Notes to Mill’s Moral and Political Philosophy
1. John Stuart Mill (JSM) credits Harriet Taylor Mill (HTM) with considerable influence on his views and his writings, especially the writing of On Liberty (see Autobiography 257–59 and Mill’s dedication to On Liberty). JSM’s relation to HTM is discussed in McCabe 2017 and Miller 2022. A stylometric analysis of HTM’s contributions to On Liberty is explored in Schmidt-Petri, Schefczyk, and Osburg 2022. On the basis of this information about JSM’s intellectual debts to HTM and the stylometric analysis, some scholars have concluded that HTM should be recognized as a co-author of On Liberty, and there is now a new edition that recognizes JSM and HTM as co-authors (John Stuart Mill and Harriet Taylor Mill, On Liberty, ed. P.N. Turner, J.E. Jacobs, H. McCabe, L. Osburg, M. Schefczyck, and C. Schmidt-Petri (Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing, 2026)). The co-authorship of On Liberty is a complicated issue, and these scholars have made a serious case for co-authorship. But I’m not yet convinced that the case is decisive. Philosophical friends, which JSM and HTM were, provide important feedback on each other’s ideas, including editorial feedback, which can influence the formulation of ideas. But that kind of feedback need not amount to co-authorship. Think about a mentor’s role in the formulation of a student’s own philosophical ideas. Moreover, in the dedication to HTM in On Liberty and his remarks in the Autobiography, JSM says that HTM played this sort of role in many of his most important works. But there is no suggestion, as of yet, that HTM deserves to be credited with co-authorship in these other works. Though the case for the co-authorship of On Liberty is interesting, I think that the co-authorship issue remains an open question.
