Notes to Alexius Meinong

1. In Meinong 1910, we find (p. 74 [58]): “Over against real objects such as a table and a chair—or for that matter, representing [Vorstellen] and desiring [Begehren]—stand ideal objects, ones whose being can be none other than subsistence, if they do have any being.”

2. The main title of Routley 1980, Exploring Meinong’s Jungle and Beyond, is a critical allusion to the following passages from Kneale 1949:

With the horrors of Meinong’s jungle fresh in our minds, we cannot accept such language until we are convinced that it is harmless. (p. 32)

But after a period of wandering in Meinong’s jungle of subsistence […] philosophers are agreed that propositions cannot be regarded as ultimate entities. (p. 12)

And in the footnote to this last passage, Kneale mentions that “The jungle is described in Meinong’s book Über Annahmen”. — There is even a Wikipedia entry on “Meinong’s jungle”.

Gilbert Ryle’s “frank concession” (1972: 7) “that Gegenstandstheorie itself is dead, buried and not going to be resurrected” is also widely quoted (and often derided) in the later literature on Meinong (cf. Priest 2005: vi, and Swanson 2011, for instance).

3. Later, 1923 (p. 158), Meinong acknowledges that the German term “gelten” which was introduced by Rickert and Windelband can be used for the “subsistence” [Sein] of dignitatives.

4. The German word “Vorstellung” is rendered as “representation”, its corresponding verb “vorstellen” as “represent”. Meinong’s use of “Präsentation” and “präsentieren” is translated as “presentation” and “present”. In English works on Meinong you can find as alternative translations of “Vorstellung” the expressions “idea” (sometimes in Findlay and Grossmann, for instance) and “presentation”.

Copyright © 2023 by
Johann Marek <johann.marek@uni-graz.at>

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