iii); and Sider (1996: §2, 2001a: ch 5.8) and Hawley (2001: Ch. 4) on (iv).

34. For arguments from arbitrariness for permissivism, see Cartwright (1975: 167), Quine (1981a: 13), Ginet (1985: 220–221), Van Cleve (1986: 145, 2008: §2), Yablo (1987: 307), Heller (1993: 59), Rea (1998: 354–355), Sosa (1999), Hudson (2001: 108–112), Johnston (2006: 696–698), Moyer (2006: 408), Schaffer (2009: 358 n.11), Parsons (2013: 333), Noonan (2014), Beebee (2017: §4), Fairchild and Hawthorne (2018: §§4–5), Spencer (2020: §§3–4), Noonan (2024), and Jago (forthcoming: §5); cf. Sider (2001a: 165, 2008a: 260), Sidelle (1992b: 417–418, 2002: 119–120), deRosset (2020: §§3–4), Fairchild (2022a), and Yang (2023).

35. See van Inwagen (1981: §3, 1990: 126), Olson (1995: §1), Hoffman and Rosenkrantz (1997: 177–178), Rea (2001: §2.2), Siderits (2007: 54–55), Van Cleve (2008: §2), and Benovsky (2018: 15) for eliminativist responses to arbitrariness arguments.

36. See Goodman (1978), Putnam (1981: 52–54), Sidelle (1992a: §7), Smith (2001: 142), Einheuser (2006, 2011), Kriegel (2008), Varzi (2011), Remhof (2017: §8.2), Goswick (2018a, 2023), and Bucchioni (2022: §5.3) for defense of anti-realism. See Shoemaker (1988), Hoffman and Rosenkrantz (1997: 178–179), Lowe (2007), Korman (2010: §5, 2015b: Ch. 8, 2020: §2), Effingham (2011b: §6), Carmichael (2020: §2), and Mooney (forthcoming: §2) for realist responses to arbitrariness arguments.

37. See Putnam (1987, 1994), Hawthorne and Cortens (1995: 158–160), and Hirsch (2000: 44, 2002b, 2004b: 135–136,  2011: xi–xvi) for deflationary responses.

38. See Joyce (2006: Ch. 6), Street (2006), and Vavova (2015) on structurally similar, moral debunking arguments. See Korman and Carmichael (2017), Rose and Schaffer (2017), Rose (2019: §§2.2–2.3, 2021: §4), Kovacs (2021b), and Kertész and Kodaj (2023) on a debunking argument from experimental philosophy.

39.Van Inwagen (1981: §3), Heller (1990: 41–42), Merricks (2001: 72–76, 2017), Sider (2013: §2), and Benovsky (2015: §2, 2018: ch. 2) all advance debunking arguments (or something in the vicinity) in support of eliminativism; cf. Jubien (1993: §1.1). See Bagwell (2021) for criticism.

40. Yablo (1987: 307), Shoemaker (1988: 209), Hawley (2001: 6–7), Hudson (2001: §3.8, 2006: 636), Sider (2001a: 156–157), Witmer (2003: 606), Nolan (2005: 35), Hawthorne (2006: vi and 109), Moyer (2006: 408), Varzi (2011: 143–145), Sattig (2015: 25–26), Barker and Jago (2018: 2984), Kurtsal (2021), and Jago (forthcoming: §6) advance debunking arguments (or something in the vicinity) in support of permissivism. See Korman (2014a: §3, 2015b: §7.3) and Fairchild and Hawthorne (2018: §§2–3) for criticism.

41. See Hirsch (2004b: §1) and Belleri (2021: §§4–5) on deflationary treatments; see Korman (2014a: §4.1) for criticism.

42. For further discussion of realist responses, see Rea (2002: Ch. 9), Korman (2014a: §7, 2015b: ch. 7, 2019a, 2020: §3), Osborne (2016), Hofweber (2017: §3, 2019), Sattig (2017), Barker (2020), Tillman and Spencer (2020), Kovacs (2021a), and Gładziejewski (2023). See Remhof (2017: §8.3) for an anti-realist response.

43. The argument is advanced by Merricks (2001: Ch. 3, 2017) and Benovsky (2018: 22–23).

44. See Merricks (2001: 61–66, 2003: §1) in defense of OD1. See Baker (2003: 598), Lowe (2003a, 2005a: 526–531), Kim (2005: 56), Elder (2007: §3, 2011: §6.3), Parsons (2013: 332–333), Pearce (2017: §4), Inman (2018: §6.3), Silver (2020: §2), Wilson (2021: Ch. 6.2), and Biro (2022: §1) for attempts to resist OD1. See Merricks (2001: Ch. 4, 2003: §§1–2), Dorr (2003), and Carroll and Carter (2005) on whether persons and other conscious composites escape overdetermination arguments by virtue of having nonredundant causal powers.

45. See Merricks (2001: 57) on causal relevance. See Bernstein (2016: §1) on varying uses of ‘overdetermination’.

46. See Merricks (2001: 66–72), Olson (2002: §6), Sider (2003b: 722–723), Carroll and Carter (2005: §7), Thomasson (2006: §1, 2007: Ch. 1), Schaffer (2007: §8), Bennett (2009: 68), Yang (2013), Árnadóttir (2015), Korman (2015b: §10.2), Bernstein (2016: §§2–3), Beebee (2017), Baker and Jago (2018: 2985), Orensanz (2022: §§3–4), and Blanchard (2023) for relevant discussion.

47. See Merricks (2001: 72–79, 2003: §3, 2017), Sider (2003b: 723–725), Korman (2015b: §10.2–10.3), Hofweber (2016: 191–196), Beebee (2017), Barker (2020), and Orensanz (2022: §6) on epistemic defenses of OD7.

48. The principle is controversial because numbers and other abstracta, if they exist, are plausibly causally inert. See Merricks (2001: 80–81) in defense of OD4, and see Toner (2008b) for criticism. For general discussion of the Eleatic Principle, see Armstrong (1978: 139), Oddie (1982), Colyvan (1998), Cowling (2015), and the papers in Topoi (2003: v. 22.2).

49. The problem is due to Geach (1980: §110) and Unger (1980). See Chihara (1994), Hudson (2001: Ch. 1), Unger (2004, 2005: Ch. 7), Hawthorne (2006: Ch. 9), O’Connor (2007), Olson (2010), Johnston (2016), Kovacs (2016, 2022, forthcoming b), Simon (2017a), Eklund (2020), Kurtsal (2022), Roelofs (2022), Builes and Hare (2023), Javier-Castellanos (2023), and Cutter (forthcoming) for special problems that arise in connection with persons. Olson (2007: 224–225) puts the problem of the many to work in an argument against universalism.

50. See Lewis (1976: §2), Quine (1981b: 92–93), Hirsch (1982: 40–42), Hoffman and Rosenkrantz (1997: §5.3), Hawley (2001: 166), Sider (2001b: §1), Burke (2003), Kovacs (2010), Williams (2013: §§5–9), Sattig (2013: §2), Sutton (2014), Korman (2015b: §12.1), Inman (2018: 191–194), Francescotti (2019), and Williams (2021: §§5–6) on maximal properties.

51. See Quine (1981b: 93), Lewis (1993: 166–167), and Hawley (2001: 167) on this strategy for fortifying the problem. See van Inwagen (1990: 216–217) and Korman (2015b: §12.1) on how the puzzle arises even for those who deny that there is such an object as Woodrow-minus (e.g., because they deny DAUP).

52. See Lewis (1993: 171–175), Parsons and Woodruff (1994: §5), McGee and McLaughlin (2000), McKinnon (2002), Weatherson (2003: §§3–5), Williams (2006a), Cameron (2010c: 286–287), López de Sa (2014), Korman (2015b: §12.2), Sattig (2013:§1, 2015: §7.1), Liebesman (2016: §4.4), Liebesman (2021), and Woods (2021) for discussion of this strategy or others in the vicinity.

53. See Lowe (1982, 1995, 2011: §2.6), Johnston (1992: §4), Tye (1996a: §3), Morreau (2002: §2), Wilson (2013: 377–379), Donnelly (2014), Jones (2015), and Korman (2015b: §12.3) for the constitutional pluralist response (or nearby responses). See Noonan (1993), Williams (2013: 447–448), and Sattig (2015: §7.2) for criticism. For an objection to PM2 and PM2' involving relative identity, see Geach (1980: §110) and Sattig (2010b).

54. Chisholm (1973: 589–590, 1976: §3.4, 1986: 69–70), Kim (1976: §3), Lewis (1993: 177–180), Noonan (1993: 139), Unger (2004: 203), Williams (2006a), López de Sa (2014: §§7–11), Openshaw (2021), and Sandgren (2023) endorse the permissive response (or something in the vicinity); cf. Leslie (2011), Kment (2014: §7.3), and Fairchild (2019). See Donnelly (2014: §3.2), Dorr et al. (2022: §4.3), and Robertson Ishii (2022: 145–146) for criticism. Unger (1980), Heller (1990: 38), Horgan (1993: §2), Horgan and Potrč (2008: §2.4.4), and Benovsky (2018: 9–10) endorse the eliminative response; see Bennett (2009: 66–67) for criticism. See the entry on the problem of the many for a more detailed discussion of these issues.

55. See van Inwagen (1987: §3, 1990: 73), Markosian (1998a: §4), Hirsch (2002a), Koslicki (2007: §4.3.2), Elder (2008: 440), Kelly (2008), Sider (2008a: 254), Schaffer (2009b: 358), Kriegel (2011), Korman (2015b: Ch. 4), and Evnine (2016a: §6.2.1) for arguments from counterexamples (or something in the vicinity) against various revisionary ontologies. See Zerbudis (2018), Korman (2020: §1) and Wallace (2020) on whether the arguments are question-begging. See Kriegel (2013), Hofweber (2016, 2017: §3, 2019), Sattig (2017), Byrne (2019), Schwaninger (2022: §4), Emery (2023: §6, forthcoming: §5.4), LeBrun (2021: §§3.2–3.3), and Brenner (2024) on the related question of whether there is immediate perceptual evidence against eliminativism.

56. Proponents of this domain-restriction strategy include Lewis (1986: 213, 1991: §3.5), Sosa (1999: 142), Jubien (2001: 14 n.2), Sider (2001a: 218, 2004: 680), Rosen and Dorr (2002: §4), Varzi (2003: 213–214), Richard (2006: 173), Cameron (2007: 116, 2008c: 14), Keller (2015: §4.2.2), and Kurtsal (2019: 211–212).

57. See van Inwagen (1981: 127–128, 1990: Chs. 10–11, 2014: 1–14), Horgan (1991: §2), Olson (1995: 189–190), Merricks (2000: 49–50), Sider (2004: 680–681, 2009b: §11, 2011: §5.3 and §9.3, 2013: §3, 2014: 565), Dorr (2005: §7, 2008: §1), Thomasson (2007: §10.3), Cameron (2008a: 300–301, 2010a: 256, 2010b: 25), Horgan and Potrč (2008: Ch. 3), Chalmers (2009: §2), Cotnoir (2013b), Brenner (2015a), Keller (2015), Rettler (2016: §4), Koons and Pickavance (2017: 506–7), Almotahari (2020: §§4–5), Kitsik (2020), Mokriski (2021: §§1–2), Warren (2021: §4), van Inwagen (2023: §§1.1–1.3), and Thunder (2024a: §4) for further compatibilist strategies.

58. See Noonan (1992: 240–241, 2014: 1058–1061), Tye (1992), Mackie (1993), Rosenberg (1993), Hawthorne and Cortens (1995: 156–157), Hawthorne and Michael (1996: §2), Markosian (1998a: §4, 2008: §§3–4), Noonan (1999a: 280–284), Hirsch (2000: 42, 2002a: 109–112, 2002b: 64–65, 2004b: 136–137, 2008a: §5, 2008b: 370–371), Merricks (2001: §7.1), Varzi (2002: 65), Uzquiano (2004), Olson (2007: 200–201). Korman (2008b, 2009: §3, 2015b: Chs. 5–6, 2024b), Fine (2009: 161–165), Wallace (2013), Daly and Liggins (2016a), Wilkins (2016), Biro (2017), Rose and Schaffer (2017: §3.6), Waetcher and Ladyman (2019: §2.2), Cornell (2021), Da Vee (2021), Dorr et al. (2022: 116–117), Bird (2023: 697–698), Carrara and Morato (2023a: §2, 2023b: §§2–3), Pitkovski (2024:§§5–6), and Thunder (2024a: §3) for criticism of various compatibilist strategies. See McGrath (2005), Bennett (2009: §9), Nolan (2010), and Kantin (2020) on whether counterparts of the arguments for eliminativism cause trouble for the ordinary utterances that compatibilist eliminativists wish to affirm.

59. For a variety of incompatibilist strategies, see Unger (1979b: 150), Heller (1990: Ch. 4), van Inwagen (1993: 712), Merricks (2001: §§7.2–7.3), Rosen and Dorr (2002: §§4–5), Sider (2004: 680), Eklund (2005), Olson (2007: 222), Horgan and Potrč (2008: §6.2.2), Cornell (2016), Kovacs (2021a), Bird (2023: 680) and Carrara and Morato (2023a: §§3–5, 2023b: §4). See Korman (2009, 2024a) for discussion of the constraints on a satisfactory incompatibilist account.

60. The argument from charity is due to Hirsch (2002a, 2002b: §6, 2004a, 2005, 2008b). See Davidson (1974: 19, 1989/2008: 130–2), Grandy (1973: §1), Lewis (1974: 336–337), Gauker (1986), Hirsch (2005: §5), and Williamson (2007: Ch. 8) for general discussion of principles of charity.

61. See Hirsch (2002a: §§3–4, 2005: 88–89, 2008b: 372–373) for criticism of this line of response. See Hirsch (2008a) and McGrath (2008) for further discussion of conflicts of charity.

62. See Lewis (1974: 336), Hirsch (2002a: 105–106, 2005: 78, 2008b: 370), Korman (2008a, 2008b: 324–325, 2015b: §4.4), Daly and Liggins (2010: §6), and Horden (2014: §§3–4) for relevant discussion.

63. See Merrill (1980: 77–80), Lewis (1983: 370–377, 1984: 226–229), Sider (2001a: xxi–xxiv), and Williams (2007) on the role of naturalness—or “reference magnets”—in accounts of content determination. Sider (2004: 679–682, 2009b: §11) and Keller (2015: §4.2.3) advance an argument from naturalness against CH2; see Hirsch (2002a: §5, 2005: §6, 2008a: §5, 2008b: 377–378, 2009: 243–244) for criticism.

64. See Korman (2015b: §5.5.1, 2015c), Sattig (2015: 72–73 and 89–90), and Keller (2015: §4) on arguments from charity for compatibilism. See Dorr (2005) for an argument from charity for nihilism. For further discussion of arguments from charity, see Hawthorne (2009), Hirsch (2013), Jackson (2013), Daly and Liggins (2016b), Belleri (2018: §5), and Waetcher and Ladyman (2019: §2.1.1).

65. See Baxter (1988), Wallace (2011a, 2011b), Cotnoir (2013), Turner’s C (2013), and Bricker (2016) for defense of this “composition as identity” thesis (a.k.a. CAI); cf. Payton (2021, 2022).

66. See Lewis (1991: 87), van Inwagen (1994), Yi (1999, 2021), Merricks (2001: §1.4), McKay (2006: 36–42), Sider (2007b: §3.3), McDaniel (2008), Bailey (2011), Turner’s N (2013), Cameron (2014: §1), Korman (2015b: 16), Carrara and Lando (2017), Lando (2017: ch.15), and Biro (2022: §2) against the thesis that composition is identity. See Harte (2002: 114), Merricks (2005: 629–631), Cameron (2007: 104, 2010b: §3, 2012), Sider (2007b: 61–62), McDaniel (2010b), Calosi (2016: §4), Spencer (2017: §§3–4), Loss (2018b), Falls (2021), and Lechthaler (2021) on whether the thesis that composition is identity entails universalism. See the papers in Cotnoir and Baxter (2014) for further discussion of CAI.

67. See Sidelle (1989: 161–166), Devitt and Sterelny (1999: §4.5), and Thomasson (2007: Ch. 2, 2009, 2015: 95) on the qua problem.

68. The argument from application conditions is due to Thomasson (2007: §1.2 and §9.4). Thomasson herself defends the stronger claim that ET2 is analytic, on account of the fact that these application conditions enter into the content of ‘statue’ and the associated concept. See Bennett (2009: 56), Schaffer (2009a: §1), Thomasson (2013: §§3–4, 2015: Ch. 7), Yablo (2014: §11), deRosset (2015), Hofweber (2016: 189–190), Horden (2017), Balaguer (2018, 2021: ch. 4), Brenner (2018a), Goswick (2018b: 147–8), van Inwagen (2019), Button (2020: §3), Kovacs (2021a: 2135–2136), and Raab (2021) for further discussion of application conditions and analytic entailments.

69. See Thomasson (2007: 157–159, 2009, 2015: 108–111, 2019), Schaffer (2009a), Korman (2015b: §4.4, 2019b), and Evnine (2016a: §6.2.3, 2016b) for discussion of this line of response.

70. Both arguments are due to van Inwagen: see his (1981) for the argument against DAUP and his (1987: 35–40, 1990: 75–80) for the argument against universalism; cf. Olson (2007: 229–232), Koslicki (2008: 4) against universalism.

71. See Noonan (1992: 241–242), Rea (1998: §1, 1999), McGrath (1998), Eklund (2002: §7), Hudson (2001: 93–95), McDaniel (2001: §5), Merricks (2009: 302), and Korman (2015b: §9.6.2) for discussion of the argument against universalism.

72. For further discussion of puzzles involving undetached parts (including the Dion/Theon puzzle), see Chisholm (1976: ch. 3 and appendix B), Carter (1983), Burke (1994a), Parsons (2004), Carmichael (2020), Yang (2021), Baber (2024), and Mooney (forthcoming).

73. See Sider (1993, 2003b: 724–725), Hudson (2007), Van Cleve (2008: 325), Effingham (2011a), Markosian (2015: 672–673), Brzozowski (2016), and Thunder (2023: §2.3.3.2) for relevant discussion.

74. On denying the possibility of gunk, see Zimmerman (1996: 8), Markosian (1998b: §4), Lowe (2000: 20), Holden (2004: §2.3), Williams (2006b: 504–506), Sider (2013: §10), Strohminger (2013), Kitamura (2016: 157–9), Korman and Carmichael (2016: §6.1), Koons and Pickavance (2017: 494–497), Miller and Hariman (2017), and Kleinschmidt (2021: 1825–1826).

75. See Nolan (2005: 36), Rosen (2006), Willams (2006b: §5), Cameron (2007), Bohn (2009a, 2009b: §1), Miller (2009, 2010), Parsons (2013), Sider (2013: §10), Balaguer (2018, 2021: ch. 4), Benovsky (2018: ch.4), and Dershowitz (2022) on the contingency of composition. See, in particular, Bohn (2009b: 196) on applying Hume’s Dictum to overlapping objects. See Cameron (2008b) and Wilson (2010) for general discussion of Hume’s Dictum.

76. See Markosian (2005: §4), Bohn (2009a, 2009b), Schaffer (2010: 64–65), Watson (2010), Contessa (2012), Spencer (2012: §2), Cotnoir (2014), Giberman (2015a, 2015b, 2019a), Kitamura (2016: 160–165), Sanson (2016), Inman (2018: 203–207), Smith (2019), Calosi (2023), Vogt and Werner (2024), and Dohrn (forthcoming) for discussion of junk.

77. See Hawthorne and Cortens (1995), Markosian (2005: §3), Schaffer (2007: §8, 2010), Horgan and Potrč (2008), Cameron (2008c: §3, 2010a, 2010b, 2014: §3), Dasgupta (2009), McDaniel (2010a: 641–642), French (2010, 2014: Ch. 7), Sider (2013), Korman (2015a, 2015b: Ch. 6, 2024b), Skiles (2015: §3), Carmichael (2016), Rettler (2016, 2019), Azzouni (2017), Koons and Pickavance (2017:  Ch. 22), Ioannou (2023), and Van Cleve (2023: §§V–IX) for views on which ordinary objects exist but—in one sense or another—are not among the fundamental constituents of reality. For views on which ordinary objects—in one sense or another—are fundamental, see Toner (2008a), Inman (2018), Bernstein (2021), and Mokriski (2021). See the entry on metaphysical grounding for a more detailed discussion of fundamentality.

78. Though see Schaffer (2010: §2.4) for an argument from the possibility of gunk that the entire (composite) cosmos must be more fundamental than any of its concrete parts.

79. See McDaniel (2010a: 644, 2017: §5.4), Korman (2015a: §4, 2015b: §6.3), Thomasson (2015: ch. 10), and Korman and Carmichael (2017: §6.2) for relevant discussion.

80. See Cowling (2013: §8), Sider (2013: §1), Cameron (2010a: 262–263, 2014: 100–101), Brenner (2015b, 2021), Korman (2015a: §4, 2015b: §6.3.2), and Thunder (2017) on arguments from parsimony.