Notes to Non-monotonic Logic

1. Note though that in some formalisms some input may be treated in a defeasible way so that Reflexivity need not hold. For instance, in corrective approaches such as the Free Consequences contradictory premises are not consequences.

2. We speak about super-arguments in the intuitive sense that e.g., \(A_1 \rightarrow \ldots \rightarrow A_n\) is a super-argument of \(A_1 \rightarrow \ldots \rightarrow A_m\) where \(m \lt n\).

3. Some pioneering systems in this tradition are the OSCAR system (Pollock (1995)), Defeasible Logic (Nute (1994)), or the formalisms in (Simari and Loui (1992)) and (Verheij (1996)). For a overview articles see Prakken and Vreeswijk (2002)) and Prakken (2018). More recent work in logical formal argumentation includes Arieli and Straßer (2015), Besnard and Hunter (2009), Bochman (2018), Dung et al. (2009), Modgil and Prakken (2013).

4. In this and the following examples we suppose that \(\top\) is an arbitrary tautology and the formulas \(\theta , \tau\), etc. appearing in the default rules are contingent (neither they nor their negations are tautologies).

5. One may think about a classical model M as follows: M is uniquely characterized by an assignment \(v\) of the truth-values 0 and 1 to the logical atoms. Whether a formula \(\phi\) holds in M (in signs, M \(\models \phi)\) can then be determined recursively on the basis of \(v\) by means of the classical truth tables for \(\neg , \wedge\), etc.

6. We show one direction. Suppose \(\max[\phi] \models \psi\). Hence, since big-stepped probabilities are used, \(\rP(\{\max[\phi]\}) \gt \sum \{\rP(\{M\}) \mid M \prec \max[\phi]\} \ge \rP([\phi \wedge \neg \psi]) = \sum \{\rP(\{M\}) \mid M \in[\phi \wedge \neg \psi]\}\). Since max[\(\phi] \models \psi\) also \(\rP([\phi \wedge \psi]) \ge \rP(\{\max[\phi]\})\) and hence \(\rP([\phi \wedge \psi]) \gt \rP([\phi \wedge \neg \psi])\) which implies \(\rP(\psi \mid \phi) \gt \frac{1}{2}\).

7. For instance, “We thus argue that human rationality, and the coherence of human thought, is defined not by logic, but by probability.” (emphasis added, Oaksford and Chater (2009), p. 69)

Copyright © 2019 by
Christian Strasser <Christian.Strasser@ruhr-uni-bochum.de>
G. Aldo Antonelli

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