Korean Buddhism

Buddhism was introduced to the Korean Peninsula from China in the 4th century during the Korean Three Kingdoms period. It first arrived in Koguryŏ, a kingdom on the peninsula’s northern end, and then reached Paekche, a kingdom on the southwest of the peninsula. It arrived in Silla, a kingdom on the southeast of the peninsula, through Koguryŏ. Although the Buddhism that first took root in Korea was largely Sinicized Buddhism, it evolved into a uniquely Korean tradition, developing its own distinctive historical, cultural, and social context.

Throughout history, Buddhism has significantly influenced the worldview of the Korean people, instilling concepts such as karma and the interconnectedness of all things. Korean Buddhist philosophers place an emphasis on cultivating the power of the mind, underpinning their teachings with the belief that the mind of every individual is inherently the Buddha’s mind. Nevertheless, their narratives vary when addressing the dynamic tension between aristocratic and populist Buddhism, the quest for personal enlightenment versus the salvation of others, and the dichotomy of doctrinal study and meditation practice.

• 1. Introduction of Buddhist teachings to Korea
  • 1.1 The Theory of Karma
  • 1.2 Political Ideas of Buddhism
• 2. The Flourishing of Buddhist Philosophy
  • 2.1 The Impact of the Yogācāra School
  • 2.2 Ŭisang’s Hwaŏm Philosophy
  • 2.3 Wŏnhyo’s Philosophy
  • 2.3.1. Formation of the One Mind Philosophy
  • 2.3.2. Reconciling Buddhist Doctrines
  • 2.4 Arrival of Sŏn Buddhism
• 3. Buddhism During the Koryŏ Dynasty
  • 3.1 Unification of Buddhist Teachings
  • 3.2 The Formation of Korean Sŏn Buddhism
• 4. Conversations between Buddhism and Neo-Confucianism in the Chosŏn Dynasty
  • 4.1 Critique and Defense of Buddhism
  • 4.2 Harmonizing Buddhism and Confucianism
• 5. Korean Buddhism’s Response to Modernity
  • 5.1 Investigating the Value of Buddhist Philosophy in the Modern Era
  • 5.2 Popularizing Buddhism
  • 5.3 Women and Korean Buddhist Philosophy
• Bibliography
  • Korean materials
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Introduction of Buddhist teachings to Korea

When Buddhism reached the Korean Peninsula, it encountered a spiritual landscape dominated by indigenous shamanic religions. The first major Buddhist teachings introduced in Korea included the theory of karma and the political ideas of Buddhism (Ko: 30–37). These core concepts resonated with the Korean people, leading Buddhism to soon supplant the previous spiritual systems.

1.1 The Theory of Karma

Karma, one of the most well-known Buddhist concepts in the Western world, literally means “action.” It encompasses both the act itself and its consequences, and has developed into an ethical principle of cause and effect. In Buddhism, karma is defined specifically as intentional action, placing emphasis on human agency and moral choice within the karmic process.

The theory of karma introduced the concept of transmigration. Before the arrival of Buddhism, it was commonly believed that the realms of the living and the dead were distinct and physically separated. Beings from one realm could exert spiritual influence over the other, especially among family members. Ancestors’ spirits were thought to be able to help or harm their descendants in the world of the living, and descendants were believed to be capable of aiding their ancestors in resting peacefully in the realm of the dead. When a person dies, the spirit permanently departs the world of the living, with no rebirth, it was believed. However, Buddhism introduced the idea of past and future lives through the process of rebirth, proposing that individuals are continuously reborn into circumstances determined by their past lives. Thus, the concept of karma provided the Korean people with a logical explanation for why they should engage in ethical behavior.

1.2 Political Ideas of Buddhism

The Korean ruling class embraced Buddhism because it provided advanced knowledge and ideas to fortify the concept of kingship. Specifically, during Silla’s transition from tribal coalitions to a centralized kingdom, King Chinhŭng leveraged the concept of Chakravarti to reinforce his kingship (Ko:44–48; Jeong:97). Chakravarti is the title of an ideal king in Buddhism, ruling by truth rather than force. This term implies a king who turns the wheel of truth, symbolizing limitless governing power. The king’s vast governing power is depicted through the rolling wheel on his castle. His right to rule, earned through good karma in his past life, is indestructible. Under his reign, peace and justice are assured for all. For instance, if he were to go to war, he would achieve a bloodless victory as the enemy would surrender upon seeing the aura of the wheel leading the army.

The Chakravarti concept supported the appointment of a king over a tribal coalition to ensure stability. Furthermore, the people equated a king with Maitreya, the world’s savior Buddha. Buddhism was perceived as more rational and potent than indigenous belief systems, enabling Buddhist kings to make shamans and political rivals submit to their authority more easily. Such political thoughts significantly strengthened the kingship and centralized governments in the three kingdoms.

2. The Flourishing of Buddhist Philosophy

As Buddhism took root in Korea, it was perceived as a progressive moral and intellectual framework and swiftly adopted by the Korean people. This adoption led to a more widespread belief in Buddhism and deepened the study of Buddhist scriptures. In particular, the scriptures from the Mādhyamaka, Yogācāra, and precepts schools gained significant traction. Numerous theoretical schools such as Sanlun, Shelun, Yogācāra, and Niepan were explored extensively (Huh 2005: 7). While Sanlun was a major stream in Koguryŏ, and Baekche, the Yogācāra School was the primary Buddhist school in Silla (Ko 1989:138). However, towards the late Unified Silla period (780–935CE), Huayan (K. Hwaŏm) School eventually became the most influential branch of Korean Buddhism.

2.1 The Impact of the Yogācāra School

The Yogācāra School, a major philosophical branch of Mahāyāna Buddhism, proposes that all phenomena are manifestations of consciousness. With that assumption, the school focuses on the investigation of the workings of human consciousness, the nature of the afflictions of the human mind, and how tainted consciousness can return to its original, untainted state. According to Yogācāra teachings, human consciousness exists at eight levels: the first five correspond to the senses, the sixth to the mind, the seventh to self-consciousness that creates the belief of self from stored consciousness, and the eighth to the storehouse consciousness preserving the seeds of karma. Yogācāra practice aims to purify all levels of consciousness, transforming deluded consciousness into wisdom.

Among the well-known Korean Yogācāra scholars of this period was Wŏn’gwang (圓光, 542–640 CE), a Silla monk, who studied Shelun philosophy in China before teaching it in Silla. His teachings emphasized the pure Buddha mind, urging followers of Mahāyāna teachings to primarily practice faith and understanding of the one real realm, their true mind, characterized by purity, non-obstruction, and permanence. This one real realm is referred to as the womb of Buddha (Yŏraejang 如來藏; Skt. Tathāgatagarbha) or the ninth consciousness.

Wŏn’gwang’s nine consciousness concept was influenced by Zhendi (眞諦, 499–569 CE), a key translator and scholar in the Shelun School. Zhendi introduced the concept of a ninth, pure consciousness, a belief rooted in the Buddha nature theory. He believed that the tainted eighth consciousness and the purified consciousness were essentially different, meaning they should be separately named. Though Zhendi’s nine consciousness theory was well received at that time, the idea of pure, untainted consciousness existing prior to enlightenment remained a point of contention between the Dilun and Shelun schools.

Later, Xuanzang (602–664 CE), the famed Chinese monk-scholar, introduced new translations of Yogācāra scriptures from India. These works led to the eight consciousness theory being established as the orthodox view within the Yogācāra school in China. Xuanzang acknowledged the possibility of an untainted seed existing in latent form within the eighth consciousness but did not accept the existence of a separate, ninth consciousness. He also recognized the existence of beings known as icchantikas, who entirely lack the capacity for such purity. As a result, Xuanzang proposed a theory of five classes of sentient beings, each with differing capacities for salvation, based on the quality of their untainted seeds. This marked a significant departure from Zhendi’s doctrine of universal salvation through inherent Buddha-nature.

The Shilla monk Wŏnchŭk (圓測, 613–696 CE), who studied in China, engaged with both interpretations of Yogācāra thought and tried to reconcile them. While adhering primarily to Xuanzang’s eight consciousnesses model, Wŏnchŭk incorporated the concept of pure consciousness, situating it within the eighth consciousness rather than outside of it. This view suggests the eighth consciousness is not entirely tainted as it does contain pure elements. Despite being a follower of Xunzang’s revised Yogācāra doctrines, Wŏnchŭk upheld the belief that all sentient beings possess the potential to attain Buddhahood.

Renowned monks from Shilla, such as Ŭisang (義湘, 625–702 CE) and Wŏnhyo (元曉, 617–686 CE), studied the teachings of the Yogācāra School. They sought to travel to China to learn from the famous monk Xuanzang. Wŏnhyo’s story of enlightenment, which occurred en route to China, illustrates the significant influence Yogācāra teachings had on him. When Ŭisang and Wŏnhyo reached a harbor to embark on their journey to China, they were caught in a sudden downpour and sought refuge in a small cave. During the night, Wŏnhyo woke up feeling extremely thirsty. In the darkness, he found a bowl of water nearby, drank from it, and felt a sense of satisfaction. However, come daylight, he realized he had drunk fetid water from a skull, which caused him to vomit. This experience led Wŏnhyo to question why the same water had tasted satisfactory at night but made him sick in the morning when he realized its true nature. He concluded that the water was the same, but his mind had distinguished it as clean at night and dirty in the morning. This realization—that everything is a creation of the mind—prompted him to stay in Shilla, having experienced the essential teaching of Yogācāra.

2.2 Ŭisang’s Hwaŏm Philosophy

Ŭisang is credited with founding the Korean Hwaŏm school and transmitting Hwaŏm philosophy—rooted in the Flower Garland Sūtra (Avataṃsaka Sūtra)—to the Korean peninsula. He focused on the core tenets of Hwaŏm thought, particularly the concept of “dependent arising of the universe” (Fajie yuanqi, 法界緣起), through which he articulated a vision of radical interdependence and emphasized the principle of equality both theoretically and in lived practice.

Ŭisang studied in China under Zhiyan (602–668), the second patriarch of the Huayan school, rather than with Xuanzang. During this period, he composed the “Diagram of the Dharma Realm of the One-Vehicle of the Avataṃsaka” (Hwaŏm ilsŭng pŏpkyeto, 華嚴一乘法界圖), which encapsulates the essence of his Hwaŏm philosophy. The diagram contains a distinctive shape, consisting of only 210 sinograms intricately arranged, symbolizing a mandala. This unusual shape bestowed an esoteric and magical quality upon the words, enhancing their effect.

Ŭisang’s diagram opens with a description of original nature and presents two key teachings: “dependent arising from original nature” (Xingqi, 性起) and “dependent arising of the universe.”

“The dharma nature is perfectly interfused, not possessing the characteristic of duality;

All dharmas are unmoving; they are originally quiescent.

They have no names and characteristics; all distinctions are severed.

It is known through the wisdom of realization and not by any other means.

True nature is very deep and supremely fine and profound.

It is not attached to self-nature and is achieved in accordance with conditions”

(McBride 2012a: 103–104)

This passage articulates the totality, tranquility, and ineffability of untainted original nature (dharma nature). While “true nature” is often used to refer to the original nature of the human mind, it functions in relation to other phenomena and conditions. Ŭisang’s formulation echoes the famous line from the Flower Garland Sūtra: “All originates from the mind. The mind is the world’s painter.” This exemplifies the theory of dependent arising from original nature—the idea that all phenomena arise from a hidden but present Buddha nature within the mind. Though obscured by ignorance, this inner Buddha nature shapes reality and underpins the view that the mind holds the power to transform the world, a concept foundational to Korean Buddhism.

From this point, the diagram transitions to “dependent arising of the universe”:

“Within one, there is all, and within many, there is one.

The one is precisely all, and the many are precisely the one.

A minute particle of dust contains the ten directions;

All particles of dust are also like this.

The immeasurably distant kalpa is precisely a single thought-moment,

A single thought-moment is precisely an immeasurably distant kalpa.

The nine time periods and the ten time periods are mutually identical;

They are not in confusion, but have been formed separately.

When one initially arouses the aspiration to enlightenment is precisely complete enlightenment.

Samsāra and nirvāna are always in harmony.”(McBride 2012a: 104–105)

This teaching expands the traditional Buddhist concept of dependent origination to a cosmic scale. While early Buddhist formulations explained causality among individual phenomena, Hwaŏm thought developed a more holistic vision: each being is both a microcosm of the universe and contains the entirety of the cosmos within itself. This idea is succinctly captured in the phrase “one is all, all is one.” The diagram’s poetic illustrations—such as “one dust” or “a single thought-moment”-reflect this profound interpenetration, where no absolute distinctions exist between parts and whole, individual and totality.

Ŭisang interpreted this vision as a radical form of equality. He sought to embody this ideal in his monastic community, despite the rigid social hierarchy of the Shilla period. Notably, he accepted students from all social backgrounds and treated them equally, striving to build a community that reflected the harmony and interdependence revealed in Hwaŏm thought.

Modern Korean scholars interpret “one is all, and all is one” in two ways (Kim 1990: 216–218). In the 1970s, historians proposed that this concept served to bolster the kingship of the Shilla king. They saw the relationship between the king and his subjects as analogous to the interconnectedness of the one, and all individual beings. In contrast, from the 1980s onward, Buddhist scholars began interpreting this concept as an expression of the inherent equality of all beings. They reasoned that the relationship between the one and all inherently implies equality; this equilibrium can only be sustained when all elements within the relationship are balanced, which in turn requires that each being be considered equal. Both groups also concurred that the principle of dependent arising of the universe played a significant role in unifying people. This core Hwaŏm philosophy has profoundly influenced the Korean mindset, instilling the belief in the interconnected and interdependent nature of existence (Jee 2022).

Ŭisang’s diagram offers a vision of the world seen from the enlightened perspective, encouraging readers to engage in practice toward that goal. When the mind returns to its original nature, it ceases to make distinctions, transcends duality, relinquishes attachment to a separate self, and moves freely according to the law of dependent arising. The enlightened person, fully awakened to this nature, perceives unity even among opposites, sees the entire universe in a speck of dust, and experiences boundless time in a single moment. Ŭisang concludes his diagram with the following line:

Finally, seated on the throne of the Middle Way, Ultimate Reality. From times long past he has not moved-hence his name is Buddha. (McBride 2012a: 105)

Ŭisang thus affirms that all beings are manifestations of the Buddha and possess the innate capacity to realize Buddhahood.

2.3 Wŏnhyo’s Philosophy

Wŏnhyo is widely regarded as the most prominent philosopher in Korean Buddhism. A master of Buddhist logic, he engaged deeply with a wide range of texts, including the treatises of the Mādhyamaka, Sanlun, and Yogācāra schools, as well as major scriptures such as the Lotus Sūtra, the Flower Garland Sūtra, and the Larger Sūtra of Amitabha, among others. He is credited with writing 70 works in 150 volumes, of which 20 works in 22 volumes are extant today. His commentaries on the Awakening of Faith in the Mahāyāna were highly influential, impacting later thinkers such as Fazang and Zongmi.

Although he initially planned to study under Xuanzang in China, Wŏnhyo ultimately chose to remain in Silla. There, he independently studied Xuanzang’s Yogācāra teachings and developed a critical response to them. Drawing from a wide range of Buddhist doctrines, Wŏnhyo established his own One Mind philosophy and advanced the concept of Hwajaeng (reconciling Buddhist doctrines). For his contributions, he became known as the “State preceptor of Hwajaeng” and was even considered by some to be the reincarnation of Dignāga, given his mastery of Buddhist logic. His philosophical foundation was rooted in the Awakening of Faith in the Mahāyāna

2.3.1. Formation of the One Mind Philosophy

Wŏnhyo engaged with Xuanzang’s philosophy in two major ways. First, he critiqued Xuanzang’s logical inferences, pointing out fallacies in their structure (Kim 2022: 269). Second, he raised several questions regarding Xuanzang’s Yogācāra: Can every being achieve enlightenment? Do the teachings of the Mādhyamaka School or the Yogācāra School hold more accuracy? Is the One Mind a vessel of purity, impurity, or a composite of both?

Wŏnhyo addressed these questions through his study of the Awakening of Faith in the Mahāyāna, one of the most influential texts in East Asian Buddhism. This scripture elaborates on the Tathāgatagarbha doctrine and introduces the concept of One Mind (Ch. yixin, K. ilsim, 一心).

In response to the first question, Wŏnhyo argued that all beings can achieve enlightenment because the One Mind contains pure Buddha-nature, although he acknowledged the possibility of rare exceptions. Regarding the second question, he reconciled the teachings of the Mādhyamaka and Yogācāra schools, asserting that both were valid expressions of the two aspects of One Mind. The suchness (真如) aspect corresponds to Mādhyamaka’s emphasis on emptiness as the original nature, while the arising and ceasing (生滅) aspect aligns with Yogācāra’s focus on the storehouse consciousness arising through causes and conditions.

In response to the third question, Wŏnhyo posited that the One Mind is inherently pure and ultimately beyond linguistic categorization. However, it can be provisionally described as a mixture of the tainted and the untainted. Drawing from the Awakening of Faith, he interpreted the One Mind as a unifying framework for understanding the human mind. The One Mind encompasses all terminologies related to original nature and is identified with the minds of sentient beings. It is characterized by two aspects—suchness and arising/ceasing—and by the “three greatnesses” (K. samdae, 三大), which refer to its essence, attributes, and functions.

This comprehensive interpretation offers a holistic perspective on the mind and consciousness within Mahāyāna Buddhism. Wŏnhyo’s responses to the above questions laid the groundwork for his One Mind philosophy, named to reflect the depth of its unifying insight. “One” refers to its transcendence of dualities and its ability to harmonize diverse teachings without contradiction. “Mind” refers to its ineffable, intelligent nature (T1844, 206c–207a). All beings originate from the One Mind and ultimately return to it, making it the source and destination of all phenomena.

Wŏnhyo also systematized related Buddhist terms under this framework. He classified suchness and the true nature of all beings under the aspect of suchness, while placing concepts like Buddha-nature, storehouse consciousness, the ninth consciousness, and the Buddha’s womb under the aspect of arising and ceasing (T1845, 227c).

In Wŏnhyo’s One Mind philosophy, enlightenment is, therefore, the act of returning to the One Mind. This can be achieved through the practice of the six paramitas—generosity, discipline, patience, diligence, meditative concentration, and wisdom—or by chanting to Amitābha with faith in the One Mind and the three Buddhist treasures: the Buddha, his teachings, and the Buddhist practitioners. To help more people return to the One Mind, Wŏnhyo suggested a practice of reciting the name of Amitābha, particularly for the illiterate population. He wandered through towns, reciting “Namu Amitabul” (meaning “I take refuge in Amitābha”) while tapping a wooden singing ball. The philosophy of the One Mind acknowledges the coexistence of the pure and impure minds within the One Mind. This insight underscores the duality of the human mind, containing both pure and impure aspects, and highlights the need for its cultivation.

Furthermore, Wŏnhyo utilized the concept of the One Mind as a foundational principle for harmony and reconciliation, from which he developed his unique theory of reconciliation, known as “Hwajaeng”.

2.3.2. Reconciling Buddhist Doctrines

Another well-known concept of Wŏnhyo’s Buddhist philosophy is reconciling Buddhist doctrines (hwajaeng, 和諍), which has had a lasting impact on Korean Buddhism. Scholars have argued that hwajaeng was not only a model for understanding Buddhist teaching more inclusively, but also Wŏnhyo’s response to societal division and conflict. He seeks to harmonize disputes within Buddhist doctrine, using key premises from the Mādhyamaka School and the Lotus sūtra.

The first premise holds that all disputes arise from language. From his studies within the Mādhyamaka School, Wŏnhyo recognized the effects and limitations of language. This philosophy discerns two levels of truth: the conventional truth expressed in words, and the ineffable, ultimate truth. Language facilitates understanding, yet it fails to capture things in their entirety. Hence, teachings articulated through language cannot fully convey the complete truth of Buddhism. The second premise posits that all Buddhist schools encapsulate facets of Buddha’s teachings, regardless of the potential limitations of comprehension. This principle is inspired by the famous Lotus sūtra parable of the blind men and the elephant. In this parable, blind men each touch a part of an elephant, leading to varying interpretations of what the creature is. Wŏnhyo related this parable to Buddhist doctrinal disputes, viewing each school as recognizing only part of Buddha’s teachings while insisting that their interpretation was the sole correct one. With these principles as the foundation, Wŏnhyo developed his harmonization theory, known as “hwajaeng”, advocating for non-attachment to any particular doctrine. Free from polarization, he scrutinized each doctrine’s internal validity and legitimacy through a stance of non-obstruction, neither affirming nor denying any of them. He saw doctrinal disputes from Buddha’s higher perspective, transforming them into diverse facets of a unified body of teaching without any classification.

Interpretations of Wŏnhyo’s hwajaeng philosophy have evolved over time in the historical context of Korea. The first association of Wŏnhyo’s name with the hwajaeng concept was documented in the writings of Ŭich’ŏn (義天, 1055–1101 CE), who sought to unify Buddhist doctrine and practice during the Koryŏ dynasty. Under Japanese occupation, Wŏnhyo’s hwajaeng philosophy became associated with the concept of Unified Buddhism (T’ong Pulgyo), regarded as a distinctive feature of Korean Buddhism. This Unified Buddhism, perceived as a complete form of Buddhism integrating all Buddhist teachings, served to foster pride in Korean Buddhism by positioning it above other regional Buddhist traditions. After Korea’s liberation, the meaning of hwajaeng shifted from “unification” to “reconciliation,” reflecting the broader societal transition from authoritarianism to a more pluralistic democracy. Within this evolving context, Shim Jaeryong and a group of scholars trained abroad began to critique the concept of Unified Buddhism, arguing that it was an illusory construct rooted in nationalist ideology (Cho, 2004). In contemporary times, Wŏnhyo’s hwajaeng philosophy has been suggested as a potential remedy for conflict resolution and social polarization.

2.4 Arrival of Sŏn Buddhism

In the seventh century, Sŏn (Ch. Chan, Jp. Zen) Buddhism was introduced to the Shilla Kingdom. Instead of elaborate rituals and complex doctrines, it focuses on meditation practice. Chan Buddhism put forward the idea of realizing Buddhahood, which is the attainment of enlightenment. According to Chan Buddhism, all sentient beings possess Buddha nature and have the potential to become a Buddha. Buddha nature is not merely a seed of potential to become a Buddha, but rather, the true mind of all beings. Therefore, Mazu Daoyi (709–788), the eighth patriarch of Chinese Chan Buddhism, advocated for the belief that the “Ordinary mind is the Way” and “This mind is Buddha.”

Mazu Sŏn found favor among the ruling provincial class (hojok) in Shilla beginning in the ninth century (Huh: 2005: 32–33). His teachings bear notable similarities to those of the doctrinal Huayan School, both of which were founded on the Tathāgatagarbha teaching and upheld the purity of the human mind. Mazu Chan emphasized practice and sudden enlightenment, urging practitioners to view all beings as manifestations of Buddha nature and their own minds as the Buddha mind.

3. Buddhism During the Koryŏ Dynasty

During the Koryŏ dynasty, tensions arose among various Buddhist schools, particularly between the doctrinal traditions and the Sŏn Buddhism. These tensions reflected differing expectations regarding the role and interpretation of Buddhist teachings, as well as varying levels of alignment with state patronage. In contrast to these intra-Buddhist dynamics, Confucianism and Buddhism generally functioned in separate spheres. However, by the end of the dynasty, Neo-Confucianism had emerged as the preferred philosophy among the elite class.

3.1 Unification of Buddhist Teachings

Doctrinal traditions emphasize the systematic study of scriptures, conceptual analysis, and the gradual cultivation of wisdom through intellectual understanding. In contrast, meditation-centered Sŏn schools prioritize direct, non-conceptual experience of awakening, often challenging the efficacy of verbal teachings and logical reasoning. This tension reflects deeper questions about the nature of enlightenment—whether it arises through analytical comprehension or intuitive realization—and whether language serves as a vehicle for truth or an obstacle to it. Doctrinal teachings risk becoming abstract or scholastic, while meditative approaches may dismiss the value of philosophical clarity. In response to this longstanding tension, two prominent monks proposed distinct methods for integrating these divergent paths. Ŭich’ŏn advocated for the harmony of doctrines and practices and became known for achieving unification from a doctrinal perspective. On the other hand, Chinul advocated for a Sŏn approach to unifying practice and Hwaŏm doctrine.

3.1.1 Harmonizing Doctrine and Practice—Ŭich’ŏn (義天, 1055–1101 CE)

Ŭich’ŏn, who studied Hwaŏm (Ch. Huayan) and Ch’ŏnt’ae (Ch. Tiantai; Jp. Tendai) Buddhism in both Korea and China, is traditionally regarded as the founder of the Ch’ŏnt’ae school in Koryŏ. However, due to his strong affiliation with the Hwaŏm tradition, some scholars have questioned whether he truly established an independent Ch’ŏnt’ae lineage in Korea (McBride 2016: 32–36). His efforts at doctrinal harmonization were shaped by the integrative frameworks of Huayan scholar-monks such as Chengguan (738–839) and Zongmi (780–841), as well as Korean thinker Wŏnhyo, from whom he drew key principles to support his vision of unity among Buddhist teachings.

Upon his return from China, Ŭich’ŏn observed significant similarities between the teachings of Hwaŏm and Ch’ŏnt’ae and explored the doctrinal elements they shared. Influenced by Chengguan, he proposed that the taxonomies employed by both schools were structurally aligned (McBride 2016: 136; Lee 2002: 135–155). By drawing connections between the Huayan and Tiantai classifications, Ŭich’ŏn underscored their shared vision of a reality in which all phenomena are interpenetrating—each moment and entity reflecting the whole. This ontological insight served as the metaphysical basis for Ŭich’ŏn’s broader project of doctrinal harmonization (McBride 2016: 149–152).

Although Ŭich’ŏn initially advocated for the study of various Buddhist doctrines, he did not imply that all teachings were equally beneficial for study. Later, influenced by Wŏnhyo’s hwajaeng philosophy, his perspective evolved, and he sought to harmonize all Buddhist teachings and treat them with equal regard. Ŭich’ŏn introduced Wŏnhyo as Korea’s first Ch’ŏnt’ae scholar and extolled him as the master of hwajaeng. (McBride 2016: 78, 146) He also recognized Ch’egwan (諦觀, died 970 CE) as the second Ch’ŏnt’ae scholar. A Koryŏ monk who had studied in China, Ch’egwan wrote an influential introductory book on the Ch’ŏnt’ae school, Essentials of the Four Stages of Teaching of Ch’ŏnt’ae (Ch’ŏnt’ae sagyoŭi, 天台四敎儀), summarizing the core teachings of Ch’ŏnt’ae.

Ŭich’ŏn considered the perspective of Zongmi as the epitome of reconciling doctrinal teaching and Sŏn practice perfectly. (McBride, 2016: 85–89) He believed that the Sŏn and doctrinal schools held equal importance and were compatible. While the Sŏn school eschewed language, the doctrinal schools embraced it. These contrasting stances had their respective merits and flaws, rendering them complementary. Furthermore, adopting Zongmi’s perspective, Ŭich’ŏn identified common ground between Confucianism and Buddhism. Despite their doctrinal differences, he noted that both philosophies emphasized the importance of filial piety. (McBride, 2016: 81) Consequently, he sought to harmonize these philosophies under a single system, scrutinizing their shared idea.

3.1.2 Reconciling Meditation and Doctrine—Chinul (知訥, 1158–1210)

Chinul, one of the most influential Buddhist philosophers in Korea, pursued a reconciliation of meditation and doctrine by identifying their shared ground. He considered meditation, namely Sŏn, and doctrine, specifically Hwaŏm teaching, as two distinct pathways leading to enlightenment.

Chinul’s approach to unifying practice and doctrine was inspired by Zongmi, although he developed his own variations. (H0074; Lee 2002: 201–227) Zongmi categorized Chan Buddhism and doctrinal Buddhism into three levels each and unified them on each level. In other words, the first level of Chan aligned with the first level of the doctrinal school, and so forth. Contrarily, Chinul did not adhere to this three-tiered classification of Sŏn Buddhism. Instead, he categorized Sŏn Buddhism based on whether it discussed sudden enlightenment, resulting in two classification levels. Then, he unified only the practice based on sudden enlightenment and the doctrine of perfect teachings. Sudden enlightenment represents a radical epistemic shift in which wisdom is not attained through discursive reasoning but is instead revealed through an intuitive insight that transcends conventional thought. Perfect teaching, especially as developed in Hwaŏm (Huayan) Buddhism, articulates a vision of the total interpenetration of all phenomena (事事無礙, shishi wu’ai), where each phenomenon reflects and contains all others.

This unification is possible because both approaches incorporate two complementary ways of explaining enlightenment: the negative way and the affirmative way. The negative way outlined the limits of language and thought and revealed the nature of the mind. The affirmative way perceived the mind as the essence of all beings and demonstrated its role in creating things through dependent origination. While Zongmi used these approaches to explain doctrinal teachings, Chinul employed them to harmonize Sŏn and perfect teaching. Sŏn Buddhism primarily employs the negative way to challenge the boundaries of thought and the positive way to emphasize the potency of the mind’s nature. Perfect teaching elucidated the tranquil nature and the dependent origination of all beings. Essentially, Chinul found that the Xingqi in Hwaŏm teachings aligned with the Sŏn teaching that each individual’s mind is the Buddha’s mind. Based on this discovery, he proposed that doctrinal teaching represented the word of Buddha while meditational teaching embodied the mind of Buddha.

3.2 The Formation of Korean Sŏn Buddhism

During the mid-Koryŏ Dynasty, Chinul introduced a new form of practice called Kanhwa Sŏn, which became the primary practice in Korean Sŏn Buddhism. Considered the founder of the Chogye Order, the most significant Buddhist sect in contemporary Korea, Chinul proposed several key characteristics of his practice: the concepts of “void and calm, numinous awareness” (K. kongjŏk yŏngji 空寂靈知), “sudden enlightenment followed by gradual cultivation”, and the “dual practice of samādhi and prajñā (K.chŏnghye ssangsu 定慧雙修)”.

Grounded in the Buddha-nature theory, Sŏn Buddhism emphasized direct experiential practice aimed at realizing one’s true nature. However, this teaching of universal potential for enlightenment simultaneously raises a critical question: if all beings inherently possess Buddha-nature, why are ordinary people unable to perceive it? In his work Secrets on Cultivating the Mind (Susimgyŏl, 修心訣), Chinul provided an answer: just as we cannot see our own body, we cannot perceive the Buddha nature because we are immersed in it and it resides within us (Chinul SW: 208). This Buddha nature is recognized through “the mind of void and calm, numinous awareness.” The term “void and calm” suggests that the mind is insubstantial and reflects all things, similar to a placid lake. “Numinous awareness” involves self-contemplation, illumination of the Buddha nature, and the ability to respond to the interconnected world. The concept “the mind of void and calm, numinous awareness” corresponds to the subjective aspect of the Buddha mind, while the objective aspect aligns with Buddha nature. While these concepts are not existentially divided, they are conceptually separated in the context of the principle of dependent origination. This pure and authentic mind is also referred to as the “original face” (K. pollae myŏnmok, 本來面目) in the Sŏn tradition. When compared to Zongmi’s concept of “original enlightenment and true mind” (Ch. benjuezhenxin, 本覺眞心), referring to the pure mind, the terminology used by Chinul offers a more detailed portrayal of the characteristics of the true mind.

The debate between sudden enlightenment and gradual cultivation was a pivotal discussion in Chan Buddhism. Advocates from the Southern Chan school argued for sudden enlightenment, claiming that immediate insight is sufficient to prove one’s enlightenment, and no additional cultivation is required. Conversely, the Northern Chan school supported the practice of gradual cultivation, considering the human mind to be inherently pure but enshrouded by defilement that requires gradual removal to allow enlightenment to occur. Adopting Zongmi’s approach, Chinul advocated for a dual practice of sudden enlightenment followed by gradual cultivation. He suggested that gradual cultivation is necessary after sudden enlightenment to prevent the recurrence of habitual actions and thoroughly eliminate defilements. He defined true cultivation as a process of cultivation without cultivating anything (Chinul SW: 227). This implies that, after sudden enlightenment, one realizes that deluded thoughts are essentially void, leaving no tangible defilement to be removed. Consequently, the cultivation process progresses without attachment, meaning the practitioner cultivates without clinging to the idea of eradication.

Chinul emphasized the integrated practice of samādhi (concentration) and prajñā (wisdom), which he regarded as the two essential pillars of meditation. Samādhi stabilizes the mind, cultivating a state of calm and clarity, while prajñā penetrates the nature of reality, allowing one to perceive things as they truly are. Chinul maintained that without samādhi, insight lacks the steadiness to see clearly, and without prajñā, concentration alone cannot eliminate the root of defilements. Thus, like two sides of the same coin, samādhi and prajñā are not separate paths but mutually supportive aspects of a single practice. Additionally, he expanded their interpretations of these concepts, linking samādhi to Sŏn practice and prajñā to doctrinal teaching, thereby fusing Sŏn and Hwaŏm in his practice. He further corresponded those practices to the essence and function (Chinul SW: 230). The essence is samādhi, and the function is prajñā. As essence and function are inseparable, so those two practices are inseparable, as well. The balance between them held a pivotal role in Chinul’s teaching, as demonstrated by his three approaches to Sŏn practice: “equal maintenance of quiescence and alertness” (K. sŏngjŏk tŭngji, 惺寂等持), “faith and understanding according to the complete and sudden teaching” (K. wŏndon shinhae, 圓頓信解), and “shortcut” (K. kyŏngjŏl, 徑截). “Equal maintenance of quiescence and alertness” refers to the dual practice of samādhi and prajñā. “Faith and understanding according to the complete and sudden teaching” are connected to the equal practice of Sŏn and Hwaŏm’s doctrinal teaching. Complete teaching refers to Hwaŏm teaching, and sudden teaching refers to Sŏn. The shortcut refers to Kanhwa Sŏn (Ch. Kanhua Chan, 看話禪) practice, which leads directly to enlightenment.

Established by Dahui Zonggao (1089–1163), Kanhua Chan practice concentrates on huatou (K. hwadu, Jp. watō), the critical phrase extracted from Chan dialogues known as gongan (K. kongan, Jp. kōan). In his Treatise on Resolving Doubt about Observing the Keyword (Kanhwa kyŏrŭiron 看話決疑論), Chinul advocated for this practice, deeming it the most effective way to liberate oneself from the maladies in the conceptual understanding of the Buddhist truth (Chinul SW: 317). Even though doctrinal principles convey profound and sublime teachings, they are nonetheless constrained by language. The Sŏn tradition recognizes the limitations of language, which naturally creates a dichotomy between subject and object, leading to a dualistic framework. Aware of this dichotomy, Chinul distinguished between two aspects of hwadu: investigating the meaning (K. ch’amŭi, 參意) and investigating the word (K. ch’amgu, 參句). Investigating the meaning involves interpreting hwadu within a doctrinal context while investigating the word that utilizes hwadu to liberate oneself from conceptual knowledge. These two methods are also related to two types of hwadu, namely, the living word (K. hwalgu) and the dead word (K. sagu). The living word facilitates the practitioner’s return to the original state of emptiness, thus freeing them from the preconceived notions created by linguistic structures. Conversely, the dead word represents the opposite process.

The framework of Chinul’s practice predominantly rests on the principle of sudden enlightenment, understood as the realization of one’s Buddha nature. To engage in this practice, a practitioner should first firmly believe in their inherent Buddhahood. Following this, the Kanhwa Sŏn practice enables practitioners to experience the Buddha within themselves, leading to gradual cultivation. This grounding in the balance of two forms of meditation allows practitioners to perceive the two facets of Buddha nature: its calmness and its colorful arising. Further, this gradual cultivation aims to eliminate defilements completely. Since Chinul’s time, this approach combining sudden enlightenment and gradual cultivation, with the addition of Kanhwa Sŏn practice as a shortcut, has been considered the standard practice in Korean Sŏn Buddhism. This synthesis is the hallmark of Chinul’s system of practice.

4. Conversations between Buddhism and Neo-Confucianism in the Chosŏn Dynasty

The Chosŏn dynasty marked a challenging period for Korean Buddhism. The ruling Neo-Confucian scholars criticized and suppressed Buddhism for its perceived corruption and its teachings that opposed Confucian values. In response, Buddhists emphasized the similarities between Buddhism and Neo-Confucianism and embraced Confucian ethics, including principles of loyalty and filial piety.

4.1 Critique and Defense of Buddhism

Criticism of Buddhism from Neo-Confucian scholars began in the late Koryŏ dynasty, once Buddhism’s socio-economic privileges and their negative consequences were taken seriously. A notable critic was Chŏng Tojŏn (1342–1398 CE), a foundational figure in shaping Neo-Confucian ideologogy during the early Chosŏn dynasty. In his work An Array of Critiques of Buddhism (Pulssi chappyŏn, 佛氏雜辨), he voiced his objections to both the philosophy and practices of Buddhism. In response to these critiques, Buddhist monk Hamhŏ Tŭkt’ong (涵虛得通, 1376–1433 CE) wrote The Exposition of Orthodoxy (Hyŏnjŏngnon, 顯正論), to correct widespread misunderstandings of Buddhism among Neo-Confucian scholars. While the two were never directly debated, these two works highlight the points of contention and defense regarding Buddhism during the Chosŏn dynasty.

Chŏng believed Buddhist philosophy was inherently illogical, and its religious practice hurt Confucian values. His criticisms extended to various aspects of Buddhist doctrines, including transmigration, karma, mind and nature, and ethical principles.

Regarding the concept of transmigration, Chŏng argued from a Confucian perspective that once the soul combines with Yin and Yang and separates into heaven and earth after death, they can never reunite, rendering rebirth impossible. He used the analogy of water drawn from a well, which, once taken, cannot return to the well. Additionally, Chŏng challenged the concept of transmigration by stating that, if it were true, the number of beings in the world would always be the same, but this is not the case. In discussing the causes and effects of karma, he argued that people’s fortune and misfortune are decided by timing, not only by cause and effect. He likened this idea to the process of making liquor, which only develops a good taste when the mixture of ingredients has had sufficient time to ferment.

Chŏng also highlights the inconsistency within Buddhist teachings concerning the relationship between the mind (K. sim 心) and the nature (K. sŏng 性). From his Neo-Confucian perspective, nature represents the principle instilled by heaven, while the mind forms through material force (K. ki 氣), encompassing both nature and emotion (K. chŏng 情). With this foundation, he criticizes Buddhism for its perceived internal contradiction in equating the mind with nature. He began by pointing out conflicting definitions of these concepts within Buddhist scriptures, where the mind and nature were both equated and differentiated. Delusion was associated with the mind, while awakening was linked to nature. Chŏng also took issue with phrases such as “Observe the mind and see the nature” and “Mind is none other than nature” (Chŏng CB: 60), arguing that they created a logical fallacy similar to attempting to eat one’s own mouth.

Furthermore, Chŏng criticized two Buddhist arguments: “functional activity is the nature” and “mind and its trace”. Sŏn Buddhist masters would assert that all human activities were manifestations of the Buddha nature. Chŏng questioned this perspective, suggesting that if one accepted Buddhism’s idea, then acts such as killing others could be labeled as the functional activity of nature. In his Neo-Confucian philosophy, nature represented a pure moral principle centered in the mind, which interacted with external stimuli. Therefore, he viewed Buddhism’s central argument as flawed. Regarding the concept of the mind and its trace, he critiqued Buddhism for separating them, citing a Buddhist sentence: “If the bodhisattva Mañjuśrī wanders taverns, his behavior is wrong, but his mind is right” (Chŏng CB: 64, 121). In his perspective, the mind is equated to essence (K. che), and trace represents function (K. yong), rendering them inseparable.

Chŏng also offered a critique of the metaphysical foundations of Buddhism. Citing Buddhist teachings that state, “Good and evil are from mind. The myriad of phenomena is nothing but consciousness,” he argues that this viewpoint portrays the phenomenal world as an illusory creation of consciousness and mind, devoid of a solid foundation. Consequently, he asserted that such a perspective hinders the objective assessment of good or bad behavior based on moral principles called nature.

In terms of Buddhist practice, Chŏng, along with other Confucian scholars, viewed Buddhism’s promotion of renunciation of familial ties and indiscriminate compassion as particularly problematic. Monks’ abandonment of their families and their celibacy contradicted Confucian values, which placed great importance on marriage and procreation as forms of filial piety. Additionally, Buddhism’s universal compassion conflicted with Confucianism’s emphasis on distinguishing between family and others. Chŏng also pointed out that monks, in their indiscriminate compassion, were even willing to sacrifice their bodies to leopards, a behavior that he considered a violation of the practice of filial piety. In summary, Chŏng Tojŏn’s critique aimed to reveal weaknesses in the Buddhist moral framework.

In defense of Buddhism, Hamhŏ Tŭkt’ong maintained that Buddhism and Confucianism were not fundamentally different. Regarding the topics of transmigration and karma, Hamhŏ emphasized that these teachings motivate individuals to engage in good actions rather than bad ones willingly. Additionally, these teachings promote the importance of emotional control, which fosters self-discipline and encourages virtuous deeds.

While Hamhŏ Tŭkt’ong did not directly comment on the relationship between the mind and nature, he viewed the mind as more than just an illusory empty entity; instead, he saw it as an active and luminous entity, somewhat akin to the Confucian concept of “bright virtue”, which is a characteristic of one’s nature. He also explained the interplay between nature and emotion as a relationship between essence and function. From his perspective, nature and emotion are distinct, with a deluded nature giving rise to emotions. Much like Neo-Confucian scholars, he regarded nature as the pure aspect and emotions as the impure aspect that arises in relation to external stimuli.

When addressing practical ethical issues such as monk celibacy and universal compassion, Hamhŏ argued that the choice of monkhood could provide significant benefits not only to the monks themselves but also to their parents, family members, and even the nation. He contended that it represented the highest form of practicing filial piety and loyalty. Additionally, he equated Confucian virtues, including benevolence, justice, propriety, wisdom, and trust, with Buddhism’s precepts against killing, theft, sexual misconduct, alcohol consumption, and lying. Hamhŏ Tŭkt’ong’s approach to reconciling Buddhism and Neo-Confucianism continued to exert influence on Buddhist philosophy in the Chosŏn Dynasty.

4.2 Harmonizing Buddhism and Confucianism

During the later period of the Chosŏn Dynasty, the discourse seeking harmony between Buddhism and Confucianism gained more popularity. Although Confucian scholars recognized the similarities between the two—both addressing the nature of the mind and advocating for a simple life—they maintained criticisms of Buddhism. During this period of Buddhist suppression, a monk named Hŏŭngdang Pou (虛應堂 普雨 died 1565 CE), who played an instrumental role in the restoration of Buddhism, endeavored to harmonize the two philosophies. He equated Buddhist teachings with other teachings through the Flower Garland sūtra, asserting that both Confucianism and Daoism are applications of this sūtra. Pou attempted to explain Buddhist teaching through Confucian concepts and views in his book, The Treatises of One Rightness (Ilchŏngnon, 一正論). The title, “One,” signifies the origin of all beings and the cause of all change, correlating with the principle of heaven in Neo-Confucianism. All beings exist by obtaining the principle of heaven, which also facilitates the changes of the four seasons. “Rightness” refers to the pure, untainted mind of Buddhism and the right status of the human mind according to Confucianism. This righteous state encompasses Confucian elements of morality: the sense of compassion, shame, respect, and the discernment of right and wrong. Here, “One” also represents the world, and “Rightness” implies the human mind. Consequently, Pou asserted that these two become one, resulting in a unity of the world and the human mind. He expanded his argument by acknowledging that even though the human mind is connected to the principle of heaven, it is still influenced by material force, which can tarnish the human mind. Thus, he proposed practicing Confucian methods, such as reverence and extending knowledge as a means of purification.

5. Korean Buddhism’s Response to Modernity

In the 19th century, Koreans encountered Western philosophy and Christianity. This encounter led to an assumption that traditional elements of Asian culture, including Buddhism, might be considered irrelevant on the path to modern nationhood. Modernization in Korea was frequently synonymous with Westernization. Faced with this shift in perspective, Korean intellectuals embarked on a reevaluation of Buddhism’s role in a modern, Western-influenced society.

In pursuit of this reevaluation, they posed several crucial questions: Is Buddhism worthy of preserving? To what genre does Buddhism belong in the Western academic classification? What are the similarities and the differences between Buddhism and Western thought? How can Buddhist philosophy contribute to the future world?

Moreover, the colonial and postcolonial reality significantly influenced the perception and development of modern Korean Buddhism, prompting greater engagement with social issues than during the Chosŏn period.

5.1 Investigating the Value of Buddhist Philosophy in the Modern Era

5.1.1 Placing Buddhism in the Western Intellectual Context

Korean Buddhists, much like other East Asian Buddhist intellectuals, have undertaken efforts to interpret Buddhism within the framework of Western thought. One of the issues they grapple with is the differentiation between religion and philosophy in Western discourse, a distinction that does not exist in Eastern discourse. Consequently, East Asian Buddhist intellectuals, including Koreans, have proposed that Buddhism encompasses both religious and philosophical elements, though there is disagreement on which elements specifically belong to which category.

Paek Yongsŏng (1864–1940), a Buddhist monk and reformer, placed emphasis on Buddhism as a religion. Han Yongun (1879–1944), a writer and reformer, directed his focus toward the philosophical elements. Yi Chongch’ŏn, a scholar who studied under Inoue Enryō at Toyo University, regarded the doctrinal teachings of Buddhism as philosophical elements, while considering the practice of Buddhism as its religious component (Yi 1918: 35–36). On the other hand, Paek Sŏnguk, the first Korean to study philosophy in Germany, argued that Buddhism is a religion founded on philosophy. In his article titled “Buddhist Metaphysics,” he asserted that Buddhism is a philosophy because it objectively studies truth obtained from reality, and it is a religion because it involves the worship of various deities (Paek 1925: 21–22).

In the late 1910s and the 1920s, Korean Buddhist philosophers, under the influence of Inoue Enryō (井上 円了 1858–1919), began to view Buddhist philosophy as metaphysics. Inoue, one of the most influential philosophers for East Asian intellectuals at the time, described Buddhist philosophy as pure philosophy, in that it examines the essence of the universe and the principles of truth, aligning with German idealism. Consequently, Korean Buddhist philosophers delved into metaphysical issues, such as the relationship between phenomena (dharma) and the actual reality of all phenomena (suchness, Skt. Bhūtakoṭi). The term “actual reality of all phenomena” corresponds to the concept of essence in Western philosophy. In the context of Buddhist philosophy, it refers to truth, the ultimate culmination for all beings, and a representation of things as they are. Kim Ch’ŏlu, a Buddhist scholar, explores the non-dualism within Buddhist metaphysics. Kim asserts,

Buddhism’s primary principle is that phenomena are the actual reality of all phenomena. Less developed religions separate the actual reality of phenomena from phenomena, thus failing to explain the relationship between the actual reality of phenomena and human beings. Buddhism, as an advanced religion, proposes the unity of phenomena and the actual reality of phenomena, elucidating that all phenomena constitute the actual reality of phenomena. (Kim 1919: 53)

Furthermore, Paek Sŏnguk delves into the dynamic tension within the actual reality of phenomena, which conveys the concept of Buddha as the ultimate universal truth. Using Western philosophical categories, he analyzes this truth through two interrelated aspects: the inherent object-truth and the inherent subject-Buddha. This dual framing serves not to establish ontological dualism but to render universal truth more accessible and concrete. In doing so, Paek affirms both the positivity of the phenomenal world and the active role of the subject, Buddha, within it. His approach contrasts with that of Nishida Kitarō (西田幾多郞, 1870–1945), a prominent philosopher of the Kyoto school. Nishida Kitarō articulates “absolute nothingness” as the dynamic field of self-negation in which the duality of subject and object dissolves, positing it as the foundational reality through which all differentiated beings can achieve unity. While Nishida emphasizes the dissolution of all dualities into a formless ground, Paek retains a structure affirming the dynamic interplay between self and world within a non-dual framework.

5.1.2 Aligning Buddhist Philosophy with Modern Thought

During this era, Social Darwinism emerged as a prevailing intellectual trend, asserting that all cultures must progress, and only those that advance and adapt can survive. In this context, Han Yongun took on the challenge of demonstrating the relevance of Buddhism by identifying its modern elements. He discovered ideas related to free will and egalitarianism in Buddhist teachings and argued that Buddhism held the potential to contribute to a better world than social evolution theory would.

Drawing inspiration from the works of Liang Qichao (1873–1929), a prominent modern Chinese thinker (Han 2016: 105–108), Han Yongun equated free will with the Buddhist concept of suchness, the true nature of all beings. In comparing Kant’s philosophy with Buddhism, Liang Qichao interpreted suchness as the moral subject possessing free will, whereas the state of ignorance prior to enlightenment reflects the absence of free will. Liang further argued that while Kant’s moral subject pertains to individuals, Buddha’s suchness applies universally to all human beings. Han Yongun embraced this interpretation as a basis for asserting Buddhism’s superiority over Western philosophy.

Moreover, Han Yongun characterized Buddhism as embodying egalitarian principles. Traditional Buddhist philosophy postulates two levels of truth: conventional truth and ultimate truth. The former, which emerges from the principle of cause and effect, holds a variety of distinct beings. Conversely, the world of ultimate truth represents the inherent nature of all beings, manifesting its nature of emptiness. Building upon this philosophical foundation, he articulated,

“Looking from the viewpoint of inequality, there is nothing that is not unequal, but from the viewpoint of equality, there is nothing that is not equal. What, then, is inequality? It refers to the fact that all things and phenomena are subject to the laws of necessity. What does equality mean? It refers to the free, unconstrained truth that transcends time and space. ”(Han 2016: 112–113)

In this manner, Han Yongun brought a modern sensibility to Buddhist teachings. Moreover, he envisioned a Buddhism-led future, arguing that its core doctrines guaranteed freedom for all within an egalitarian framework. Building on that perspective, he planned to incorporate socialist ideas with his egalitarian outlook, thereby formulating a vision of Buddhist socialism grounded in socio-economic equality.

5.1.3 Comparison of Buddhism to Christianity

In response to the competition posed by Christian missionary efforts, Paek Yongsŏng (1864–1940) embarked on a comparative analysis between Christianity and Buddhism with the aim of demonstrating the superiority of Buddhism (Paek 2016). He argued that Christianity lacked a comprehensive understanding of the mind, even though it shared similarities to Buddhism in terms of the concept of a fair exchange of good deeds and their rewards. Expanding on this viewpoint, he critiqued the notion of God as a separate creator distinct from his creations. According to Buddhist philosophy, the original mind gives rise to all beings, and Buddha’s mind resides within the minds of individuals. He also criticized the idea of divine punishment for original sin, as it seemed harsh for a creator to chastise individuals after permitting them to err.

5.1.4 The Identity of Korean Buddhism

Amid the effort to align Buddhism with Western thought, a movement emerged to preserve traditional Korean Buddhism and rediscover its distinct identity. Monk Sŏkjŏn (1870–1948) is one of the leading figures of it. He started teaching Buddhist classics to individuals passionate about Korean studies and the essence of Korea’s spirit. Among his students, Ch’oe Namsŏn (1890–1957) wrote two articles delineating the identity of Korean Buddhism: “Overview of Korean Buddhism: A Diachronic Approach to Korean Buddhism” (1918) and “Korean Buddhism: Its Position in the Cultural History of the East” (1930). Through these works, he emphasizes that Korean Buddhism played an active and significant role in the evolution of Buddhism in East Asia, rather than merely assimilating Chinese Buddhism into their own culture. He asserts that Korean Buddhism surpassed other East Asian forms of Buddhism, both in its philosophical depth and artistic expression.

Ch’oe Namsŏn gives special attention to the hwajaeng (reconciling Buddhist doctrines) philosophy of Wŏnhyo, which encapsulates all Buddhist teachings and practices as one. He dubbed this form of Buddhism as “unified Buddhism,” “completed Buddhism,” or “synthesis Buddhism (K. T’ong Pulgyo),” branding it as the distinctive identity of Korean Buddhism. Ch’oe’s arguments continued to be well-received by Korean Buddhist scholars even after Korea’s liberation, leading to “Unified Buddhism” being perceived as a defining characteristic of Korean Buddhism. This view remained largely unchallenged until 1985, when Shim Jaeryong brought it into question (Shim 1999: 171–181). He argued that the idea of unified Buddhism as a defining feature of Korean Buddhism had been taken up without rigorous scrutiny. Building on Shim’s critique, scholars trained outside of Korea took a more critical stance, contending that unified Buddhism was a product of nationalism and nationalist historiography and, thus, a historical fabrication.

5.2 Popularizing Buddhism

The essence of modernity lies in its emancipation from mysticism, embracing human reason, and promoting individual rights. These notions also resonated with the transformation of Korean Buddhism from the late 19th to the 20th century. Buddhist intellectuals reinterpreted traditional practices through the lens of individual responsibility for awakening, aligning it with modern notions of self-cultivation and social responsibility. This shift implies a revaluation of Buddhist soteriology—from salvation as divine favor to enlightenment as a self-driven ethical and existential project rooted in everyday life. In doing so, Korean Buddhism positioned itself not as an otherworldly tradition but as a modern moral philosophy capable of addressing personal and societal suffering.

5.2.1 Enlightenment and Social Engagement

Paek Yongsŏng identified enlightenment as the unique and pivotal aspect of Buddhist thought, aiming to reestablish its original intent in the lives of laypeople. Rooted in Sŏn Buddhism, “enlightenment” denoted the realization of one’s intrinsic Buddhahood. Great enlightenment, in this context, signifies the attainment of the original nature of the human mind. According to Paek, every individual should not only attain enlightenment but also actively help others achieve the same realization. Enlightenment, in his view, was a path to uncovering one’s true identity and inner strength. To promote this vision, he founded the Order of Great Awakening (Taegakkyo) in 1922 and launched the Great Awakening (Taegak) school movement, which provided laypeople—who had previously lacked access—with opportunities to participate in meditation classes. However, Paek’s emphasis extended beyond personal liberation; he underscored the importance of socially engaged practice, rooted in the Buddhist ideal of “saving all sentient beings.”

Paek Yongsŏng and Han Yongun were not just theorists but also activists who energetically participated in social movements, such as the Korean Independence movement. While Han Yongun was intrigued by social Buddhism, he did not develop his own comprehensive social theory. In contrast, Paek Sŏnguk expanded his philosophical journey to include social theory. After a thorough examination of cosmology, he posited that a single principle (K. illi) constructed the cosmos. Applying this principle to the human world, he argued that it could transform this impure land into the Pure Land (Paek 2021: 81).

According to Paek, this principle applies to three aspects of human life: in legal life, it dictates the rules of human communities; in economic life, it ensures a fair distribution of resources; and in spiritual life, it bestows meaning to existence. Paek contended that each facet of life should maintain its boundaries and balance, with spiritual life taking the lead. An excessive focus on legal life might suppress economic equality and individual freedom, while an overemphasis on economic life could turn humans into mere working machines. If spiritual life remained intertwined with the other spheres, that might disrupt harmful patterns there, ultimately benefiting humanity and shaping a more humane existence. In his social theory, Paek Sŏnguk effectively fused the Hwaŏm Buddhist philosophy with the modern social theory.

5.2.2 Won Buddhism

Won Buddhism, a relatively modern Buddhist movement, was founded by Park Chungbin (1891–1943), who became known as Sot’aesan. Interestingly, Park did not undergo formal training in the Buddhist tradition; instead, his connection to Buddhism emerged after enlightenment, which he recognized as akin to the descriptions of enlightenment found in Buddhism. Won Buddhism predominantly embraces Buddhist teachings but reformulates them in a manner that is more accessible to laypeople. Central to its philosophy is the belief that Buddhism should transcend distinctions between Buddhist clergy and lay practitioners, as well as between Buddha and sentient beings. The doctrinal foundation of Won Buddhism is articulated in the Scripture of Won Buddhism (Wŏn Pulgyo kyojŏn).

At the core of Won Buddhism’s doctrinal framework lies the concept of the “One Circle Form” (K. irwŏnsang), symbolizing the dharmakāya Buddha, which represents the essence of all beings and Buddhas, as well as Buddha nature. This concept is depicted in a circular form because it signifies the perpetual transformation between being and non-being, revealing their inherent emptiness and completeness. The ultimate objective of Won Buddhism is to attain Buddhahood, aligning with the aspirations of other Buddhist traditions. To achieve this enlightenment, Sot’aesan introduced the framework of the fourfold grace of human life and three practices. The fourfold grace includes heaven and earth, parents, brethren, and law, as they grant life and support one’s existence. The three core practices in Won Buddhism mirror the traditional Buddhist triad of concentration (Skt. samādhi), wisdom, and precepts. These practices are structured as follows: cultivation of the spirit (K. chŏngsin suyang), inquiry into facts and principles (K. sari yŏn’gu), and careful selection of karmic actions (K. chagŏp ch’wisa).

Adapted from the foundational principles of Buddhism, these practices serve as a guide for spiritual development. In daily life, practitioners are encouraged to engage in regular meditation called “timeless sŏn” (K. musi sŏnpŏb) and adhere to the nine essential dharmas of daily practice, intending to dispel afflictions. Among these nine rules, three correspond to the fundamental practices mentioned earlier, emphasizing the transformation of negative mindsets into positive virtues, including belief, zeal, dedication, gratitude, self-reliance, and goodwill.

5.2.3 Socially Engaged Buddhism

In the 1980s, Minjung Buddhism emerged as part of the Minjung movement in South Korea, a social movement dedicated to the liberation of the “minjung.” The term “minjung,” which means “common people,” refers to those who are oppressed by the ruling class but who nonetheless have the potential to become agents in shaping history. Alongside Minjung movement activists, young Buddhists established the Minjung Buddhism Society in 1975. Chŏn Chaesŏng wrote “The Theory of Minjung Buddhism” and published it in the journal Dialogue (Taehwa) in 1977. Although the article did not present an intense, argumentative discourse, it did introduce the basic principles of Minjung Buddhism and encouraged young Buddhists to participate in the social and political reality of Korean society.

Minjung Buddhists derived their theoretical framework from Buddhist philosophy, adapted via Marxist theory. They first sought Buddhist teachings that resonated with Marxist ideology and found numerous similarities between Marxism and early Buddhism. Both systems embrace atheism, materialism, empiricism, and egalitarianism. Here, the term materialism differs from 19th-century mechanistic materialism; rather than reducing existence to inert matter, early Buddhism recognizes the material and physical conditions of life as fundamental to suffering, causality, and transformation. Without appealing to divine intervention, early Buddhism explained the world in empirical and ethical terms. It depicted rūpa (form/matter) as a foundational element of human existence, emphasized empiricism, and advocated for egalitarian communities of monks akin to the primitive communities described by Marx.

Later, the Buddhist monk, Pŏpsŏng, brought together the varied threads of Minjung Buddhist philosophical discourse and highlighted how Minjung Buddhism reinterpreted fundamental Buddhist concepts to reveal the revolutionary characteristics of Buddhism. The concepts included dependent arising, karma, and Pure Land, with all new interpretations pointing towards emphasizing the self-reliance of the minjung or general public.

The Buddhist principle of dependent arising supports the social engagement of Buddhism. It situates each individual’s life in the broader scope of history and reveals history to be a tapestry woven from the threads of individual lives. Additionally, one’s deeds and social activities lead to social change because people and society are interconnected. This new interpretation of Buddhist concepts formed the basis for the argument that the minjung has the capacity to promote change.

Minjung Buddhists also understood karma as people’s creative activity that shapes the world and transforms themselves. Utilizing the concept of “karma,” they emphasized human self-reliance, asserting that without human action or karma, no change or revolution can occur. They drew parallels between the Marxist concept of “motion,” a fundamental principle in dialectical materialism that denotes the continuous change in the world and human thought, and karma. They proposed that the motion of the world is a universal principle, and karma embodies this principle in humans. That is, karma is the expression of human engagement with the world, and it constitutes a part of the world’s overall motion. One’s past karma influences the present, and present karma molds the future, implying that the entire world is shaped by the power of karma. The emphasis on human self-reliance in the concept of karma is strongly tied to the idea of the minjung, which signifies not just those who are oppressed but also those who are agents of historical and social change. Both Minjung Buddhism and Minjung Theology highlight the potential of the minjung to bring about revolution.

Minjung Buddhists aimed to establish an ideal society called the Pure Land (Chŏngt’o). Traditionally, Pure Land Buddhist philosophy has two aspects: being reborn in Amita Buddha’s Pure Land and creating the Pure Land in this world at this moment. Minjung Buddhists accepted the latter, arguing that we can live in the Pure Land when we strive to overcome the contradictions of society and individuals. Through Minjung Buddhism, Korean Buddhists envisioned a social revolution.

After the democratization of South Korea in 1987, the Minjung Buddhist movement gradually waned. Most of its members transformed the movement into a more socially accessible form known as “practical Buddhism” (K. silch’ŏn Pulgyo), which later evolved into “socially engaged Buddhism” (K. ch’amyŏ Pulgyo). They have led environmental protection, Korean unification, and other social movements. The philosophy of Minjung Buddhism became the theoretical foundation for socially engaged Buddhism, which is rooted in the belief that individuals are the agents of societal change and that people’s creative actions can transform the world.

Two notable groups actively involved in social issues blend these principles with traditional Buddhist philosophy: The Jungto Society and Indra’s Net Community. The Jungto Society adopted the Minjung Buddhists’ objective of creating the Pure Land in the current world. However, the Jungto Society does not focus on political revolution; instead, its primary concerns are individual happiness and a harmonious world based on non-dualistic Buddhist philosophy. Meanwhile, the Indra’s Net Community embraces the Hwaŏm philosophy of an interconnected world, encapsulated in the idea that “one is all, and all is one,” as appeared in Ŭisang’s Ocean Seal Chart. The metaphor of Indra’s net implies the teaching that all beings are interconnected. As such, the Indra’s Net Community concentrates on restoring the connection between people and the earth through ecological movements and care for all life forms on earth.

5.3 Women and Korean Buddhist Philosophy

In the modern era, women struggled for gender equality and sought liberation from a patriarchal society. Kim Iryŏp (1896–1971), a leading figure among the “New Woman” (K. sinyŏsŏng) of her time, actively confronted these issues and discovered profound insights within Sŏn Buddhism. Prior to her life as a Buddhist nun, she gained recognition as a prominent writer and female intellectual and was deeply involved in the women’s movement. Following her ordination as a nun, she wholeheartedly dedicated herself to Buddhist practice and philosophy, while she was not explicitly engaging in the women’s movement during that time. Her explorations nevertheless delved into women’s issues at a more fundamental level (J. Park 2017b). Nearly three decades after she joined the monastery, she published three books, including Reflections of a Zen Buddhist Nun, and rekindled her connection with society. In her publications, she skillfully applied traditional Sŏn teachings to address her search for the authentic self and presented a novel approach to philosophical inquiry.

In her essay collections, Kim Iryŏp employed her personal experiences as a foundation for philosophical contemplation, interpreting them in the context of Buddhist teachings. Through her life journey as a woman in a patriarchal society, she sought answers to questions regarding human existence, identity, societal constraints, and love.

During her Sŏn practice, Kim Iryŏp encountered the concept of the “great self,” representing a universal existence that transcended individual selves. She made a clear distinction between the individual self, often referred to as the “small self,” and the authentic self which she calls “the great self.” The great self does not exist as an independent entity but rather symbolizes the openness of the self. In the context of gender-related issues, the “small self” represents the confined “I,” constrained by societal gender norms, whereas the “great self” epitomizes the liberated self, free from societal restrictions. Before engaging with Buddhist philosophy, Kim primarily focused on seeking liberation from social norms. However, as a Buddhist nun, she transcended the binary opposition between social restriction and freedom, attaining a deeper, non-dualistic form of liberation rooted in spiritual insight.

She also introduced the concept of “creativity” as the pathway to liberation from the constricting small self and the embrace of the expansive great self. This creativity is synonymous with each person’s original mind, which serves as the wellspring of one’s existence. Recognizing this original mind led to the realization of becoming a “complete being,” someone whose existence harmonized with the universe. Kim Iryŏp’s philosophy vividly illustrated how Buddhist teachings could serve as a powerful tool for both personal and social transformation.

Another noteworthy Buddhist nun, Daehaeng (1927–2012), the founder of the Hanmaum Seon Center (Hanmaŭm Sŏnwŏn), revolutionized traditional Buddhist practices in response to the needs of people. She focused on healing individuals, and she proposed “one mind” or hanmaŭm thought and chuin’gong practice as methods for healing. “Hanmaum” signifies the concept of “one Mind” (K. ilsim), an alternative expression of Buddha nature. Daehaeng posits that the One Mind (hanmaum, 한마음) is the source of all existence—it permeates all beings, and all phenomena arise from it. Chuin’gong (주인공) refers to the “insubstantial doer,” the individualized manifestation of the One Mind within each person. Daehaeng teaches that practitioners should entrust everything to chuin’gong, which she identifies as the true center and master of the self. To prevent misunderstandings of chuin’gong as a transcendental or external deity, Daehaeng emphasizes its emptiness by altering the Chinese character gong (公, “master”) to gong (空, “emptiness”), thereby underscoring its non-substantial and non-dual nature. Chuin’gong practice does not require formal seated meditation at designated times or places; rather, practitioners are encouraged to call upon chuin’gong whenever the need arises. Because of its simplicity and adaptability, this approach made the practice highly accessible to ordinary people in their daily lives.

Modern Korean women Buddhist philosophers like Kim Iryŏp and Daehaeng have reshaped traditional Buddhist philosophy in the context of modern and gender related issues and demonstrated the capacity of Buddhist teachings to address existential questions, especially for women. Their dedicated efforts have also contributed to the enrichment of the tapestry of Korean Buddhist philosophy in modern times.

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Other Internet Resources

• Baek, Yongseong, The Sun over the Sea of Enlightenment [Gakhae illyun], translated by Suh Junghyung.
• Han’guk Pulgkyo Chŏnsŏ (한국불교전서) [Collected Works of Korean Buddhism], Dongguk Taehakkyo Ch’ulp’anbu.
• Kŭntae Pulgyo Chapchi (근대불교잡지) [Buddhist Journals in modern Korea], Dongguk Taehakkyo Ch’ulp’anbu.

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