Proof of the Falsification Theorem

Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem 1—The Falsification Theorem:
Suppose the evidence stream \(c^n\) contains precisely m experiments or observations on which \(h_j\) is not fully outcome-compatible with \(h_i\). And suppose that the Independent Evidence Conditions hold for evidence stream \(c^n\) with respect to each of these hypotheses. Furthermore, suppose there is a lower bound \(\delta \gt 0\) such that for each \(c_k\) on which \(h_j\) is not fully outcome-compatible with \(h_i\),

\[ P[\vee \{ o_{ku} : P[o_{ku} \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c_k] = 0\} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c_{k}] \ge \delta \]

—i.e., \(h_i\) (together with \(b\cdot c_k)\) says, via a likelihood with value no smaller than \(\delta\), that one of the outcomes will occur that \(h_j\) says cannot occur). Then,

\[ \begin{align} &P\left[\vee \left\{ e^n : \frac{P[e^n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^n]}{P[e^n \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^n]} = 0\right\} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{n}\right]\\[1ex] &\qquad\qquad = P\vee \left\{e^n : P[e^n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^n] = 0\right\} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{n}]\\[1ex] &\qquad\qquad \ge 1-(1-\delta)^m, \end{align} \]

which approaches 1 for large m.

Proof

First notice that according to the supposition of the theorem, for each of the m experiments or observations \(c_k\) on which \(h_j\) is not fully outcome-compatible with \(h_i\) we have

\[ \begin{align} (1-\delta) & \ge P\vee \{o_{ku} : P[o_{ku} \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c_k] \gt 0\} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c_{k}]\\ & = \sum_{\{o_{ku}\in O_k : P[o_{ku} \pmid h_j\cdot b\cdot c_{k}] \gt 0\}} P[o_{ku} \pmid h_{i}\cdot b\cdot c_{k}]. \end{align} \]

And for each of the other \(c_k\) in the evidence stream \(c^n\)—i.e., for each of the \(c_k\) on which \(h_j\) is fully outcome-compatible with \(h_i\),

\[ P\left[\vee \left\{o_{ku} : P[o_{ku} \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c_k] \gt 0\right\} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c_{k}\right] = 1. \]

Then, we may iteratively decompose

\[P\left[\vee \left\{ e^n : P[e^n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^n] \gt 0\right\} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{n}\right]\]

into its components as follows:

\[ \begin{align} P&[\vee \{ e^n : P[e^n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^n] \gt 0\} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{ n} ] \\ &= \sum_{\{e^n :P[e^n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^{ n}] \gt 0\}} P[e^n \pmid h_{i}\cdot b\cdot c^{ n} ] \\ &\begin{aligned}= \sum_{\left\{\begin{split} e^n :P[e_n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c_n\cdot c^{n-1}\cdot e^{n-1}] \\ \times P[e^{n-1} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c_n\cdot c^{ n-1}] \gt 0 \end{split}\right\}} P[e_n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c_n\cdot c^{n-1}\cdot e^{ n-1}] \\ {} \times P[e^{n-1} \pmid h_{i}\cdot b\cdot c_n\cdot c^{ n-1} ] \end{aligned}\\[2ex] &= \sum_{\left\{\begin{split} e^n :P[e_n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c_n] \\ \times P[e^{n-1} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{ n-1}] \gt 0 \end{split}\right\}} P[e_n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c_n] \times P[e^{n-1} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{ n-1} ] \\ &= \sum_{\left\{\begin{split} e^n :P[e_n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c_n] \gt 0 \\ \amp P[e^{n-1} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{ n-1}] \gt 0 \end{split} \right\}} P[e_n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c_n] \times P[e^{n-1} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{ n-1} ] \\ &\begin{aligned} = \sum_{\left\{ e^{n-1}: P[e^{n-1} \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^{ n-1}] \gt 0 \right\}} \sum_{\{o_{nu}\in O_n :P[o_{nu} \pmid h_j\cdot b\cdot c_{ n}] \gt 0\}} P[o_{nu} \pmid h_{i}\cdot b\cdot c_{ n} ] \\ {} \times P[e^{n-1} \pmid h_{i}\cdot b\cdot c^{ n-1} ] \end{aligned}\\[2ex] & \begin{aligned}= \sum_{\{e^{n-1}: P[e^{n-1} \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^{ n-1}] \gt 0\}} P[\vee \{ o_{nu}: P[o_{nu} \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c_n] \gt 0\} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c_{ n} ] \\ {} \times P[e^{n-1} \pmid h_{i}\cdot b\cdot c^{ n-1} ] \end{aligned}\\[2ex] & \le (1-\gamma) \times \sum_{\{e^{n-1}: P[e^{n-1} \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^{ n-1}] \gt 0\}} P[e^{n-1} \pmid h_{i}\cdot b\cdot c^{ n-1} ], \end{align} \]

if \(c_n\) is an observation on which \(h_j\) is not fully outcome-compatible with \(h_i\)

or, alternatively,

\[ = \sum_{\{e^{n-1}: P[e^{n-1} \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^{n-1}] \gt 0\}} P[e^{n-1} \pmid h_{i}\cdot b\cdot c^{n-1}], \]

if \(c_n\) is an observation on which \(h_j\) is fully outcome-compatible with \(h_i\).

Now, continuing this process of decomposing terms of form

\[ \sum_{\{e^k : P[e^k \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^{k}] \gt 0\}} P[e^k \pmid h_{i}\cdot b\cdot c^{k}] \]

(in each disjunct of the ‘or’ above, using the same decomposition process shown in the six lines preceding that disjunction), and realizing that according to the supposition of the theorem, this decomposition leads to terms of the form of the first disjunct exactly m times, we get

\[ \begin{align} &\vdots \\ \le &\prod^{m}_{k = 1} (1-\gamma) = (1-\gamma)^m. \end{align} \]

So,

\[ \begin{align} P\left[\vee \{ e^n : P[e^n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^n] = 0\} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{n}\right]\\ = 1 - P[\vee \{ e^n : P[e^n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^n] \gt 0\} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{n}] \\ \ge 1 - (1-\gamma)^m.\\ \end{align} \]

We also have,

\[ \begin{align} & P\left[\vee \left\{ e^n : \frac{P[e^n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^n]}{P[e^n \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^n]} = 0\right\} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{n}\right]\\[1ex] & P\left[\vee \left\{ e^n : P[e^n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^n] = 0\right\} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{n}\right], \end{align} \]

because

\[ \begin{align} & P\left[\vee \left\{ e^n : \frac{P[e^n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^n]}{P[e^n \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^n]} \gt 0\right\} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{n}\right]\\[1ex] & = \sum_{\{e^n : P[e^n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^n]/P[e^n \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{n}] \gt 0\}} P[e^n \pmid h_{i}\cdot b\cdot c^{n}] \\ & = \sum_{\{e^n : P[e^n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^n] \gt 0 \amp P[e^n \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{n}] \gt 0\}} P[e^n \pmid h_{i}\cdot b\cdot c^{n}] \\ & = \sum_{\{e^n : P[e^n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^{n}] \gt 0\}} P[e^n \pmid h_{i}\cdot b\cdot c^{n}] \\ & = P\vee \{ e^n : P[e^n \pmid h_{j}\cdot b\cdot c^n] \gt 0\} \pmid h_i\cdot b\cdot c^{n}]. \\ \end{align} \]

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