1. Rescorla (2007 [2019], the entry on convention) provides a valuable review of this literature.

2. An important exception is the work of Nicholas Southwood (2011; Southwood & Eriksson 2011), which relies on more traditional methods of philosophical analysis.

3. Indeed, as Heath (2017: 287) points out, most of what the social domain theorists refer to as “conventions” are not Lewisian conventions at all.

4. Parts of this section are borrowed from Stich 2019.

5. Terminology, here, is not our friend. “Constructivism” has a very different meaning in metaethics (Bagnoli 2011 [2020], entry on constructivism in metaethics). Rather than use “constructivism” for the developmental view that Piaget, Kohlberg, and Turiel share, Jonathan Haidt (2012: 324, fn 8) calls it “rationalism” to emphasize the role that reasoning is alleged to play, though “rationalism” also has a variety of different meanings. For more on Turiel’s version of constructivism, see Section 8.

6. For detailed and insightful accounts of both Piaget’s work on moral psychology and Kohlberg’s see Lapsley 1996: chs. 1–4.

7. See, for example, Turiel, Killen, and Helwig (1987: 169–170) where Dworkin (1983) and Rawls (1971) are cited.

8. Starting around the turn of the century, the term “the moral/conventional task” became an increasingly common label for experimental procedures that use questions similar to these, though the term is rarely if ever used by Turiel or other social domain theorists. Researchers who use the term often include questions about the seriousness of the transgression as part of the task, and while social domain theorists sometimes do ask about seriousness, they do

not considered [seriousness] to be a formal criterion for distinguishing moral and conventional rules and transgressions. (Smetana 1993: 117)

This is to be expected, since Turiel and his colleagues report studies in which participants judge some conventional transgressions to be more serious than some moral transgressions (Turiel, Killen, & Helwig 1987: 175). Researchers who adopt the “moral/conventional task” terminology do not draw a sharp distinction between criterion judgments and justification categories; they treat questions eliciting justification categories to be part of the moral/conventional task. However, for Turiel and his collaborators, only criterion judgments are used to determine whether a judgment is moral or conventional. The responses to justification category questions are used to explore how participants think about moral and conventional transgressions.

9. For an extensive list of studies published from the mid-1970s thru the mid-1980s, see Turiel, Killen, & Helwig 1987: 172–174.

10. Why “most or all” not “all”? Though the point does not loom large in the work of Turiel and his associates, they would of course agree that some criterion judgments are just mistakes due to inattention, failure understand the description of the transgression, or some other factor.

11. Huebner, Lee, & Hauser (2010: 13–17) found that participants’ judgments about a number of “grown-up” intuitively conventional transgressions also differ from their judgments about the sorts of conventional transgressions that social domain theorists typically use in their studies.

12. For a critiques of Kelly et al. (2007) see Kumar (2015 & 2016); Rosas (2012); Sousa, Holbrook, & Piazza (2009); and Sousa & Piazza (2014); for a response to Sousa, Holbrook, & Piazza (2009) see Stich, Fessler, & Kelly (2009). For a critique of Fessler, Barrett, et al. (2015), see Piazza & Sousa (2016); for a response, see Fessler, Holbrook, et al. (2016).

13. Heath notes that terms like “justice”, “rights”, and “welfare” are obviously ambiguous, and though Turiel makes no attempt to define them, he interprets them very broadly. For example, Turiel considers lying to be a moral transgression because “it involves a violation of ‘justice’” (Heath 2017: 283).

14. Turiel & Davidson (1986: 119); Smetana (1993: 113); Killen & Smetana (2015: 706); Smetana, Jambon, & Ball (2018: 24); Nucci & Turiel (1978: 402); Yau & Smetana (2003: 650); Turiel & Smetana (1984: 261 & 270); Stoddart & Turiel (1985: 1242); Turiel (2002: 111).

15. Here is an example from Killen & Smetana.

For researchers studying moral judgment, the definition of morality is derived primarily from moral philosophers taking a deontological perspective (Kant, 1785/1959). According to this approach, morality refers to a set of prescriptive norms about how individuals ought to treat one another, including concerns with fairness, others’ welfare, equality, and justice. (2015: 702)

For another example, see Killen & Dahl (2018: 21).

16. The religious groups included Catholics (Nucci 1982), Amish-Mennonites, Dutch Reform Calvinists, and Conservative and Orthodox Jews (Nucci & Turiel 1993). The cultures included groups in the Virgin Islands (Nucci, Turiel, & Encarnacion-Gawrych 1983), Nigeria (Hollos, Leis, & Turiel 1986), South Korea (Song, Smetana, & Kim 1987), northeastern Brazil (Nucci, Camino, & Sapiro 1996), Hong Kong (Yau & Smetana 2003), Mongolia (Berniūnas, Dranseika, & Sousa 2016), and mainland China (Berniūnas, Silius, & Dranseika 2020).

17. Nichols’ theory was first presented in Nichols 2002. Features of the theory were elaborated in Nichols 2004: Ch 1, and discussed further in Nichols & Mallon 2006; Gill & Nichols 2008; and Nichols 2021.

18. Nichols leaves it open that normative theories may have universal components and that parts of them may be innate (Nichols 2002: 226, fn. 3).

19. As noted in note 8, “the moral/conventional task” is a term used to denote a variety of experimental procedures inspired by the work of Turiel and other social domain theorists. The version of the task used by Nichols asks participants about permissibility and authority contingency, which the social domain theorists consider criterion judgments. It also asks about the seriousness of the transgression, which social domain theorists explicitly reject as a criterion judgment, and it does not ask whether the transgression would be wrong in other places or at other times, which social domain theorists do include as criterion judgments. Nichols’ task asks participants to justify their judgment, which social domain theorists consider a justification category question, not a criterion judgment.

20. For additional evidence that is problematic for Nichols’ view see Royzman, Goodwin, & Leeman 2011.

21. Nichols’ view on this issue is less clear. On the one hand, he insists that work in the Turiel tradition “help[s] us understand the nature of moral judgment” (2004: 4). And in his critique of Gibbard, discussed in the following section, he uses the fact that young children give standard responses in the moral/conventional task as evidence that they are able to make moral judgments. But he also argues that the transgressions that his version of the moral/conventional task classifies as “non-conventional” include disgusting behavior that he does not consider to be a moral transgression.

22. As Royzman, Kim, & Leeman (2015) point out, this is an idea that has been defended by Gray, Schein, & Ward (2014) using quite different methods.

23. Killen & Smetana (2008: 4) argue that the moral/conventional task and related tools developed by social domain theorists “could be useful to ensure that moral neuroscience researchers are assessing moral decisions”.

24. Kumar (2015) suggests a rather different nomological cluster. His suggestion is critiqued by Stich (2019).

25. There is, it would seem, a prima facie tension between this argument and Nichols’ defense of his “norms with feeling” version of sentimentalism. The experiments Nichols designed to test the norms with feeling theory showed that when people are asked about what Nichols takes to be clear cases of conventional transgressions that evoke disgust their responses are those that Turiel associates with moral transgressions. And if that’s right, it is hard to see how Nichols can claim that “passing the moral/conventional” task reflects “a basic capacity for moral judgment”, since his experimental result seems to indicate that the moral/conventional task does not succeed in identifying moral judgments. To the best of our knowledge, Nichols has never addressed this issue. For further discussion of Nichols’ argument against Gibbard, see Prinz (2007a: 115 ff.).

26. Roskies uses the phrase to characterize individuals with damage to the ventromedial cortex who exhibit a somewhat different clinical profile sometimes characterized as “acquired sociopathy”.

27. Surprisingly, the psychopathic offenders gave the moral response pattern to both moral and conventional transgressions. Blair interpreted this as a strategic move. They

wished to demonstrate that the treatments they were receiving were effective. They therefore would be motivated to show that they had learned the rules of society. (Blair 1995: 23)