1. The interested reader should note that Bar-Hillel and Carnap’s original work is no mere artefact of history. Contemporary research into 6G communications technology—“semantic communications”—are reexploring this material with urgency. See Ma et al. (2023).

2. Further afield than theoretical computer science, or epistemic logics (for which see section 1.1 below), hard and soft information have found particular utility in financial modelling, for which see Bertomeu and Marinovic (2016).

3. The issue turns on modelling inferential information—the agent possessing the reasoning skills required to move information form implicit to explicit storage. Models for inferential information for non-ideal agents will be explored in sections below, but for now we note that reasoning is just one type of informational action—an action-type dedicated to “transporting” information. Another type of informational action is that of an announcement .

4. Although a serious comparison lies outside the scope of this entry, DEL has deep connections with dynamic semantics, and the point above is very close in spirit to the insight that “the utterance of a sentence brings us from a certain state of information to another one”, from the Dynamic Predicate Logic (DPL) of Groenendijk and Stokhof (1991). For further information, see van Eijck and Visser (2012).

5. Readers familiar with model theory may have noticed that the ‘part-of’ relation described here is a generalization of the notion of theory interpretation —just consider the case when the instances of the two classifications \(\mathbf{A}, \mathbf{C}\) are the models of two first order theories \(T_A\), \(T_B\), respectively, and the types are the sentences of the language of the corresponding theory.

6. In general, the definition of \(L_A\) can be made more sophisticated, allowing for constraints of a more elaborated form than the simple two-type ones used in this discussion.

7. In other words, the Strong Commutation rule is derived. Strong commutation follows from commutation and association: From \((A \otimes B) \otimes D\) we can associate to get \(A \otimes(B \otimes D)\), then commute to get \(A \otimes(D \otimes B)\), associating again to get \((A \otimes D) \otimes B\). In non-associating logics with commutation, commutation is restricted to left-right swaps within the parameters of a given bracketing. In this case, from \((A \otimes B) \otimes D\) we could get only \((B \otimes A) \otimes D, D \otimes(A \otimes B)\), and \(D \otimes(B \otimes A)\). Since non-associative logics with commutation are rare, commutation appears usually in its stronger, derived form. In non-associating logics with commutation, commutation is restricted to left-right swaps within the parameters of a given bracketing.

S1. Floridi uses \(U\) instead of \(N\), but we have changed the notations here so as to guard against confusion with regard to the universal modality in situation semantics.