The Definition of Morality

First published Wed Apr 17, 2002; substantive revision Tue Jan 28, 2025

The topic of this entry is not—at least directly—moral theory; rather, it is the definition of morality. Moral theories are large and complex things; definitions are not. The question of the definition of morality is the question of identifying the target of moral theorizing. Identifying this target enables us to see different moral theories as attempting to capture the very same thing. A definition of morality also enables psychologists, anthropologists, evolutionary biologists, and other more empirically-oriented theorists to design their experiments or formulate their hypotheses without prejudicing matters too much in terms of the specific content a code, judgment, or norm must have in order to count as distinctively moral. As we’ll see, different fields of study may prioritize different criteria of adequacy in such definitions, given their goals.

There does not seem to be much reason to think that a single definition of morality will be applicable to all moral discussions, even within philosophy. One reason for this is that “morality” seems to be used in two distinct broad senses: a descriptive sense and a normative sense. More particularly, the term “morality” can be used either

  1. descriptively to refer to certain codes of conduct endorsed by a society or a group (such as a religion), or accepted by an individual for her own behavior, or
  2. normatively to refer to a code of conduct that, given specified conditions, would be endorsed by all rational people.

Any definition of “morality” in the descriptive sense will need to specify which of the codes endorsed by a society or group count as moral. Even in small homogeneous societies that have no written language, distinctions are sometimes made between morality, law, and religion. And in larger and more complex societies these distinctions are often sharply marked. So “morality” cannot be taken to refer to every code of conduct endorsed by a society. As Dahl (2023: 53) puts it, a descriptive definition of “morality” should be distinctive: it should distinguish moral judgments, principles, or codes from other normative judgments, principles, or codes.

In the normative sense, “morality” refers to a code of conduct that would be endorsed by anyone who meets certain intellectual and volitional conditions, almost always including the condition of being rational. That a person meets these conditions is typically expressed by saying that the person counts as a moral agent. However, merely showing that a certain code would be endorsed by any moral agent is not enough to show that the code is the moral code. It might well be that all moral agents would also endorse a code of prudence or rationality, but this would not by itself show that prudence was part of morality. So something else must be added; for example, that the code can be understood to involve a certain kind of impartiality, or that it can be understood as having the function of making it possible for people to live together in groups.

As we’ve just seen, not all codes that are endorsed by societies or groups are moral codes in the descriptive sense of morality, and not all codes that would be endorsed by all moral agents are moral codes in the normative sense of morality. So any definition of morality—in either sense—will require further criteria. Still, each of these two very brief descriptions of codes might be regarded as offering some features of morality that would be included in any adequate definition. In that way they might be taken to be offering some definitional features of morality, in each of its two senses. When one has specified enough definitional features to allow one to classify all the relevant theories—whether normative moral theories, or theories about the descriptive moralities of different societies—as theories of a common subject, one might then be taken to have given a definition of morality. This is the sense of “definition” at work in this entry.

1. Is Morality Unified Enough to Define?

An assumption suggested by the very existence of this encyclopedia entry is that there is some unifying set of features in virtue of which all moral systems count as moral systems. But Sinnott-Armstrong (2016) directly argues against an analogous hypothesis in connection with moral judgments, and also seems to take this view to suggest that morality itself is not a unified domain. He points out that moral judgments cannot be unified by any appeal to the notion of harm to others, since there are such things as moral ideals, and there are harmless behaviors that a significant number of people regard as morally wrong: Sinnott-Armstrong gives examples such as cannibalism and flag-burning. Whether people who condemn such behaviors morally are correct in those judgments is largely irrelevant to the question of whether they count as moral in the first place.

Sinnott-Armstrong seems right in holding that moral judgments cannot be delimited from other judgments simply by appeal to their content. It seems quite possible for someone to have been raised in such a way as to hold that it is morally wrong for adult men to wear shorts. And it also seems plausible that, as he also argues, moral judgments cannot be identified by reference to any sort of neurological feature common and peculiar to them and them alone. A third strategy might be to claim that moral judgments are those one makes as a result of having been inducted into a social practice that has a certain function. However, this function cannot simply be to help facilitate the sorts of social interactions that enable societies to flourish and persist, since too many obviously non-moral judgments do this.

Beyond the problem just described, attempts to pick out moral codes in the descriptive sense by appeal to their function often seem to be specifying the function that the theorist thinks morality, in the normative sense, would serve, rather than the function that actual moralities do serve. For example, Greene claims that

morality is a set of psychological adaptations that allow otherwise selfish individuals to reap the benefits of cooperation, (2013: 23)

and Haidt claims that

moral systems are interlocking sets of values, virtues, norms, practices, identities, institutions, technologies, and evolved psychological mechanisms that work together to suppress or regulate self-interest and make cooperative societies possible. (2011: 270)

But these claims need to deal with the existence of dysfunctional moralities that do not in fact serve these functions. Perhaps this problem could be alleviated by pointing out that many instances of a kind that have a function—for example, an actual human heart—fail to fulfill that function.

Even if Sinnott-Armstrong’s position is correct with regard to morality in the descriptive sense, there might nevertheless be a code of conduct that, given certain specified conditions, would be endorsed by all rational agents. That is, even if the descriptive sense of morality is a family-resemblance notion, vaguely bordered and open-textured, or even if it is significantly disjunctive and disunified, the normative sense might not be. By way of comparison, we might think of the notion of food in two ways: as what people regard as food, and as what they would regard as food if they were rational and fully informed. Certainly there is not much that unifies the first category: not even being digestible or nutritious, since people regard various indigestible and non-nutritious substances as food, and forego much that is digestible and nutritious. But that does not mean that we cannot theorize about what it would be rational to regard as food.

2. Descriptive Definitions of “Morality”

An initial naïve attempt at a descriptive definition of “morality” might take it to refer to the most important code of conduct endorsed by a society and accepted by the members of that society. But the existence of large and heterogeneous societies raises conceptual problems for such a descriptive definition, since there may not be any such society-wide code that is regarded as most important. As a result, a definition might be offered in which “morality” refers to the most important code of conduct endorsed by any group, or even by an individual. Apart from containing some prohibitions on harming (certain) others, different moralities—when “morality” is understood in this way—can vary in content quite substantially.

Law is distinguished from morality by having explicit written rules, penalties, and officials who interpret the laws and apply the penalties. Although there is often considerable overlap in the conduct governed by morality and that governed by law, laws are often evaluated—and changed—on moral grounds. Some theorists, including Ronald Dworkin (1986), have even maintained that the interpretation of law must make use of morality.

Although the morality of a group or society may derive from its religion, morality and religion are not the same thing, even in that case. Morality is only a guide to conduct, whereas religion is always more than this. For example, religion includes stories about events in the past, usually about supernatural beings, that are used to explain or justify the behavior that it prohibits or requires. Although there is often a considerable overlap in the conduct prohibited or required by religion and that prohibited or required by morality, religions may prohibit or require more than is prohibited or required by guides to behavior that are explicitly labeled as moral guides, and may recommend some behavior that is prohibited by morality. Even when morality is not regarded as the code of conduct that is put forward by a formal religion, it is often thought to require some religious explanation and justification. However, just as with law, some religious practices and precepts are criticized on moral grounds, e.g., that the practice or precept involves discrimination on the basis of race, gender, or sexual orientation.

When “morality” is used simply to refer to a code of conduct endorsed by an actual group, including a society, even if it is distinguished from law and religion, it is being used in a descriptive sense. It is also being used in the descriptive sense when it refers to important attitudes of individuals. Just as one can refer to the morality of the Greeks, so one can refer to the morality of a particular person. This descriptive use of “morality” is now becoming more prominent because of the work of psychologists such as Jonathan Haidt (2006), who have been influenced by the views of David Hume (1751), including his attempt to present a naturalistic account of moral judgments.

Guides to behavior that are regarded as moralities normally involve avoiding and preventing harm to others (Frankena 1980), and perhaps some norm of honesty (Strawson 1961). But all of them involve other matters as well, and Hare’s (1952, 1963) view of morality as that which is most important allows that these other matters may be more important than avoiding and preventing harm to others. This view of morality as concerning that which is most important to a person or group allows matters related to religious practices and precepts, or matters related to customs and traditions, e.g., purity and sanctity, to be more important than avoiding and preventing harm.

When “morality” is used in a descriptive sense, moralities can differ from each other quite extensively in their content and in the foundation that members of the society claim their morality to have. Some societies may claim that their morality, which is more concerned with purity and sanctity, is based on the commands of God. The descriptive sense of “morality”, which allows for the view that morality is based on religion in this way, picks out codes of conduct that are often in significant conflict with all normative accounts of morality.

A society might have a morality that takes accepting its traditions and customs, including accepting the authority of certain people and emphasizing loyalty to the group, as more important than avoiding and preventing harm. Such a morality might not count as immoral any behavior that shows loyalty to the preferred group, even if that behavior causes significant harm to innocent people who are not in that group. The familiarity of this kind of morality, which makes in-group loyalty almost equivalent to morality, seems to allow some comparative and evolutionary psychologists, including Frans De Waal (1996), to regard non-human animals to be acting in ways very similar to those that are regarded as moral.

Although all societies include more than just a concern for minimizing harm to (some) human beings in their moralities, this feature of morality, unlike purity and sanctity, or accepting authority and emphasizing loyalty, is included in everything that is regarded as a morality by any society. Because minimizing harm can conflict with accepting authority and emphasizing loyalty, there can be fundamental disagreements within a society about the morally right way to behave in particular kinds of situations. Philosophers such as Bentham (1789) and Mill (1861), who accept a normative account of morality that takes the avoiding and preventing harm element of morality to be most important, criticize all actual moralities (referred to by “morality” in the descriptive sense) that give precedence to purity and loyalty when they are in conflict with avoiding and preventing harm.

Some psychologists, such as Haidt, take morality to include concern with, at least, all three of the triad of (1) harm, (2) purity, and (3) loyalty, and hold that different members of a society can and do take different features of morality to be most important. But beyond a concern with avoiding and preventing such harms to members of certain groups, there may be no common content shared by all moralities in the descriptive sense. Nor may there be any common justification that those who accept morality claim for it; some may appeal to religion, others to tradition, and others to rational human nature. Beyond the concern with harm, the only other feature that all descriptive moralities have in common is that they are endorsed by an individual or a group, usually a society, in which case they provide a guide for the behavior of the people in that group or society. In the descriptive sense of “morality”, morality may not even incorporate impartiality with regard to all moral agents, and it may not be universalizable in any significant way (compare MacIntyre 1957).

Although most philosophers do not use “morality” in any of the above descriptive senses, some do. Ethical relativists such as Harman (1975), Westermarck (1960), and Prinz (2007), deny that there is any universal normative morality and claim that the actual moralities of societies or individuals are the only moralities there are. These relativists hold that only when the term “morality” is used in this descriptive sense is there something that “morality” actually refers to. They claim that it is a mistake to take “morality” to refer to a universal code of conduct that, under certain conditions, would be endorsed by all rational persons. Although ethical relativists admit that many speakers of English use “morality” to refer to such a universal code of conduct, they claim such persons are mistaken in thinking that there is any such thing. Such relativists are plausibly regarded as skeptics about morality taken in the normative sense.

When used with its descriptive sense, “morality” can refer to codes of conduct with widely differing content, and still be used unambiguously. This parallels the way in which “law” is used unambiguously even though different societies have laws with widely differing content. However, when “morality” is used in its descriptive sense, it sometimes does not refer to the code of a society, but to the code of a group or an individual. As a result, when the guide to conduct endorsed by, for example, a religious group conflicts with the guide to conduct put forward by a society, it is not clear whether to say that there are conflicting moralities, conflicting elements within morality, or that the code of the religious group conflicts with morality.

In small homogeneous societies there may be a guide to behavior that is endorsed by the society and that is accepted by (almost) all members of the society. For such societies there is (almost) no ambiguity about which guide “morality” refers to. However, in larger societies people often belong to groups that endorse guides to behavior that conflict with the guide endorsed by their society, and members of the society do not always endorse the guide endorsed by their society. If they endorse the conflicting guide of some other group to which they belong (often a religious group) rather than the guide endorsed by their society, in cases of conflict they will regard those who follow the guide endorsed by their society as acting immorally.

In the descriptive sense of “morality”, a person’s own morality cannot be a guide to behavior that that person would prefer others not to follow. However, the fact that an individual adopts a moral code of conduct for his own use does not entail that the person requires it to be adopted by anyone else. An individual may adopt for himself a very demanding moral guide that he thinks may be too difficult for most others to follow. He may judge people who do not adopt his code of conduct as not being as morally good as he is, without judging them to be immoral if they do not adopt it. However, such cases do not undermine the restriction; a guide is plausibly referred to as a morality only when the individual would be willing for others to follow it, at least if “follow” is taken to mean “successfully follow”. For it may be that the individual would not be willing for others to try to follow that code, because of worries about the bad effects of predictable failures due to partiality or lack of sufficient foresight or intelligence.

3. Descriptive Definitions in Allied Areas

Because psychologists and anthropologists often need to design questionnaires and other sorts of probes of the attitudes of subjects, they might be expected to be more sensitive to the need for a reasonably clear means of separating moral judgments from other sorts of judgments. But despite this expectation, and roughly half a century ago, Abraham Edel (1962: 56) decried the lack of an explicit concern to delimit the domain of morality among anthropologists, writing that “morality…is taken for granted, in the sense that one can invoke it or refer to it at will; but it is not explained, depicted, or analysed.” The danger here, he points out, is that of “merging the morality concept with social control concepts.” Augmenting this danger was the influence, in anthropology, of the sociologist Émile Durkheim (1906/2009), for whom morality was simply a matter of how a given society enforces whatever social rules it happens to have.

The failure to offer an operational definition of morality or moral judgment may help explain the widespread but dubious assumption in contemporary anthropology, noted by James Laidlaw (2016: 456), that altruism is the essential and irreducible core of ethics. But Laidlaw also notes that many of the features of what Bernard Williams (1985) described as “the morality system”—features that Williams himself criticized as the parochial result of a secularization of Christian values—are in fact widely shared outside of the West. This state of affairs leads Laidlaw to ask the crucial question:

Which features, formal or substantive, are shared by the “morality system” of the modern West and those of the other major agrarian civilizations and literate religions?

This is, to a very close approximation, a request for the definition of morality in the descriptive sense.

Klenk (2019) notes that in recent years anthropology has taken what he terms an “ethical turn”, recognizing moral systems, and ethics more generally, as a distinct object of anthropological study. This is a move away from the Durkheimian paradigm, and includes the study of self-development, virtues, habits, and the role of explicit deliberation when moral breakdowns occur. However, Klenk’s survey of attempts by anthropologists to study morality as an independent domain lead him to conclude that, so far, their efforts do

not readily allow a distinction between moral considerations and other normative considerations such as prudential, epistemic, or aesthetic ones. (2019: 342)

In light of Edel’s worry about a conflation of moral systems with systems of social control, it is interesting to consider Curry (2016), who defends the hypothesis that

morality turns out to be a collection of biological and cultural solutions to the problems of cooperation and conflict recurrent in human social life. (2016: 29)

Curry notes that rules related to kinship, mutualism, exchange, and various forms of conflict resolution appear in virtually all societies. And he argues that many of them have precursors in animal behavior, and can be explained by appeal to his central hypothesis of morality as a solution to problems of cooperation and conflict resolution. He also notes that philosophers, from Aristotle through Hume, Russell, and Rawls, all took cooperation and conflict resolution to be central ideas in understanding morality. It is unclear, however, whether Curry’s view can adequately distinguish morality from law and from other systems that aim to reduce conflict by providing solutions to coordination problems.

In evolutionary biology, morality is sometimes simply equated with fairness (Baumard et al., 2013: 60, 77) or reciprocal altruism (Alexander 1987: 77). But it is also sometimes identified by reference to an evolved capacity to make a certain sort of judgment and perhaps also to signal that one has made it (Hauser 2006). This makes morality into something very much like a natural kind, that can be identified by reference to causal/historical processes. In that case, a content-based definition of morality isn’t required: certain central features are all that one needs to begin one’s theorizing, since they will be enough to draw attention to certain psychologically and biologically individuated mechanisms, and the study of morality will be a detailed inquiry into the nature and evolutionary history of these mechanisms.

The view that moral judgment is a natural kind is also represented in psychology (Mikhail 2007). If moral judgment is a natural kind in this way, then a person’s moral code might simply consist in the moral judgments that person is disposed to make. One piece of evidence in favor of the natural kind hypothesis is the relative universality of certain moral concepts in human cultures: concepts such as obligation, permission, and prohibition. Another is an argument similar to Chomsky’s famous “poverty of the stimulus” argument for a universal human grammar (Dwyer et al. 2010; see also Roedder and Harman 2010).

In psychology, one significant topic of investigation is the existence and nature of a distinction between the moral and the conventional (Machery and Stich 2022). More specifically, the distinction at issue is between (a) acts that are judged wrong only because of a contingent convention or because they go against the dictates of some relevant authority, and (b) those that are judged to be wrong quite independently of these things, that have a seriousness to them, and that are justified by appeal to the notions of harm, rights, or justice. Elliot Turiel emphasized this distinction, and drew attention to the danger, if one overlooks it, of lumping together moral rules with non-moral “conventions that further the coordination of social interactions within social systems” (1983: 109–11). Those who accept this distinction are implicitly offering a definition of morality in the descriptive sense. But not all psychologists accept the distinction (see Machery and Mallon 2010 and Kelly et al. 2007).

The psychologist Kurt Gray might be seen as offering an account of moral judgment that would allow us to determine the morality of an individual or group. He and his co-authors suggest that

morality is essentially represented by a cognitive template that combines a perceived intentional agent with a perceived suffering patient. (Gray et al. 2012: 102)

This claim, while quite strong, is nevertheless not as implausibly strong as it might seem, since the thesis is directly concerned with the template we use when thinking about moral matters; it is not directly concerned with the nature of morality itself. In the sense of “template” at issue here, the template we use when thinking about dogs might include having four legs, a tail, and fur, among other things. But that does not mean that an animal must have these features to count as a dog, or even that we believe this.

Given the way that Gray et al. think of templates, even if their hypothesis is correct, it would not mean that our psychology requires us to think of the moral as always involving intentional agents and perceiving patients. In line with this, and despite some lapses in which they suggest that “moral acts can be defined in terms of intention and suffering,” (2012: 109) their considered view seems to be only that the dyadic template fits the majority of moral situations, as we conceive them. Moreover, the links between immoral behavior and suffering to which they appeal in defending their general view is sometimes extremely loose and indirect. For example, they fit authority violations into their suffering-based template by noting that “authority structures provide a way of peacefully resolving conflict” and that “violence results when social structures are threatened.”

In a recent illuminating discussion of morality an object of psychological study (Dahl 2023) offers his own suggested definition of “morality” as a matter of those concerns that are regarded by an agent as obligatory, and that have to do with others’ welfare, rights, fairness and justice, as well as certain psychologically interesting effects of such concerns. Dahl’s definition has its merits, but—importantly—he does not offer it as the uniquely best definition. Indeed, he repeatedly stresses that in empirical science there is no pressing need to determine the “correct” definition of “moral.” Rather, what is of primary importance is simply clarity about the sense of “moral” at issue in any given line of research. The definitions Dahl urges his fellow psychologists to make explicit should, he argues, have four virtues. They should be technical in the sense of being well-defined and easy to apply while at the same time overlapping with messy everyday use at least to a sufficient degree. They should also be psychological in the sense of picking out sufficiently common psychological characteristics. They should be descriptive in the sense of not depending, for their application any particular normative or evaluative stance. And, lastly, they should be distinctive, in that they should distinguish moral attitudes from other sorts of normative attitudes.

The increasing importance, in the everyday life of many people, of technology that makes use of natural language processing and artificial intelligence makes a definition of morality take on a significant practical relevance in these newly developing areas. The issue is not simply that artificial agents should not behave in ways that would be regarded as immoral in genuine moral agents. Rather, a definition of morality is likely to be used to gather the data on which artificial intelligences are trained, as well as to provide benchmarks for their acceptability. At present there is an explosion of research on moral phenomena connected with AI and NLP (see Hagendorff and Danks 2022 and references therein). This research represents a new perspective on the determinants of moral judgments in humans (see, e.g., Pauketat and Anthis 2022), since human beings have not, until very recently, confronted non-human agents capable of acting and communicating in ways that closely resemble human beings. Vida et al. (2023) plausibly suggest that this research may lead to more general definitions of morality in psychology and perhaps in other areas as well.

It would of course be beneficial if there were a small standardized set if widely-shared benchmarks for adequate moral value alignment in AI. But, unsurprisingly, there are at present no such benchmarks, since there is not even a widely shared definition of morality. Vida et al. surveyed nearly 100 papers that purport to concern moral issues connected with artificial intelligence. One main conclusion is

there is a lack of clarity and consistency as to whether morality in [natural language processing and artificial intelligence] is addressed purely empirically or also normatively. This lack of clarity persists also in regards to the further usage of ethical terminology (2023: 5538).

4. Normative Definitions of “Morality”

Explicit philosophical attempts to define morality in the normative sense are hard to find, at least since the beginning of the 20th century. One possible explanation for this is the combined effect of early positivistic worries about the metaphysical status of normative properties, followed (or augmented) by Wittgensteinian worries about definitions of any significant terms whatsoever. Whatever the explanation, when definitions have been offered, they have tended to be directed at the notion of moral judgment (Hare 1952, 1981), not morality itself.

Even moral realists who offer fully developed moral theories do not tend to offer anything like a definition of morality. Instead, what these philosophers usually offer is a justification of a set of norms with which they take their audience already to be acquainted. In effect, they tacitly pick morality out by reference to certain salient and relative uncontroversial bits of its content: that it prohibits killing, stealing, deceiving, cheating, and so on. In fact, this would not be a bad way of defining morality, if the point of such a definition were only to be relatively theory-neutral, and to allow theorizing to begin. We could call it a “reference-fixing definition” or “substantive definition” (see Prinz and Nichols 2010: 122).

A reference-fixing definition of morality in the normative sense is not, however, a definition in the sense at issue in this entry. It only specifies certain salient bits of content, and leaves completely implicit what it is about that content that makes it count as moral. For our purposes, a better schema for a definition is the following: morality is (or would be) the behavioral code that all rational persons, under certain specified conditions, would endorse. Some who offer a definition that fits this schema also argue that there is no such code. These, again, are skeptics about morality in the normative sense.

In looking for a definition of morality in the normative sense, moral skeptics are useful, since their arguments often amount to specifying some definitional feature of morality, and arguing that nothing has it. For example, one interesting class of moral skeptics includes those who think that we should abandon the narrow category of the moral because of the notion of a code at its center. These moral skeptics hold that we should do our normative theorizing in terms of the good life, or the virtues, not morality. Their arguments therefore involve the view that it is definitional of morality that it be a code. Elizabeth Anscombe (1958) gave expression to this kind of view, which also finds echoes in the work of Bernard Williams (1985). J. L. Mackie (1977), on the other hand, was a skeptic about morality because he thought that no code would pick out a property that would infallibly motivate anyone who saw or appreciated it. So Mackie took it as definitional of morality that all rational beings endorse it in a very strong sense of “endorse”: one that includes being motivated.

4.1 Morality and rationality

One’s understanding of what morality is, in the normative sense, will depend very significantly on how one understands rationality. Morality, in the normative sense, is sometimes taken to prohibit certain forms of consensual sexual activity, or the use of recreational drugs. But including such prohibitions in an account of morality as a universal guide that all rational persons would endorse requires a very particular view of rationality. After all, many will deny that it is irrational to favor harmless consensual sexual activities, or to favor the use of certain drugs for purely recreational purposes.

One concept of rationality that supports the exclusion of sexual matters, at least at the basic level, from the norms of morality, is that for an action to count as irrational it must be an act that increases the risk of harms to oneself without producing a compensating benefit for someone—perhaps oneself, perhaps someone else. Such an account of rationality might be called “hybrid”, since it gives different roles to self-interest and to altruism. An account of morality based on the hybrid concept of rationality could agree with Hobbes (1660) that morality is concerned with promoting people living together in peace and harmony, which includes obeying the rules prohibiting causing harm to others. Although moral prohibitions against actions that cause harm or significantly increase the risk of harm are not absolute, in order to avoid acting immorally, justification is always needed when violating these prohibitions. Kant (1797) seems to hold that it is never justified to violate some of these prohibitions, e.g., the prohibition against lying. This is largely a result of the fact that Kant’s (1785) concept of rationality is purely formal, in contrast with the hybrid concept of rationality described above.

Consequentialist views might not seem to fit the basic schema for definitions of “morality” in the normative sense, since they do not appear to make reference to the notions of endorsement or rationality. But this appearance is deceptive. Mill himself explicitly defines morality as

the rules and precepts for human conduct, by the observance of which [a happy existence] might be, to the greatest extent possible, secured. (1861 [2002: 12])

And he thinks that the mind is not in a “right state” unless it is in “the state most conducive to the general happiness”—in which case it would certainly favor morality as just characterized. And the act-consequentialist J.J.C. Smart (1956) is also explicit that he is thinking of ethics as the study of how it is most rational to behave. His embrace of utilitarianism is the result of his belief that maximizing utility is always the rational thing to do. On reflection it is not surprising that many moral theorists implicitly hold that the codes they offer would be endorsed by all rational people, at least under certain conditions. Unless one holds this, one will have to admit that, having been shown that a certain behavior is morally required, a rational person might simply shrug and ask “So what?” And, though some exceptions are mentioned below, very few moral realists think that their arguments leave this option open. Even fewer think this option remains open if we are allowed to add some additional conditions beyond mere rationality: a restriction on beliefs, for example (similar to Rawls’ (1971: 118) veil of ignorance), or impartiality.

Among those who use “morality” normatively, it is common to hold that it is definitional of morality that it should never be overridden. That is, it is common to hold that no one should ever violate a moral prohibition or requirement for non-moral reasons. This claim is trivial if “should” is taken to mean “morally should”. So the claim about moral overridingness is typically understood with “should” meaning “rationally should”, with the result that moral requirements are asserted to be rational requirements. Though common, this view is by no means always taken as definitional. Sidgwick (1874) despaired of showing that rationality required us to choose morality over egoism, though he certainly did not think rationality required egoism either. More explicitly, Gert (2005) held that though moral behavior is always rationally permissible, it is not always rationally required. Foot (1972) seems to have held that any reason—and therefore any rational requirement—to act morally would have to stem from a contingent commitment or an objective interest. And she also seems to have held that sometimes neither of these sorts of reasons might be available, so that moral behavior might not be rationally required for some agents. Finally, moral realists who hold desire-based theories of reasons and formal, means/end theories of rationality sometimes explicitly deny that moral behavior is always even rationally permissible (Goldman 2009), and in fact this seems to be a consequence of Foot’s view as well, though she does not emphasize it.

Despite the fact that theorists such as Sidgwick, Gert, Foot, and Goldman do not hold that moral behavior is rationally required, they are by no means precluded from using “morality” in the normative sense. Using “morality” in the normative sense, and holding that there is such a thing, only entails holding that rational people would endorse a certain system; it does not entail holding that rational people would always be motivated to follow that system themselves. But to the degree that a theorist would deny even the claim about endorsing the system, that theorist is either not using “morality” in a normative sense, or is denying the existence of morality in that sense. Such a theorist may be using “morality” in a descriptive sense, or may not have any particular sense in mind.

4.2 Morality as a public system

Let us define a public system as a system of norms that (1) is knowable by all those to whom it applies, and (2) is not irrational for any of those to whom it applies to follow (Gert 2005: 10). The ideal situation for a legal system would be that it be a public system. But in any large society this is not possible. Games are closer to being public systems and most adults playing a game know its rules, or they know that there are judges whose interpretation determines what behavior the game prohibits, requires, etc. Although a game is often a public system, its rules apply only to those playing the game. If a person does not care enough about the game to abide by the rules, she can usually quit. It is plausible that it is definition of morality in the normative sense that it is the one public system that no rational person can quit. The fact that one cannot quit morality means that one can do nothing to escape being legitimately liable to sanction for violating its norms, except by ceasing to be a moral agent. Morality applies to people simply by virtue of their being rational persons who know what morality prohibits, requires, etc., and being able to guide their behavior accordingly.

Public systems can be formal or informal. To say a public system is informal is to say that it has no authoritative judges and no decision procedure that provides a unique guide to action in all situations, or that resolves all disagreements. To say that a public system is formal is to say that it has one or both of these things (Gert 2005: 9). Professional basketball is a formal public system; all the players know that what the referees call a foul determines what is a foul. Pickup basketball is an informal public system. The existence of persistent moral disagreements shows that morality is most plausibly regarded as an informal public system. This is true even for such moral theories as the Divine Command theory and act utilitarianism, inasmuch as there are no authoritative judges of God’s will, or of which act will maximize utility, and there are no decision procedures for determining these things (Scanlon 2011: 261–2). When persistent moral disagreement is recognized, those who understand that morality is an informal public system admit that how one should act is morally unresolvable, and if some resolution is required, the political or legal system can be used to resolve it. These latter formal systems have the means to provide unique guides, but they do not provide the uniquely correct moral guide to the action that should be performed.

Despite the existence of important and controversial moral issues, morality, like all informal public systems, presupposes agreement on how to act in most moral situations, e.g., all agree that killing or seriously harming any moral agent requires strong justification in order to be morally allowed. No one thinks it is morally justified to cheat, deceive, injure, or kill a moral agent simply in order to gain sufficient money to take a fantastic vacation. Moral matters are often thought to be controversial because everyday decisions, about which there is no controversy, are rarely discussed. The amount of agreement concerning what rules are moral rules, and on when it is justified to violate one of these rules, explains why morality can be a public system even though it is an informal system.

By using the notion of an informal public system, we can improve the basic schema for definitions of “morality” in the normative sense. The old schema was that morality is the code of conduct that all rational persons, under certain specified conditions, would endorse. The improved schema is that morality is the informal public system that all rational persons, under certain specified conditions, would endorse. Some theorists might not regard the informal nature of the moral system as definitional, holding that morality might give knowable precise answers to every question. This would have the result that conscientious moral agents often cannot know what morality permits, requires, or allows. Some philosophers deny that this is a genuine possibility.

4.3 The content of morality

For moral realists who explicitly hold that morality, in the normative sense, is an informal public system that all rational persons would endorse for governing the behavior of all moral agents, it has a fairly definite content. Hobbes (1660), Mill (1861), and most other non-religiously influenced philosophers in the Anglo-American tradition limit morality to behavior that, directly or indirectly, affects others.

The claim that morality, in the normative sense, only governs behavior that affects others is somewhat controversial, and so probably should not be counted as definitional, even if it turns out to be entailed by the correct moral theory. Some have claimed that morality also governs behavior that affects only the agent herself, such as taking recreational drugs, masturbation, and failure to develop one’s talents. Kant (1785) may provide an account of this wide concept of morality. Interpreted this way, Kant’s theory still fits the basic schema, but includes these self-regarding moral requirements because of the particular account of rationality he employs. However, pace Kant, it is doubtful that all moral agents would endorse a universal guide to behavior that governs behavior that does not affect other people at all. When the concept of morality is completely distinguished from religion, moral rules do seem to limit their content to behavior that directly or indirectly causes or risks harm to others. Some behavior that seems to affect only oneself, e.g., taking recreational drugs, may have a significant indirect harmful effect on others by supporting the illegal and harmful activity of those who benefit from the sale of those drugs.

Confusion about the content of morality sometimes arises because morality is not distinguished sufficiently from religion. Regarding self-affecting behavior as governed by morality is supported by the idea that we are created by God and are obliged to obey God’s commands, and so may be a holdover from the time when morality was not clearly distinguished from religion. This religious holdover might also affect the claim that some sexual practices such as homosexuality are immoral. Those who clearly distinguish morality from religion typically do not regard sexual orientation as a moral matter.

It is possible to hold that having a certain sort of social goal is definitional of morality (Frankena 1963). Stephen Toulmin (1950) took it to be the harmony of society. Baier (1958) took it to be “the good of everyone alike”. Utilitarians sometimes claim it is the production of the greatest good. Gert (2005) took it to be the lessening of evil or harm. This latter goal may seem to be a significant narrowing of the utilitarian claim, but utilitarians always include the lessening of harm as essential to producing the greatest good, and almost all of their examples involve avoiding or preventing harm. It is notable that the paradigm cases of moral rules are those that prohibit causing harm directly or indirectly, such as rules prohibiting killing, causing pain, deceiving, and breaking promises.

Among the views of moral realists, differences in content are less significant than similarities. For all such philosophers, morality prohibits actions such as killing, causing pain, deceiving, and breaking promises. For some, morality also requires charitable actions, but failure to act charitably on every possible occasion does not require justification in the same way that any act of killing, causing pain, deceiving, and breaking promises requires justification. Both Kant (1785) and Mill (1861) distinguish between duties of perfect obligation and duties of imperfect obligation and regard not harming as the former kind of duty and helping as the latter kind of duty. For Gert (2005), morality encourages charitable action, but does not require it; it is always morally good to be charitable, but it is not immoral not to be charitable.

5. Relations Between Normative and Descriptive Morality

When “morality” is used in its normative sense, it need not have either of the two formal features that are essential to moralities referred to by the descriptive sense: that it be a code of conduct that is endorsed by a society, group, or individual, or that it be accepted as a guide to behavior by the members of that society or group, or by that individual. Indeed, it is possible that morality, in the normative sense, has never been endorsed by any particular society, by any group at all, or even by any individual. This is partly a consequence of the fact that “morality” in the normative sense is understood in terms of a conditional that is likely to be counterfactual: it is the code that would be endorsed by any fully rational person under certain conditions.

If one is a moral realist, one may require that descriptive moralities at least approximate, in some ways, morality in the normative sense. That is, one might claim that the guides to behavior of some societies lack so many of the essential features of morality in the normative sense, that it would be incorrect to say that these societies even have a morality in a descriptive sense (Luco 2014: 385). Even if one endorses such a criterion for a code to count as moral, it remains plausible that all societies have something that can be regarded as their morality. One need only add that many of these moralities—perhaps, indeed, all of them—are to some degree defective. That is, a moral realist might hold that although these actual guides to behavior have enough of the features of normative morality to be classified as descriptive moralities, they would not be endorsed in their entirety by all moral agents.

While most moral realists do not claim that any actual society has or ever has had morality as its actual guide to conduct, “natural law” theories of morality claim that any rational person in any society—even one that has a defective morality—is capable of knowing what general kinds of actions morality prohibits, requires, discourages, encourages, and allows. In the theological version of natural law theories, such as that put forward by Aquinas, this is because God implanted this knowledge in the reason of all persons. In the secular version of natural law theories, such as that put forward by Hobbes (1660), natural reason is sufficient to allow all rational persons to know what morality prohibits, requires, etc. Natural law theorists also claim that morality applies to all rational persons, not only those now living, but also those who lived in the past. Such views might be thought to blur the line between normative and descriptive morality, since they hold that there is a sense in which all members of all societies are already aware of, and accept, the same code.

In contrast to natural law theories, other moral theories do not hold quite so strong a view about the universality of knowledge of morality. Still, many hold that morality is known to all who can legitimately be judged by it. In line with this latter view, Baier (1958), Rawls (1971) and other contractarians deny that there can be an esoteric morality: one that judges people even though they cannot know what it prohibits, requires, etc. For all of the above theorists, morality is a public system. Moral judgments of blame thus differ from legal or religious judgments of blame in that they cannot be made about persons who are legitimately ignorant of what they are required to do.

6. Variations

As one gives more substance and detail to the general notions of endorsement, rationality, and the relevant conditions under which rational people would endorse morality, one moves further from providing a definition of morality in the normative sense, and closer to providing an actual moral theory. And a similar claim is true for definitions of morality in the descriptive sense, as one specifies in more detail what one means in claiming that a person or group endorses a system or code. What follow are four broad ways of making the definition of morality, in the normative sense, more precise, focusing on the notion of endorsement. They are all sufficiently schematic to be regarded as varieties of definition, rather than as theories. But their relations to particular theories also serves to show that the general schema is adequate to a wide range of detailed accounts. Similar examples might be offered for accounts of morality in the descriptive sense.

The expressivist Allan Gibbard (1990) held that moral assertions express acceptance of norms for feeling the emotions of guilt and anger. A moral realist might appeal to this attitude to make the general schema for morality more precise in the following way:

V1: Morality is the informal public system that is picked out by the set of norms for feeling guilt and anger that all rational people, given specified conditions, would accept.

Similar use might be made of appeal to norms for praise and blame (Sprigge 1964: 317) or norms for reward and punishment (Skorupksi 1993). All of these co-options of expressivist views amount to giving more specific content to the notion of endorsing code.

Another way of understanding the notion of endorsement is as advocacy. Advocating a code is a second- or third-personal matter, since one advocates a code to others. Moreover, it is consistent with advocating a code, that one does not plan on following that code oneself. Just as asserting something one believes to be false still counts as asserting it, hypocritical advocacy of a code still counts as advocacy of that code. When endorsement is understood as advocacy, it can be used in definitions of morality, in the descriptive sense, as long as it is the morality of a group or society. And endorsement-as-advocacy can also be used in definition of morality in the normative sense. Such a view has been offered by Gert (2005). The corresponding general definition of morality, into which Gert’s account fits, is the following:

V2: Morality is the informal public system that, given specified conditions, would be advocated by all rational people.

The notion of advocacy has less of a place in a descriptive account of a single person’s morality, since when someone is hypocritical we often deny that they really hold the moral view that they advocate. One way of understanding the notion of endorsement that applies to individuals as well as to groups is as acceptance. This yields the following:

V3: Morality is the informal public system that, given specified conditions, would be accepted by all rational people.

Contractarians like Gauthier (1986), who view morality primarily from a first-personal point of view, can be seen as understanding morality in this way, since accepting a code is a first-personal matter.

T.M. Scanlon (1982, 1998) suggests that the subject matter of morality—what we are talking about, when we talk about morality—is a system of rules for the regulation of behavior that is not reasonably rejectable based on a desire for informed unforced general agreement. This, also, can be seen as an instance of the general schema given above, as follows:

V4: Morality is the informal public system that, given that they were reasonable and looking for an unforced general agreement, would not be rejected by any rational people.

V4 is perhaps a limiting case of a variation on the basic schema, since it interprets endorsement simply as non-rejection.

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