1. Although the year of his birth is often given as 1135, research now supports the later date. For two recent studies of Maimonides’ life, see Davidson 2005 and Kramer 2005.

2. For a readily available English translation, see Twersky 1972, 402–23.

3. For an English translation and commentary on the Treatise on Resurrection, see Halkin and Hartman 1985, 211–81. For an abridged English translation of the Letter on Astrology, see Twersky, 1972, 464–73.

4. In Judaism, the first commandment is: “I am the Lord thy God,” which Maimonides (MT 1, Principles of the Torah, 1.1–7) takes an affirmative precept mandating belief in the existence of God.

5. For English translations, see Twersky, 1972, 361–86 and Weis and Butterworth, 59–104.