Moral Luck
Moral luck occurs when an agent can be correctly treated as an object of moral judgment despite the fact that a significant aspect of what she is assessed for depends on factors beyond her control. Bernard Williams writes, “when I first introduced the expression moral luck, I expected to suggest an oxymoron” (Williams 1993, 251). Indeed, immunity from luck has been thought by many to be part of the very essence of morality. And yet, as Williams (1976) and Thomas Nagel (1979) showed in their now classic pair of articles, it appears that our everyday judgments and practices commit us to the existence of moral luck. The problem of moral luck arises because we seem to be committed to the general principle that we are morally assessable only to the extent that what we are assessed for depends on factors under our control (call this the “Control Principle”). At the same time, when it comes to countless particular cases, we morally assess agents for things that depend on factors that are not in their control. And making the situation still more problematic is the fact that a very natural line of reasoning suggests that it is impossible to morally assess anyone for anything if we adhere to the Control Principle.
- 1. Generating the Problem of Moral Luck
- 2. Implications for Other Debates
- 3. Responding to the Problem: Moral Luck Skepticism
- 4. Responding to the Problem: Acceptance of Moral Luck
- 5. Conclusion
- Bibliography
- Academic Tools
- Other Internet Resources
- Related Entries
1. Generating the Problem of Moral Luck
The idea that morality is immune from luck finds inspiration in Kant:
A good will is not good because of what it effects or accomplishes, because of its fitness to attain some proposed end, but only because of its volition, that is, it is good in itself… Even if, by a special disfavor of fortune or by the niggardly provision of a step motherly nature, this will should wholly lack the capacity to carry out its purpose—if with its greatest efforts it should yet achieve nothing and only the good will were left (not, of course, as a mere wish but as the summoning of all means insofar as they are in our control)—then, like a jewel, it would still shine by itself, as something that has its full worth in itself. Usefulness or fruitlessness can neither add anything to this worth nor take anything away from it (Kant 1784 [1998], 4:394).
Thomas Nagel approvingly cites this passage in the opening of his 1979 article, “Moral Luck.” Nagel’s article began as a reply to Williams’ paper of the same name, and the two articles together articulated in a new and powerful way a challenge for anyone wishing to defend the Kantian idea that an important aspect of morality is immune from luck, or independent of what is outside of our control.
To see exactly how the challenge arises, let us begin with the Control Principle:
(CP) We are morally assessable only to the extent that what we are assessed for depends on factors under our control.
It is intuitively compelling, as is the following corollary of it:
(CP-Corollary) Two people ought not to be morally assessed differently if the only other differences between them are due to factors beyond their control.
Not only are the Control Principle and its corollary plausible in themselves, they also seem to find support in our reactions to particular cases. For example, if we find out that a woman who has just stepped on your toes was simply pushed, then our temptation to blame her is likely to evaporate. It seems that the reason for this is our unwillingness to hold someone responsible for what is not in her control. Similarly, if two drivers have taken all precautions, and are abiding by all the rules of the road, and in one case, a dog runs in front of the car and is killed, and not in the other, then, given that the dog’s running out was not something over which either driver had control, it seems that we are reluctant to blame one driver more than the other. Although we might expect different reactions from the two drivers, it does not seem that one is deserving of a worse moral assessment than the other.
At the same time, it is important to recognize that there are many different kinds of moral assessment. For example, there are judgments about a person’s character, for example, as “good” or “bad” (sometimes called “aretaic” judgments). There are also judgments of states of affairs that concern people’s actions as “good” or “bad” (sometimes called “axiological” judgments. Then there are judgments of actions as “right” or “wrong” (sometimes called “deontic” judgments). There are also judgments of responsibility, blame, and praise. As we will see, this category can be further divided in various ways. The focus of much of the literature is on this latter category and that will be the main focus here. (But see Zimmerman (2006) for discussion of luck and deontic judgments, and Richards (1986) and Greco (1995) for discussion of luck and moral worth.)
Distinguishing between the various notions of moral assessment allows for the possibility that the Control Principle should be read as applying to some, but not to other forms of moral assessment. For example, even if we keep our focus on responsibility, blame and praise, some argue that there is a perfectly acceptable form of moral luck which does not conflict with the true spirit of the Control Principle, namely, luck in what you are responsible for (e.g., Richards 1986, Zimmerman 2002). On this view, it will be readily admitted by many that the successful murderer can be responsible for a death, whereas the one who unsuccessfully attempts murder is not responsible for a death. At the same time, both could be equally responsible, or blameworthy, in degree (Zimmerman 2002, 560). Whether or not being responsible or blameworthy for more has implications for whether one is blameworthy to a higher degree is a question to which we will return. For now, we will focus mainly on a reading of the Control Principle in which moral assessments are restricted to those related to responsibility, blameworthiness and praiseworthiness. When we do so, the principle appears compelling.
At the same time, it seems that there are countless cases in which the objects of our moral assessments do depend on factors beyond agents’ control. Even though “moral luck” seems to be an oxymoron, everyday judgments suggest that there is a phenomenon of moral luck after all. As Nagel defines it, “Where a significant aspect of what someone does depends on factors beyond his control, yet we continue to treat him in that respect as an object of moral judgment, it can be called moral luck” (Nagel 1979, 59). To bring out the conflict with the Control Principle even more starkly, we will understand moral luck as follows:
(ML) moral luck occurs when an agent can be correctly treated as an object of moral judgment, despite the fact that a significant aspect of what he is assessed for depends on factors beyond his control.
It is important to note that not all recent discussions of moral luck have accepted this characterization of moral luck. For example, Levy 2019 argues that luck is a richer notion that includes opposition to control as only one aspect among others. Some recent work has instead taken moral luck to be a species of a larger genus of luck, of which there are other species, as well, such as epistemic luck, or offered a conceptual analysis of a very general everyday concept of luck. Such an approach does not build in the idea that luck is opposed to control. (See Pritchard 2006, and see Coffman 2015, who argues in favor of a particular unified analysis of luck for agency and epistemology, but also recognizes that there are other notions of luck in play in some debates.) Considering moral luck alongside other phenomena that go under the label “luck” might be fruitful in some ways, but in order to engage in the debate as found in Kant and Nagel and many others, moral luck must be understood as in contrast to control.
We certainly seem to be committed to the existence of moral luck. For example, we seem to blame those who have murdered more than we blame those who have merely attempted murder, even if the reason for the lack of success in the second case is that the intended victim unexpectedly tripped and fell to the floor just as the bullet arrived at head-height. Since whether the intended victim tripped or not is not something in control of either would-be murderer, we appear to violate the Control Principle and its corollary.
It might be tempting to respond at this point that what people are really responsible for are their intentions or their “willings,” and that we are thus wrong to offer different moral assessments in this pair of cases. Adam Smith (1790/1976), for example, advocates this position, writing that
To the intention or affection of the heart, therefore, to the propriety and impropriety, to the beneficence or hurtfulness of the design, all praise or blame, all approbation or disapprobation, of any kind, which can justly be bestowed upon any action, must ultimately belong. (II.iii.intro.3.)
This is a tempting response, and others have followed Smith in defending something like it (e.g., Khoury 2019). But it faces difficulties of its own. First, as we will see, the would-be murderers offer only one of many cases in which our intuitive moral judgment appears to depend on “results” beyond one’s intentions, as Smith himself noted (II.iii.intro.5). And even more importantly, luck can affect even our “willings” and other internal states (Feinberg 1970, 34–38). As Nagel develops the point, there are other types of luck that affect not only our actions but also every intention we form and every exertion of our wills. Further, once these kinds of luck are recognized, we will see that not one of the factors on which agents’ actions depend is immune to luck.
Nagel identifies four kinds of luck in all: resultant, circumstantial, constitutive, and causal.
Resultant Luck. Resultant luck is luck in the way things turn out. Examples include the pair of would-be murderers just mentioned as well as the pair of innocent drivers described above. In both cases, each member of the pair has exactly the same intentions, has made the same plans, and so on, but things turn out very differently and so both are subject to resultant luck. If in either case, we can correctly offer different moral assessments for each member of the pair, then we have a case of resultant moral luck. Cases of negligence provide another important kind of resultant luck. Imagine that two otherwise conscientious people have forgotten to have their brakes checked recently and experience brake failure, but only one of whom finds a child in the path of his car. If in any of these cases we correctly offer differential moral assessments, then again we have cases of resultant moral luck.
Circumstantial luck. Circumstantial luck is luck in the circumstances in which one finds oneself. For example, consider Nazi collaborators in 1930s Germany who are condemned for committing morally atrocious acts, even though their very presence in Nazi Germany was due to factors beyond their control (Nagel 1979). Had those very people been transferred by the companies for which they worked to Argentina in 1929, perhaps they would have led exemplary lives. If we correctly morally assess the Nazi collaborators differently from their imaginary counterparts in Argentina, then we have a case of circumstantial moral luck.
Constitutive luck. Constitutive luck is luck in who one is, or in the traits and dispositions that one has. Since our genes, care-givers, peers, and other environmental influences all contribute to making us who we are (and since we have no control over these) it seems that who we are is at least largely a matter of luck. Since how we act is partly a function of who we are, the existence of constitutive luck entails that what actions we perform depends on luck, too. For example, if we correctly blame someone for being cowardly or self-righteous or selfish, when his being so depends on factors beyond his control, then we have a case of constitutive moral luck. Further, if a person acts on one of these very character traits over which he lacks control by, say, running away instead of helping to save his child, and we correctly blame him for so acting, then we also have a case of constitutive moral luck. Thus, since both actions and agents are objects of moral assessment, constitutive moral luck undermines the Control Principle when it comes to the assessment of both actions and agents.
Causal luck. Finally, there is causal luck, or luck in “how one is determined by antecedent circumstances” (Nagel 1979, 60). Nagel points out that the appearance of causal moral luck is essentially the classic problem of free will. The problem of free will to which Nagel refers arises because it seems that our actions—and even the “stripped-down acts of the will”—are consequences of what is not in our control. If this is so, then neither our actions nor our willing are free. And since freedom is often thought to be necessary for moral responsibility, we cannot be morally responsible even for our willings. (It is worth noting that some have viewed the inclusion of the category of causal luck as redundant, since what it covers is completely captured by the combination of constitutive and circumstantial luck (Latus 2001 [Other Internet Resources]).)
Upon reflection, it seems that we morally assess people differently for what they do (or who they are) when their actions and personal qualities depend on luck of all kinds. And it is not only in unusual cases like that of would-be murderers that people are subject to the various types of luck. For example, whether any of our intentions are realized in action or not depends on some factors outside of our control. Thus, if resultant luck undermines our assessments of moral responsibility, as the Control Principle suggests, then many of our everyday judgments ought to be abandoned. Still, applying the Control Principle to resultant luck continues to leave open the possibility that we are correctly assessed for things like our intentions, just not for the results of our intentions. But consideration of the other sorts of luck leads to more and more global skepticism about moral assessment. For example, circumstantial luck affects even our intentions, so it seems that we cannot be assessed in virtue of our intentions. Once again, though, we might still be able to retain the idea that we are morally assessable for something, even if only for what we would have intended in various situations. But reflection on constitutive luck and causal luck can make it seem as though we cannot be properly assessed for anything we do. For if who we are and therefore what we would have done are themselves subject to luck, then according to the Control Principle, we cannot be properly assessed even for those things. What is left as an object of assessment? As Nagel puts it, “[t]he area of genuine agency, and therefore of legitimate moral judgment, seems to shrink under this scrutiny to an extensionless point” (1979, 66.) He goes on,
I believe that in a sense the problem has no solution, because something in the idea of agency is incompatible with actions being events, or people being things. But as the external determinants of what someone has done are gradually exposed, in their effect on consequences, character, and choice itself, it becomes gradually clear that actions are events and people things. Eventually nothing remains which can be ascribed to the responsible self, and we are left with nothing but a portion of the larger sequence of events, which can be deplored or celebrated, but not blamed or praised (1979, 68).
If this is right, then we could not simply revise our everyday moral judgments in accordance with a more diligent application of the Control Principle; at best, if we adhere to the Control Principle, we should refrain from making any moral judgments. Not everyone shares this skepticism, and there is naturally a wide variety of responses to the challenge of how to reconcile our adherence to the Control Principle with our everyday judgments that commit us to the existence of moral luck. At stake are not only our seemingly ubiquitous practices of moral praise and blame, but also the resolution of other central debates in ethics, philosophy of law, and political philosophy.
2. Implications for Other Debates
Before turning to proposed solutions to the problem, it will be helpful to see just what rests on resolving the problem of moral luck.
2.1 Legal Responsibility and Punishment
Whether or not we accept, reject, or qualify the Control Principle has implications for the law, and for punishment in particular. The question of how resultant luck should affect punishment has been debated at least since Plato (The Laws IX, 876–877). According to the Control Principle, if results are not in our control, then our attributions of moral responsibility and blameworthiness should not be affected by them. And if, in addition, justified punishment tracks moral blameworthiness, then the degree of punishment allotted for crimes should not be based even in part on results. H.L.A. Hart puts this conclusion in the form of a rhetorical question: “Why should the accidental fact that an intended harmful outcome has not occurred be a ground for punishing less a criminal who may be equally dangerous and equally wicked?” (1968, 129). It turns out, however, that the idea that results should not be taken into account in determining punishment is in direct tension with a variety of criminal laws, including, for example, the differential punishment accorded attempted murder and murder in the United States. It is also in direct tension with parts of the tort law in the United States such as the differential treatment accorded the merely negligent person and the negligent person whose negligence leads to harm. Interestingly, however, the Model Penal Code takes a different approach for at least some offenses, prescribing the same punishment for attempts and completed crimes. (Model Penal Code, §2.05, cmt. at 293–95; Official Draft and Revised Comments 1985). And this approach is favored by a number of legal theorists.
Now the line of reasoning sketched above that rejects any tracking of results in punishment depends not only on the Control Principle (or a modified version of it), but also on a thesis that limits justified punishment to the proper objects of moral blameworthiness or, alternatively, articulates a parallel to the Control Principle for legal culpability. Both of these premises can, and have been, questioned. But the debate in legal theory about whether results should make a difference to punishment very often centers on the premise about control, and thus, the status of the Control Principle has important implications for the legal debates concerning differential punishment for attempts and completed crimes. (On this debate, see, for example, Alexander, Ferzan, & Morse 2009, Davis 1986, Feinberg 1995, Herman 1995, Kadish 1994, Lewis 1989, Moore 1997 and 2009, Ripstein 1999, and Yaffe 2011. On luck and tort law, see Waldron 1995, and for a wide-ranging discussion of moral luck and the law, Enoch 2010.)
It is also important to note that the implications of the status of the Control Principle for the law are not limited to results. For example, if we accept the Control Principle in unqualified form, and accept the premise constraining justified punishment to that for which people are morally blameworthy, then it might turn out that no one is morally blameworthy and so no punishment is ever justified.
2.2 Distributive and Social Justice
Whether or not the Control Principle is true either in its general or in some restricted form also has implications for the debate over distributive and social justice. In particular, questions about moral luck have played a key role in discussions of egalitarianism, broadly understood as the idea that a just society is one in which people are treated equally in some way. On one kind of such a view, there should be equality in distribution of goods, or, in other words, a distribution of relevant goods that is more equal over a relevant population is more just than one that is less equal. Inspired by the work of John Rawls, some egalitarians have invoked the idea that our constitution and circumstances are out of our control in the justification of their view. For example, Rawls writes that
The existing distribution of income and wealth, say, is the cumulative effect of prior distributions of natural assets—that is, natural talents and abilities—as these have been developed or left unrealized, and their use favored or disfavored over time by social circumstances and such chance contingencies as accident and good fortune. Intuitively, the most obvious injustice of the system of natural liberty is that it permits distributive shares to be improperly influenced by these factors so arbitrary from a moral point of view. (Rawls 1971, p. 72.)
Egalitarians who treat luck in this way are sometimes called “luck egalitarians.” (For an overview, see Lippert-Rasmussen 2023, and for examples of various versions of luck egalitarianism, see Arneson 1997, 2001, Cohen 1989, Dworkin 1981 and 2000, Knight 2021 Roemer 1996; for criticisms see Nozick 1974, Anderson 1999 and 2010, Hurley 2001, and Scheffler 2003.) It is often difficult to see exactly how the appeal to constitutive luck is meant to function in various arguments for egalitarianism. There are two very general ways the reasoning might go: a “positive” and a “negative” way (Nozick 1974). According to one positive line of reasoning, it is first observed that one’s natural talents, circumstances of birth, and so on are things that are beyond one’s control, and at the same time, if a natural “free market” system operates, these circumstances give rise to many advantages and disadvantages relative to others. By the Control Principle, one is not responsible for these advantages and disadvantages. Further, it is wrong for people to have advantages and disadvantages for which they are not responsible. Therefore, justice requires a more egalitarian redistribution of goods to rectify this wrong. Although this line of reasoning has received much criticism, it is arguable that a weaker, and so less vulnerable “negative” line of reasoning is really behind much of luck egalitarianism (see, for example, Arneson 2001).
The “negative” luck argument for egalitarianism is really a rebuttal to the objection that people should not be deprived in the name of egalitarianism of what they have earned. The argument goes like this: Take as a starting point a presumption in favor of equality of condition. Next observe, as before, that one’s natural talents, circumstances of birth, and so on are things beyond one’s control, and, again, that these factors often give rise to advantages and disadvantages relative to others. Therefore, by the Control Principle, one is not responsible for many advantages and disadvantages. If one is not responsible for these, then one is not deserving of them. And if one is not deserving of them, then it is not wrong to redistribute goods in a more egalitarian way that eliminates many advantages and disadvantages.
The explicit appeal to the Control Principle in both of these lines of reasoning shows ways in which the plausibility of Luck Egalitarianism depends on the resolution of the problem of moral luck. It is also notable that some luck egalitarians attempt to draw a line between certain sorts of luck; for example, it is sometimes argued that if one suffers a great financial setback due to one’s choice to engage in high-stakes gambling, then there might be circumstances in which it would be wrong to seek to treat one in the same way as another whose equal suffering was brought on by, say, a devastating earthquake. It might be that underlying this move is acceptance of a restricted version of the Control Principle; for example, one that allows that one can be responsible for one’s choices and their expected consequences, but not for the results of one’s choices that are in large part beyond one’s control. Here, too, it is clear that how one resolves the problem of moral luck—whether one rejects the possibility of moral luck altogether, accepts it in all forms, or accepts certain kinds and not others—has implications for the ultimate success of Luck Egalitarianism. Thus, much is at stake in the resolution of the problem of moral luck. Before turning to suggested solutions, a brief bit of ground-clearing will be necessary.
2.3 The Free Will Debate
Causal luck poses a problem that simply is the problem of free will, according to Nagel. The truth of determinism, or the thesis that all events, including human actions, are the inevitable result of past events in accordance with the laws of nature, has been thought by many to be incompatible with the existence of free agency, precisely because determinism undermines control. Some theorists, namely, compatibilists, have responded by finding ways to reconcile freedom and determinism, while others, namely, incompatibilists, have embraced the apparent inconsistency. As we will see in section 4, some compatibilists have directly taken on the problem of luck in the causal antecedents of one’s actions by proposing accounts of free agency consistent with causal luck. It might seem at first that this is a problem only for compatibilists, but there is also a problem for incompatibilists. (See, for example, Pereboom 2002, 41–54, Watson 1982, 9). For even if the thesis of determinism is false and there are only probabilistic laws of nature, or no universal laws at all, then it might seem that we are then left with a kind of randomness rather than control. Incompatibilists divide in the way that they address the issue, and we will see that some try to hold on to the moral luck skepticism which originally motivated many, while others join compatibilists in seeking ways to avoid or at least soften the tension between causal luck and free agency. In these ways, extant accounts of free agency already populate some of the spaces in the moral luck debate. But it is also the case that the debate about moral luck, especially when focused on moral outcome luck, can offer potential resources that have not yet been taken up in significant ways in the free will literature. If there are compelling arguments in favor of outcome luck, for example, then these might be a resource for compatibilists and incompatibilists who are engaged in making causal luck more appealing.
3. Responding to the Problem: Moral Luck Skepticism
Given the conflict between the Control Principle and apparent instances of moral luck, one can resolve the problem by either denying the existence of moral luck, despite appearances, or accept it. But things are somewhat more complicated than this. Some who respond to the problem of moral luck take a single approach to all kinds of luck, either denying the existence of all kinds or accepting all kinds. But many take a mixed approach; that is, they embrace one approach for one kind of luck and another approach for another kind of luck, or address only a certain type(s) of luck, while remaining silent about the other types. Is taking a mixed approach legitimate? After all, it seems that if the Control Principle is true, then there is no moral luck, and if it is false, then there can be any type of moral luck. It is possible at least in theory to offer a principled reason for qualifying the Control Principle so that it applies only to certain sorts of factors and not others. At the same time, as we will see, providing just such a principled way of distinguishing certain kinds of luck from others turns out to be a formidable task. We begin here with those who reject at least some kinds of moral luck.
Most of those who deny that one or more types of moral luck exist are those who seek to preserve the centrality of morality in our lives. One of their main tasks is to explain away the appearance of moral luck (see 3.1). A second main task is to paint a plausible and coherent picture of morality that avoids luck (see 3.2). A third kind of resource is to offer additional arguments for the rejection of moral luck (see 3.3). In 3.4, we turn to a radically different skeptical approach, suggested by Williams in the “Postscript” to his “Moral Luck” (1993), according to which the Control Principle is preserved, but at the cost of seeing morality as less central to our lives than we might have initially thought.
3.1 Explaining Away the Appearance of Moral Luck
An important tool for those who wish to explain away the appearance of moral luck is what Latus (2000) calls the “epistemic argument” (see Richards, Rescher, Rosebury, and Thomson). To see how it goes, let us begin by focusing on resultant luck. Why do we feel differently about the successful and unsuccessful murderers? Because, according to the epistemic argument, we rarely know exactly what a person’s intentions are or the strength of her commitment to a course of action. One (admittedly fallible) indicator is whether she succeeds or not. In particular, if someone succeeds, that is some evidence that the person was seriously committed to carrying out a fully formed plan. The same evidence is not usually available when the plan is not carried out. Thus, rather than indicating our commitment to cases of resultant moral luck, our differential treatment of successful and unsuccessful murderers indicates our different epistemic situations with respect to each. If we were in the unrealistic situation of knowing that both agents had exactly the same intentions, the same strength of commitment to their plans, and so on, then we would no longer be inclined to treat them differently.
The epistemic argument has been extended to circumstantial luck. Consider again the Nazi sympathizer, and a counterpart who moved in 1929 to Argentina on business. The counterpart has exactly the same dispositions as the Nazi sympathizer, but lives a quiet and harmless life in Argentina. According to this line of reasoning, while it is true that the counterpart is not responsible for the same deeds as the Nazi sympathizer, he should be judged precisely for what he would have done. Richards argues that we do judge people for what they would have done, but that what they do is often our strongest evidence for what they would have done. As a result, given our limited knowledge, we might not be entitled to treat the counterpart in the same way as the Nazi sympathizer, even though they are equally morally deserving of such treatment (Richards 1986, 174 ff.). Thus, circumstantial luck, like resultant luck, affects the basis available to us when we judge agents, but does not affect what those agents deserve.
It is hard to see how the argument can be extended further to cover constitutive or causal luck. But even if the epistemic argument is limited in this way, it can still be part of a good overall strategy of responding to the problem of moral luck insofar as it is possible to take a mix-and-match approach to different kinds of luck.
A second strategy for explaining away the appearance of moral luck is most naturally applied to resultant luck. Those who adopt this strategy argue that it is understandable or even appropriate to feel differently about the driver who kills a child than about the one who does not. What is not appropriate is to offer different moral assessments of their behavior (e.g., Rosebury, Richards, Wolf, Thomson).
Williams elucidates a notion of “agent-regret,” a sentiment whose “constitutive thought” is a subject’s first-person thought that it would have been much better had she done otherwise. Agent regret also requires a certain sort of expression that is different from that of what we might call “bystander regret.” For example, it might include the willingness to compensate a person who was harmed by one’s actions. In the case of a lorry driver who, through no fault of his own, runs over a child, Williams writes, “we feel sorry for the driver, but that sentiment co-exists with, indeed presupposes, that there is something special about his relation to this happening, something which cannot merely be eliminated by the consideration that it was not his fault” (1976 [1993b, 43]).
It is possible to take this thought still further and argue that it is reasonable to expect and perhaps even demand that one who kills the child respond in a different way from the other. For example, Wolf argues that there is a “nameless virtue” which consists in “taking responsibility for one’s actions and their consequences” (2001, 13). It is the virtue of taking responsibility in some sense for the consequences of one’s actions, even if one is not responsible for them. In some ways it is akin to the virtue of generosity in that it “involves a willingness to give more…that justice requires” (14). (See also Richards 1986, 178–79). Appropriate feelings of greater responsibility in the case in which the results are worse can then easily be confused with judgments that commit us to the existence of moral luck. Yet once we distinguish these legitimate feelings from moral judgments, we can and should eliminate the judgments that entail a commitment to moral luck. Again, this strategy is most naturally applied to resultant luck.
Critics of this strategy have objected to it on a variety of grounds. For example, it has been argued that once we acknowledge the appropriateness of greater self-blame in cases of greater harm, no good reason for denying moral luck remains, and indeed we have good reason for accepting it. (See Moore 2009, 31 ff.) It has also been argued that Wolf’s description of our phenomenology is at best incomplete: it is not merely that we wish people to blame themselves more when they cause greater harm, but that we judge them to be more blameworthy. Our judgments of greater responsibility also require explaining away. (See Domsky 2004).
A variant of this strategy employs the idea that one can justify differential treatment of, say, the negligent driver who hits a child and one who does not, even if both are equally morally blameworthy. For example, Henning Jensen (1984) argues that while both are equally culpable, there are consequentialist reasons for not subjecting the first negligent driver to the same degree of blame behavior. Since we all take some risks, and some are less likely to lead to harm than others, to blame everyone for simply taking such risks would require such a high standard of care as to risk destroying our ability to function as moral agents. On the other hand, requiring punishment for or compensation from those who do cause harm is required to provide a “restorative value” for those agents and preserve their integrity.
A third strategy is to point out that we mistakenly infer moral luck from legal luck. While there might be good reasons for the law to treat people differently even if what they do depends on factors beyond their control, we (understandably) make the mistaken inference that the law directly reflects correct moral assessment in such cases. For example, there are a number of reasons why the law might justifiably punish successful crimes more severely than merely attempted ones, including the balancing of deterrence and privacy (Rosebury 521–24, Lewis (1989)). If reasons like this provide the justification for the differential treatment of such cases in the law, then it would indeed be wrong to infer that the successful and unsuccessful murderers are deserving of different moral assessments. However, the fact that we do make such a mistaken inference explains why we often commit ourselves to the existence of moral luck, when reflection can show that doing so is a mistake.
Finally, a resource can be found in a surge of experimental psychological results that suggest that there might be less to explain away than might be thought initially, and, at the same time, identifies factors other than judgments of outcome moral luck that might explain the attributions of blameworthiness that have been taken to manifest commitments to moral luck. For example, Cushman and Green (2012) offer an explanation of apparently conflicting intuitions about moral results luck in terms of two dissociable processes, and Björnsson and Persson (2012) offer an explanation in terms of shifting explanatory perspectives. In an interesting set of studies, building on earlier work in the area, Kneer and Machery (2019) and (2023) found that when participants were asked for comparative judgments about pairs of scenarios, varying only in outcome, they tended to offer anti-moral luck responses, judging agents in both scenarios equally blameworthy. In contrast, in related studies in which each participant only saw one scenario without a comparison, participants’ judgments of degrees of blameworthiness varied by scenario, with the more harmful outcome scenarios receiving judgments of higher degrees of blame. However, Kneer and Machinery found that the differences in judgments in these cases was nearly entirely mediated by a disproportionate attribution of negligence to the agents in the harmful scenarios, suggesting the possibility that, when presented only with one scenario, participants read backwards from harm to a morally significant attribution of features in the agents. (Interestingly, this appears to provide a kind of support to a variant of the epistemic argument, according to which we fallibly infer states of mind from outcomes.) If this is correct, then it may not be outcome per se that provides the grounds of differential judgments, but, rather, a distinct morally salient feature of agents that is often associated with outcome. Taken together, Kneer and Machery’s studies support the idea that people have anti-results-luck intuitions and lay theories, and that where they appear to have pro-results-luck intuitions, these can be explained as people tracking something only contingently associated with outcome rather than outcome itself. Importantly, even if we were confident in our possession of psychological explanations of our intuitions, there would still be philosophical work to do to sort out what the normative facts are. At the same time, given that intuitions form part of arguments from reflective equilibrium for various position, making sure that thought experiments isolate the relevant variables without confounds is essential. And an impressive set of such studies suggest that at least some intuitions that have been categorized as pro-moral luck intuitions might in fact represent the result of heuristic but fallible inferences from differential outcomes to differential features of agents’ mental states, where the latter are uncontroversially relevant to blameworthiness.
3.2 A Positive Picture Without Moral Luck
In addition to explaining how there can be an appearance of moral luck, despite the fact that there is not any, some of those who wish to deny the existence of moral luck take on the task of offering a coherent and plausible picture of morality that avoids luck.
Some of those engaged in the free will debate have denied the existence of causal, and perhaps also of constitutive, moral luck by offering a distinctive metaphysical account of human agency. (See, for example, Chisholm, Taylor, Clarke, and O’Connor. See also Pereboom who argues that such an account is coherent, but not true.) The view is known as “Agent-Causal Libertarianism,” and the basic idea is that agents themselves cause actions or at least the formation of intentions, without their being caused to do so. Thus, the agent herself, exercising her causal powers, is an undetermined cause of her intentions. On some agent causal views, only the agent, as opposed to events caused by other events is the cause of the intention (e.g., O’Connor), while on another view, the agent acts in tandem with events that probabilistically cause the action (Clarke 1993). Particularly on the first sort of view, we seem to avoid the conclusion that our actions must depend on causal factors that are beyond our control. At the same time, it is not clear exactly how the move to agent causation is supposed to restore the kind of control we seek. For we might ask why we should consider the agent cause in control of her actions, while we can imagine that other substance causes (e.g., tables or billiard balls) would not be in control of what they cause. It might be stipulated that the exercise of the particular causal power to cause intentions simply is an exercise of control, but we need further details to see that the challenge has not been stipulated away. (See Clarke 2005 and Mele 2006 for recent discussions of agent causation and luck.) It is also important to note that Agent-Causal views are consistent with actions and even intentions depending in part on factors beyond one’s control, such as the reasons people have available at the time of decision or action.
In a very different way, as we have seen, it is possible to take on a part of the task of describing a coherent picture of luck-free morality by identifying an object of moral assessment in the case of circumstantial luck. For example, Richards suggests that people should be assessed for what they would have done in different circumstances. More fundamentally, relying on the appeal to counterfactuals, the view is that people should be assessed for their characters, of which their actions in different circumstances are manifestations.
Zimmerman begins where Richards leaves off, proposing to pursue “the implications of the denial of the relevance of luck to moral responsibility” to their “logical conclusion” (2002, 559). With the possible exception of some kinds of constitutive luck, Zimmerman rejects the possibility of moral luck of all four kinds while proposing a coherent picture of moral assessment. He rejects the possibility of resultant luck by first acknowledging that a man who (by luck) succeeds in his plan to cause harm is responsible for more things than one who (by luck) fails to carry out an identical plan. But, according to Zimmerman, we must distinguish between scope and degree of responsibility, where scope captures what one is responsible for and degree captures how responsible or blameworthy one is. Though one of the two men is responsible for more, both men are responsible to the same degree, and it is this latter kind of moral assessment to which the Control Principle ought to apply. When it comes to circumstantial luck, things are more difficult. For when it comes to cases like those of resultant luck in which we want to hold people responsible, we can find something to hold them responsible for, namely, their plans or intentions or attempts. However, when it comes to cases of circumstantial luck, such as the Nazi collaborator and his counterpart, there are no counterpart plans or intentions or attempts that have simply failed to come to fruition. Zimmerman suggests that there is nothing that we hold the counterpart responsible for; in this case, the scope of the agent’s responsibility is 0. But we can and should still hold him responsible to the same degree as the Nazi sympathizer. He is responsible tout court even if he is not responsible for anything (2002, 565). He is responsible in the sense that his moral record is affected for better or worse in virtue of something about him. For there is something in virtue of which he is responsible, namely, his being such that he would have freely performed the very same wrong actions had he been in the same circumstances as the Nazi sympathizer.
This reasoning can be extended still further to cover the case of constitutive and even one kind of causal luck. Suppose that Georg does not kill Henrik, and George does kill Henry. Further suppose that “the reason for Georg’s not killing Henrik was that he was too timid, or that he had a thick skin and Henrik’s insults did not upset him in the way that Henry’s insults upset George, or that he was deaf and simply did not hear the insults that Henrik hurled his way. If it is nonetheless true that Georg would have freely shot and killed Henrik but for some such feature of the case over which he had no control, then, I contend, he is just as responsible, in virtue of this fact, as George is” (2002, 565). Zimmerman acknowledges that there are features of one’s constitution that are essential to who one is, although he denies that timidity, thick-skinnedness, and so on count among them. However, if such features are essential, then it will not be true to say that had Georg lacked them, he would have freely killed Henrik. Since Georg is responsible, on Zimmerman’s view, precisely in virtue of such counterfactuals being true, he would be absolved of responsibility if such features were essential to him. For this reason, Zimmerman concedes that “the role that luck plays in the determination of moral responsibility may not be entirely eliminable…” (2002, 575; see also Rescher (1993) who, though appealing to a different understanding of luck, argues that there is something incoherent about the idea of moral luck when it comes to constitution).
Finally, Zimmerman goes on to claim that his reasoning applies even to cases in which a person’s actions are causally determined. If it is true that, say, Georg would have killed Henrik if his deterministic causal history, over which he has no control, had been different, then Georg is as responsible as he would have been had he killed Henrik in a world that was not determined. The upshot of the application of Zimmerman’s reasoning is that we are all responsible, blameworthy, and even praiseworthy in ways we have never imagined. If Zimmerman is right, there are countless counterfactuals that apply to each and every one of us, in virtue of which we are responsible to one degree or another. The view thus takes the Control Principle extremely seriously, and applies it in the broadest possible way. The price we pay for “taking luck seriously” is that our everyday moral judgments are, if not always mistaken, at the very least radically incomplete.
A number of objections can be raised to Zimmerman’s view, including (i) that at least large classes of the counterfactuals in virtue of which he thinks people are responsible lack truth value (e.g., Adams 1977, Nelkin 2004, Zimmerman 2002, 572, and Zimmerman 2015), and (ii) that he is simply mistaken that one can be responsible without being responsible for anything. A third sort of objection takes the form of a challenge to offer a precise schema of the relevant counterfactuals that can plausibly account for the feature of agents in virtue of which they are responsible to the same degree as others who are blameworthy for wrongful acts (e.g., Hanna (2014)). Perhaps counterfactuals simply cannot do the job being asked of them. Finally, we might note that there is a clash over intuitions. For example, Hanna offers the case of Jenny who “lives in a stable, idyllic, isolated utopian society. Consequently, she hasn’t developed to a sufficient degree all the traits that would dispose her to resist tyranny. Unfortunately, for these reasons…Jenny would collaborate if she were in Nazi-Germany-like conditions.” In line with Nagel’s original suggestion about his cases of the two would-be Nazis, Hanna’s intuition is that Jenny is not as culpable as an actual Nazi collaborator, whereas it seems that Zimmerman, having all the counterfactuals in view for each of the two agents, has the opposite reaction. We return to this point in section 4.2.5.
Even if one or more of the objections to Zimmerman’s argument are ultimately on target, his approach is very helpful in showing what an attempt to follow out the denial of moral luck to its logical conclusion looks like. Unlike Zimmerman, most of those who adopt the denial strategy do so only for certain sorts of moral luck. By treating all sorts of luck in the same way (with the exception of constitutive luck with respect to one’s essential properties), Zimmerman challenges those who adopt this strategy to defend the drawing of the line between resultant and other sorts of luck. As we will see, this very same challenge is also issued by those who take a diametrically opposed position and accept all forms of moral luck.
3.3 Additional Arguments for Moral Luck Skepticism
Finally, one might argue for moral luck skepticism from other angles, and in this section, we canvass three such distinctive arguments, the first two focused on moral outcome luck, and the third on circumstantial and constitutive luck.
An argument that focuses on a different set of cases than the classic test cases for moral luck intuitions offers a new angle on the debate. Carolina Sartorio (2015a and 2015b) and Sarah Bernstein (2017 and 2019) have both presented a number of cases intended to show how the extent of one’s causal contribution to an account can affect one’s degree of responsibility and blameworthiness. For example, compare two cases: in Victim, two assassins shoot a victim who dies, but either shot alone would have killed Victim. In Hardy Victim, two assassins shoot a victim who dies, and both shots were necessary to kill him. (Bernstein, 2017, 165). Bernstein suggests that the greater one’s causal contribution to an outcome, the more responsible one is. (See also Sartorio 2015a and 2015b) But interestingly, whether one’s causal contribution is greater in Victim or Hardy Victim varies depending on the theory of causation (Kaiserman 2017). On a “productive”, or energy transfer theory, we might conclude that the assassins in Victim are more responsible than in Hardy Victim, but on a certain counterfactual theory of causation, we might conclude that they are more responsible in Hardy Victim. Both Bernstein and Sartorio see a kind of moral results luck in cases of this kind. How many other agents are involved, for example, can affect one’s degree of responsibility, on their views, and this seems a matter of luck.
Matt Talbert (2024) takes these and related cases and the analyses that have been proposed, and offers the following novel line of reasoning that concludes in a rejection of outcome moral luck: while a theory of causation might be required to figure out what one is responsible for, it is intuitively implausible that we should need such a theory to figure out how blameworthy each is. To illustrate, coming to find the productive theory more compelling than one once did does not seem to change one’s view of the assassins’ relative degree of blameworthiness, nor does it seem it should. But if that is the case, then it seems that causal contribution to an outcome does not affect one’s degree of blameworthiness. Further, it is plausible that if outcome is a factor at all in one’s degree of blameworthiness, it should figure only insofar as the agent is causally connected to it. So if causal contribution to an outcome is irrelevant, then so is the outcome itself. It is worth emphasizing that this argument leaves untouched claims about what people are responsible for, and this is all the more important in light of a renewed interest in the literature on the relationship between causation and responsibility.
A second kind of argument again begins with a very different category of cases than the classic test cases for moral luck intuitions, and redirects our initial focus from morality to rationality. David Enoch (2019) asks us to consider cases of rational evaluation such as that of the basketball coach who must decide which player should take the final shot of a tied game in the last seconds. We assess the rationality of her choice independently of the outcome, win or lose. The key, according to Enoch, is to evaluate how well the coach played the “hand she was dealt” in light of the probabilities available to her. On Enoch’s view, this provides the basis for a possibility proof for outcome moral luck skepticism, since there is a kind of evaluation that is luck insensitive, namely, assessment of rationality at the moment of choice. To show that such skepticism is not just possible but plausible, he then turns to a kind of functionalist account to support the idea that we have reason to care about such luck insensitive moral evaluations. The idea is that we care about prediction, and that how well one played the cards one was dealt, independently of outcome in that particular case, is a better predictor of future behavior than outcome itself. There are some reasons to resist the functionalist account of our practice of moral evaluation, including the empirical evidence that people often do, whether rationally or not, use past outcome as a basis for prediction. And some have offered functionalist accounts of our responsibility practices that yield different verdicts when it comes to the relevance of outcomes (see Mitchell Berman 2023 for an interesting argument of this kind when it comes to blameworthiness understood as liability to blame). But even without the functionalist account, it is plausible that the parallel to rational evaluation provides support for a stronger thesis than the mere possibility of outcome moral luck skepticism. This is because the parallel is arguably a tight one and the burden would be on an opponent to challenge a claim of symmetry between the rational and moral. Thus, the argument that rests on the parallel to rational assessment can be seen as a promising resource on its own for the defenders of moral outcome luck skepticism.
A third kind of argument focuses on circumstantial and constitutive luck. The starting point is the idea that circumstantial and constitutive moral luck are problematic insofar as they offer some people unfair advantages or disadvantages when it comes to desert of praise or blame, and appeals to the intriguing idea that everyone’s expected desert levels are the same at any given time, so that neither the circumstances or constitution one finds oneself with provide one with an unfair advantage or disadvantage. Philip Swenson (2022) illustrates this with the following case. Alice and Claire both take a walk along a river. Alice comes across a drowning child and rescues him, while Claire never encounters anyone, even though she, too, would (probably) have rescued a child had she seen one. This might seem unfair at first, for the reason that Alice had an opportunity to deserve praise that Claire did not. But Swenson suggests that it is plausible that they had the same expected desert level. Suppose Alice had a 90% chance of completing the rescue and gets 10 “units” of desert of praise; had she not rescued the child, she would have received 90 units of desert of blame, bringing her to an expected desert value of 0. This is exactly what Claire, not having an opportunity for praiseworthy or blameworthy action, has in expected desert value. Thus the expected desert value of the circumstances they find themselves in is identical, and the only thing that makes the difference in their actual desert is Alice’s free exercise of agency in a particular direction. Thus no factor other than her own action determines the difference. When put this way, it can seem like a denial of circumstantial moral luck, and while Swenson describes the view as an “anti-luck” one at various points (see p. 389), he also acknowledges that this might be a matter of terminology, and that fundamentally, it is an “anti-unfairness” account. There is some good reason to treat it in this latter way instead; among other reasons for this is that one might not exercise agency at all in any direction in a situation in which one has the opportunity to do so and nevertheless be blameworthy to a negative degree (see Nelkin and Rickless 2017). In that case, it appears that what distinguishes this person’s negative score from a person who lacked the opportunity altogether is the existence of the opportunity and not an exercise of agency. In this case, it appears to violate the corollary of the Control Principle. But even if this is correct, and whether or not the argument can meet the challenges that might be raised for it, it helpfully prompts consideration of the question of whether the Control Principle rests on more foundational principles such as fairness.
3.4 Denying Moral Luck and Setting Aside Morality in Favor of Ethics
Before turning to the approach of accepting the existence of moral luck, it remains to consider the view ascribed earlier to Williams’ “Postscript” (1993). Extracting Williams’ position on “Moral Luck” is a notoriously difficult task, made easier only by Williams’ own acknowledgment in the “Postscript” that his original article “may have encouraged” some misunderstandings (251). Many commentators have read Williams as advocating the position that moral luck exists and is deeply threatening to morality. There is certainly a line of reasoning in Williams’ original article that suggests this (see 37–42, 51–53). But in the Postscript, Williams makes a distinction between morality and ethics that allows him to deny the existence of moral luck, thus preserving a certain integrity for morality.
Williams understands morality to embody the Kantian conception of it described above, accepting that the essence of the Control Principle is “built into” morality so understood (1993, 252). At the same time, contra Enoch (2019), he recognizes examples such as a fictionalized version of an artist who leaves his family to pursue his art as illustrating that one can be rationally justified in one’s decision in virtue of its outcome. Further, he argues that such cases show that our overall value judgment of someone’s decision can depend on factors beyond the control of the agent. We must conclude, then, that there is a broad kind of value that competes with, if not trumps, moral value, namely ethical value. And if that is right, then we must give up “the point of morality” so understood, namely, to “provide a shelter against luck, one realm of value (indeed, of supreme value) that is defended against contingency” (1993, 251, emphasis mine). It seems that morality can only insulate itself from luck at the expense of foregoing supreme value. Once we acknowledge this cost, we can keep morality intact (although skeptical doubts about its ability to resist luck can still be raised), but we have lost our reason to care about it. Instead, Williams suggests, we should care about ethics, where ethics is understood to address the most general question of how we ought to live.
Questions can be raised about this line of reasoning. For example, we can ask whether there is any sense in which Williams’ artist is justified in his decisions. If there is not, then Williams has not shown that morality competes with, or is trumped by, some other value. From the other direction, we can ask whether Williams is right that morality loses its point if it is not the supreme source of value. Of course, even if Williams’ reasoning is unsound, the conclusion could still be correct, and others have offered different routes to it.
The idea that we ought to care about ethics, understood as Williams does, finds inspiration in the work of Aristotle. Aristotle is concerned with the nature of the good life in the broadest sense—in what he calls “eudaimonia,” often translated as “happiness”. Aristotle defends the idea that happiness consists in being a virtuous person over a complete life, and, in turn, the idea that being a virtuous person requires not only that one have virtuous qualities and dispositions, but also that one act on them. Luck enters into the account in at least two ways. First, on Aristotle’s account, one becomes a virtuous person by undergoing the right kind of upbringing and training. Since whether one receives this training is at least to some extent beyond one’s control, one’s ability to live a virtuous life is deeply dependent on luck. Second, the fact that being a virtuous person requires the performance of certain kinds of activities means that the world must cooperate in various ways in order for one to be truly virtuous, and so be truly happy. Aristotle writes that happiness “needs the external goods as well; for it is impossible, or not easy, to do noble acts without proper equipment” (1984 NE 1099a 31–33). For example, in order to engage in acts of generosity, one must have resources at one’s disposal to share. And since having the right equipment is at least to some extent a matter of circumstantial luck, the value of one’s life itself will depend in part on what is not in one’s control. On one interpretation of Aristotle, luck enters into the account in yet a third way. Acting in accordance with virtue does not suffice for happiness, on this interpretation, although it is the “dominant component” of Aristotle’s account of happiness (Irwin 1988, 445). According to this view, one must also have a minimum provision of external goods (e.g., health, security, access to resources) whose contribution to happiness is independent of their making virtuous activity possible. If this is right, then the value of one’s life will depend at least in part on factors beyond one’s control. In sum, while there is some dispute about whether Aristotle thought more than a life of virtuous activity is required for happiness, it is clear that luck plays a significant role in determining both whether people are truly virtuous and whether people’s lives are good in the broadest sense. Hence, “the fragility of goodness” (See Martha Nussbaum 1986).
4. Responding to the Problem: Acceptance of Moral Luck
All of those who accept the existence of some type of moral luck reject the Control Principle and the Kantian conception of morality that embraces it. As a result, they must either explain how we can revise our moral judgments and practices in a coherent way or show that we are not committed to the Control Principle in the first place. Some of the arguments, which we have already encountered, consist in rebuttals to the arguments for skepticism.
4.1 Accepting Moral Luck and Radically Revising our Practices
Some who accept moral luck argue that doing so requires a significant change in our moral practices. Brynmore Browne (1992), for example, suggests that if the Control Principle is false, we ought not to respond to an agent’s wrongdoing with anger and blame that is “against” him, but rather with anger that does not include hostility or the desire to punish. Nevertheless, we can still respond to the successful murderer with more of the “right” kind of anger than we feel toward the unsuccessful one. One question that might be raised here is whether we are left with enough of our ordinary conception of morality to include genuine notions of blame and responsibility. Though not focused primarily on moral luck, Gary Watson (2004) also suggested that attention to the idea that in similar circumstances to culpable wrongdoers, we, too, might have acted similarly, provokes the thought that “there but for the grace of God go I” (or a secular version which shares the idea that our moral status is fragile and might lead us to feel less in the way of blaming attitudes).
4.2 Accepting Moral Luck Without (As Much) Revision
Others suggest that the Control Principle does not have nearly the hold on us that Nagel and Williams assume, and that rejecting it would not change our practices in a significant way.
4.2.1 Working From the Opposite Direction: From Moral Luck Intuitions to Rejection of the Control Principle
One strategy for rejecting the Control Principle turns Nagel’s argument on its head by taking as a starting point ordinary judgments and reactions that reveal our implicit rejection of the Control Principle. Robert Adams (1985) adopts this strategy, drawing our attention to common practices, such as blaming people for their racist attitudes even if we do not think that such people are in control of their attitudes. Since Adams focuses primarily on agents’ states of mind that have intentional objects such as anger and self-righteousness, it is possible to see him as accepting the existence of constitutive moral luck in particular. But it is also possible to adopt the same sort of strategy for other sorts of luck, including resultant luck. Michael Moore (1997 and 2009), for example, points to the fact that we resent those who succeed in causing harm more than those who do not, we feel greater guilt when we ourselves cause harm, and when we face decisions, we feel that the consequences of matter to the moral quality of our choices. According to Moore, the best explanation of these reactive attitudes, such as guilt and resentment, is that their objects are genuinely more blameworthy.
Now opponents who deny the existence of moral luck have ways of explaining away these phenomena. As we have seen, recent experimental work has suggested systematic explanations that preserve the idea that folk theories are anti-moral luck, at least when it comes to moral outcome luck. When it comes to cases of constitutive luck, like the case of the racist, they can say that we confuse agents’ blameworthiness for their character and attitudes with blameworthiness for their actions that manifest these offending attitudes and for their failure to take steps to eliminate them. On reflection, we can see that we ought to blame the racists only for their actions or omissions, not for the attitudes themselves over which they have no control. Another response is to appeal to the distinction between judgments of blameworthiness and “aretaic” judgments (or judgments of virtue and vice). (See, for example, Watson 1996 for elaboration of this distinction). We can appropriately judge people vicious or otherwise bad, even as we withhold judgments of accountability and culpability. Further, those accepting resultant moral luck face a challenge of articulating a positive theory of how exactly results affect one’s moral status while at the same time accounting for our intuitions. Sverdlik (1988) argues that it is not obvious how such a challenge can be met, and, as we saw in section 3, there are many open questions about the relationship between responsibility and causation of outcomes (see Sartorio, Bernstein and Kaiserman for examples).
For these reasons, it is no surprise that those who accept moral luck tend not to rely exclusively on ordinary judgments to make their case, but rather go on to try to undermine the Control Principle in other ways.
4.2.2 The Control Principle and Idealized Moral Agents
One strategy is to argue that moral luck is only a problem for an overly idealized conception of human agency. But once we adopt a realistic conception of human agency, the problem evaporates. Margaret Urban Walker (1991) argues in this vein that moral luck is only problematic for a conception of moral agents as “noumenal” or pure (238). In contrast, adopting a conception of morality that applies to human beings in all of their impurity will not be threatened by moral luck. According to Walker, the Control Principle is far from obvious, and we would not want to live in a world in which it held sway. The argument appears to rest on the idea that without moral luck, we would lack several virtues that allow us to help each other in most essential ways. Our very reactions to moral luck can be virtuous. For example, by accepting that our “responsibilities outrun control,” we are able to display the virtue of dependability by accepting that we will be there for our friends, even if their needs are not in our control. In contrast, pure agents who are only responsible for what they control “may not be depended on, much less morally required, to assume a share of the ongoing and massive human work of caring, healing, restoring, and cleaning-up on which each separate life and the collective one depend” (247). (See also Wolf (2001).) Thus, if we focus on our actual moral commitments, we will see that the Control Principle is neither attractive nor necessary for morality.
It is not obvious that a world in which people denied the existence of moral luck would be as bleak as the one Walker envisions. Moral luck skeptics have material with which to question Walker’s claim. For example, those who deny resultant moral luck can still agree that agents have an obligation to minimize their risks of doing harm, and those who deny circumstantial moral luck can still agree that agents have an obligation to cultivate qualities that prepare them to act well in whatever circumstances arise.
4.2.3 Alternatives to the Control Principle
Another way of trying to undermine the appeal of the Control Principle itself is to show how it might be mistaken for something else that is more plausible. For example, Adams (1985) recognizes that there are limits to what we can be responsible for, and writes that the states of mind “for which we are directly responsible are those in which we are responding, consciously or unconsciously, to data that are rich enough to permit a fairly adequate ethical appreciation of the state’s intentional object and of the object’s place in the fabric of personal relationships” (26). Thus, according to Adams’ conception of morality, adherents of the Control Principle are correct in an important respect, namely, in their understanding that what one is responsible for springs in the right way from oneself. But this requirement is more general than a strict requirement of control, and although easily confused with the Control Principle, is superior to it, on this view.
Adopting the same general strategy, Moore (1997) identifies still other principles with which the Control Principle might be confused. He points out that when we use the word “luck” in the context of moral assessment, we tend not to mean that the person lacked control over what he did, but rather that what happened was far off of “some moral baseline of the normal” (213). For example, consider two would-be murderers, one of whom fires his gun and hits his target, and the other of whom fires in the same way, from the same distance, and so on, but whose bullet is deflected by an unexpected and unusually strong wind. Moore suggests that the first gunman is not “lucky” in the ordinary sense, even though it is true that whether a hurricane-force wind arose or not was not in his control. According to Moore, there is something intuitively right about morality being immune to luck, but only if we understand “luck” in the sense of “freakishness.” Further, the successful murderer is “in control” of his action in the normal sense of the word “control,” even though he doesn’t control the wind. Thus, while we do care about luck and control in making both moral and legal assessments, they aren’t Nagel’s concepts, on this view. Thus, according to Moore, there is no contradiction in our everyday commitments.
Now those who think we are naturally drawn to the Control Principle can respond by pointing out both the intuitive plausibility of the principle in the abstract and the cases described earlier that seem to support it. They might also accept that Adams and Moore have pointed out further necessary conditions for responsibility, while still maintaining that the Control Principle is true. Again, differing intuitions about cases and about the Control Principle have the potential to make a big difference to one’s view at this point.
Michael Otsuka offers yet another principle in place of the Control Principle: One is only blameworthy in cases in which one had the kind of control that would have allowed one to be entirely blameless. Consistent with this is a kind of moral luck, however: one’s blameworthiness can vary in degree as a function of harm done, where harm done may be affected by what is not in one’s control. Although one cannot be blameworthy if one lacked the control necessary to avoid blameworthiness, one’s degree of blameworthiness can increase if the risk one takes comes out badly due to circumstances one could do nothing to avoid. For example, in the case of the two assassins, both are blameworthy, but, Otsuka argues, the one who hits and kills his target is more blameworthy. In sketching the view, Otsuka draws a parallel with Dworkin’s (1981) treatment of option luck in the debate over egalitarianism. In that debate, a distinction is drawn between option luck (“a matter of ...whether someone gains or loses through accepting an isolated risk he or she should have anticipated and might have declined”) and brute luck (“a matter of how risks fall out that are not in that sense...gambles).” If one’s luck is just brute-one did not assume a risk, as when one has done everything a careful driver would do, and due to sheer luck, a dog runs into the street and one drives over it-one is not blameworthy. But if one assumes a risk by knowingly and freely driving recklessly, and, as a result, one kills a dog, then one is blameworthy. And, further, one might be more blameworthy in the case in which one kills the dog than in the case in which one takes the same risk but luckily reaches home without hitting anything. It would be reasonable, on Otsuka’s view, for the dog owner whose dog is killed to be more resentful than the one whose dog escapes, and this supports the conclusion that the driver who kills the dog is more blameworthy than the one who does not.
The parallel to option and brute luck is suggestive, but a defender of the unqualified Control principle has resources here. Appealing to the distinction between scope and degree, one might grant that the reckless driver is, importantly, responsible for more things (including a death), but not more blameworthy. In fact, the parallel to the treatment of option luck in the debate about distributive justice may fit best if we are interested in what we are responsible for, rather than how responsible we are. Further, we have seen reason to think that on reflection we should not blame one reckless driver more than another. One might question Otsuka’s premise that degree of blameworthiness is to be understood in terms of appropriate degree of attitudes such as resentment (or even the weaker premise that the degree of blameworthiness tracks the appropriate degree of such attitudes). But even if we accept this premise, we might conclude that while it is understandable that one dog owner would be more resentful than the first, more resentment is not actually justified. This observation takes us back to the subtle nature of the dialectic.
4.2.4 Free Will and Causal, Constitutive and Circumstantial Luck
A large group who accept moral luck are focused on what Nagel identifies as a narrower issue than moral luck writ large, namely, that of free will. One traditional problem of free will is posed by the following line of reasoning: if determinism is true, then no one can act freely, and, assuming that freedom is necessary for responsibility, no one can be responsible for their actions. Compatibilists have argued that we can act freely and responsibly even if determinism is true. Since most do not adopt Zimmerman’s radical account of moral assessment in which one can be responsible despite not being responsible for anything, they admit the existence of causal moral luck. If, as some have argued, causal luck is exhausted by constitutive and circumstantial luck, then they also accept that there can be these sorts of moral luck, as well.
A basic compatibilist strategy is to argue that agents can have control over their actions in the sense required for freedom and/or responsibility even if they do not control the causal determinants of those actions. For example, if one acts with the ability to act well in accordance with good reasons or acts with reasons-responsiveness (e.g., Brink 2021, Fischer and Ravizza 1998, Nelkin 2011, Vargas 2013, Wolf 1990), one can be responsible for one’s actions. The key move here is to distinguish between different kinds of factors over which one has no control. If one’s actions are caused by factors that one does not control and that prevent one from having or exercising certain capacities, then one is not responsible. However, if one’s actions are caused by factors that one does not control, but that do allow one to have and exercise the relevant capacities, then one can be “in control” of one’s actions in the relevant sense, and so responsible for one’s actions.
Interestingly, compatibilists are often silent on the question of resultant and circumstantial moral luck, although these forms of luck might represent an underutilized resource for them. For if it turns out that the luck—or lack of control—delivered by determinism is but one source of luck among others, then determinism does not embody a unique obstacle to free will and responsibility, at least when it comes to control. Assimilating the challenge from causal luck to challenges from results and circumstantial luck can be used to support the idea that compatibilists are not alone.
Further, within the free will debate, compatibilists are not alone in accepting the existence of certain types of luck. Many libertarians assume that our actions are caused by prior events (not themselves in our control) in accordance with probabilistic laws of nature (see, for example, Kane 1996, 1999, Nozick 1981). Given this view, it is natural to conclude that if determinism is false, there is at least one kind of luck in what sort of person one decides to be and so in what actions one performs. That is, there is luck in the sense that there is no explanation as to why a person chose to be one way rather than another, given that even holding fixed everything about the person up until the moment of choice, it could have gone either way. At the same time, Kane, for example, denies that there must be luck in the sense that one’s choices are flukes or accidents if determinism is false. In Kane’s view, what is important is to be free from luck of the second kind, or “fluke” luck. For even if one’s action is not determined, it can still be the case that the causes of one’s action are one’s own efforts and intention. And if one’s action is caused by one’s own efforts and intentions, then one’s action is not lucky in the sense of being a fluke or accident. But while this shows that one’s actions can be free of luck of an important kind, it still leaves unaddressed luck of a third kind, namely the kind at issue in the moral luck debate: the dependence of agents’ choices on factors beyond their control. And it appears that on the libertarian view in question, our choices are indeed subject to luck of this sort. (See Pereboom 2002 and 2014 for a discussion of the similar burdens shared by compatibilists and this sort of libertarian.) Only the agent-causal libertarians discussed above offer an account that aims specifically at eliminating a type of moral luck. (See Levy 2011 for an argument that no account of free will can avoid challenges concerning luck.
Although most theorists who accept moral luck as an implication of their views on free will do not explicitly weigh in on resultant moral luck, it is open to them to either draw a line, advocating skepticism about resultant luck despite embracing other types, or to suggest that no line be drawn at all.
4.2.5 Arguing Against a Principled Place to Draw a Line
And in fact there is a final argument in favor of the acceptance of all kinds of moral luck of a very different kind that might ultimately help decide the issue in one direction or the other. It explicitly encompasses every kind of luck and thus poses a deep and difficult challenge to moral luck skeptics, particularly the large group who focus exclusively on resultant luck. The main idea is that rejecting resultant luck, but not other sorts of luck, is an unstable position (e.g., Moore 1997 and Hartman 2017). In a nutshell, one cannot find a principled place to draw the line at refusing to accept moral luck. In effect, this argument is Nagel’s argument in reverse. Begin by observing that we lack control over everything: the results of our actions, our circumstances, our constitution, and our causal history. If we are to avoid moral skepticism, then we must accept moral luck in some areas, and if we do that, then we ought to accept it in the area of results. Particularly if we accept that we are not predisposed to accept the Control Principle in the first place, then we ought to accept luck in all areas, thereby avoiding moral skepticism.
Hartman (2017) offers a version of this strategy that is explicitly analogical (pp. 105–07). Consider three agents who all form the intention and plan to carry out a murder. Each has a single opportunity to pull the trigger of a gun. Sneezy sneezes and so is unable to pull the trigger; Off-Target pulls the trigger, but the bullet is intercepted by a bird, and Bulls-Eye pulls the trigger and hits her target. By hypothesis, there is circumstantial luck, so, claims Hartman, Sneezy is less blameworthy than Off-Target, even though she would have pulled the trigger had her allergies not acted up. But given the parallels between Sneezy and Off-Target (same intentions, plans, and so on) are similar to the parallels between Off-Target and Bulls-Eye, we have analogical evidence that Off-Target is less blameworthy than Bulls-Eye.
There are a variety of possible replies, such as that offered by Rivera-López (2016), which claims that there is a principled difference resting on the need to make moral attributions at all. We should accept moral luck where it is necessary for making the practice of attributing responsibility possible, but given that it is necessary in the case of circumstantial luck and not in the case of results luck, we can draw a principled line between the two pairs of cases. Hartman takes it that what is really needed here is that we ought to accept moral luck only if it is needed for our practices of attribution, but he also suggests that this begs the question in the context at least without further defense. Another reply is that accepting circumstantial luck does not require accepting that it makes a difference everywhere, and that indeed Sneezy and Off-Target are themselves equally blameworthy. While some pairs of cases, such as Nagel’s would-be Nazis or Hanna’s cases of Jenny and her counterpart are intuitively plausible instances of circumstantial moral luck, Sneezy and Off-Target or not. Without either an intuitively plausible pair of cases with differential blameworthiness or a convincing independent argument that the two cases differ in degree of blameworthiness, the analogical argument does not get off the ground with this set of cases. And yet if we turn to cases such as the two would-be Nazis, where the intuition of differential degrees of blameworthiness is indeed stronger, the analogy between Off-Target and Bullseye becomes much weaker (See Nelkin 2019, and Nyman 2022 who argues that the analogy is not strong enough even with the original cases).
Whether or not the argument succeeds in the end, it poses a challenge for anyone who wishes to draw a line, accepting some kinds of moral luck and not others. As some of the responses suggest, there is some reason to rethink the idea that the line must be drawn between two of the original four categories provided in Nagel’s classic contribution or to rethink the way that we have assigned cases to each of the four categories. Given apparently relevant differences between sets of cases that have all been categorized as test cases for circumstantial luck, perhaps it is time to reassess this assumption, implicit in many discussions of moral luck.
5. Conclusion
The problem of moral luck is deeply unsettling. Naturally, there is a wide variety of responses to it. On the one extreme are those who deny that there is any sort of moral luck, and on the other are those who accept every sort of moral luck. Most writers who have responded to the problem fall somewhere in between; either they explicitly take a mixed approach or they confine their arguments to a carefully delineated subset of types of moral luck while remaining uncommitted with respect to the others. The extreme positions are vulnerable to the objection that they have left some consideration or other completely unaccounted for. But those who occupy the middle also face a formidable challenge: where can one draw a principled line between acceptable and unacceptable forms of luck? As we have seen, one apparently natural place to draw a line is between resultant luck and all of the other sorts. On this view, there is no resultant moral luck, despite initial appearances, although there is moral luck of all the other kinds. Thus, occupiers of this position face the challenge of setting out a plausible rationale for drawing the line where they do. But they also face the challenge of where precisely to draw another line, namely, the line around what counts as “results.” For we can ask on which side of this line do intentions, willings, bodily movements, and so on, fall. Do results include everything that happens after the formation of an intention or the exertion of the will, for example? Or everything that follows the beginning of the formation of an intention or the beginning of the exertion of the will? Or everything that follows the “affection of the heart” of which Adam Smith wrote so eloquently? And as we have just seen illuminated by the analogical argument, a special class of cases commonly categorized as circumstantial luck appear to share salient features with cases of outcome luck, offering yet another challenge for drawing the line around only outcome moral luck. Thus, this proposal, too, faces serious challenges. Fortunately, there is a rich and growing literature providing a full spectrum of responses to explore.
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Acknowledgments
I am very grateful to David Brink, Nina Davis, Derk Pereboom, and Sam Rickless for their very helpful input and constructive suggestions on the initial entry. I also benefited greatly from participation in the University of San Diego Institute for Law and Philosophy Roundtable on Moral Luck in April 2003. Many thanks to an anonymous reviewer for very helpful comments on the 2025 version.