Some basic definitions concerning measureable spaces

This supplement contains only those few definitions from measure theory which are needed in the main entry. It is mainly intended as a reminder for those who have seen the subject. Others will want to consult books on measure theory or analysis.

Let M be any set. A σ-algebra of subsets of M is a collection of subsets of M which contains M itself as an element and is closed under complement and countable union. A measurable space is a pair M = (M, Σ), where M is a set and Σ is a σ-algebra of subsets of M. The sets in Σ are called measurable sets or events. A measure on M is a function μ : Σ → [0,∞] which has the property that if S₀, S₁, … S_n, … is a countable collection of pairwise disjoint sets, then μ( ∪_n S_n) = Σ_n μ(S_n). The measure μ is a probability measure if μ(M) = 1.

For any space M, let Δ(M) be the set of probability measures on M. For any measurable set E, we define

Bp (E) = {μ ∈ Δ(M) : μ(E) ≥ p}.

We want to specify a σ-algebra Σ^* on the set Δ(M). We take Σ^* to be the smallest σ-algebra containing all sets of the form Bp (E) for p∈ [0,1] and E∈ Σ. So (Δ(M), Σ^*) is a measurable space.

Given two measurable spaces A and B, the product space A×B is the cartesian product of the sets A and B, endowed with the σ-algebra generated by the sets of the form E×F, where E is measurable in A and F is measurable in B. For a subset E⊆ A×B, the sections of E are the sets: E_a={b:(a,b) ∈ E} and E^b={a:(a,b) ∈ E}. Each section of a measurable subset of the product is measurable.

If μ is a probability measure on A and ν a probability measure on B, we can define the probability measure μ × ν on A×B by

(μ × ν)(E)= ∫ μ(E^b) dν = ∫ ν(E_a) dμ.

(Of course, this definition refers to the notion of integration. We are not going to develop this topic here.)

Going in the other direction, a probability measure μ on A×B induces via the projections, a measure on each of the factor spaces. These measures are called marginals, and defined and denoted by

marA = μ ⋅ πA-1

marB = μ ⋅ πB-1