Japanese Zen Buddhist Philosophy

First published Wed Jun 28, 2006; substantive revision Thu Mar 7, 2024

Zen, like the other forms of Buddhism, aims at the perfection or realization of personhood. To this end, sitting meditation called “za-zen” (坐禅) is a foundational method of prāxis across the various schools of this Buddha-Way—which is not an ideology, but a way of living. Through za-zen the Zen practitioner attempts to embody non-discriminatory wisdom vis-à-vis the meditational experience known as “satori.” A process of discovering wisdom culminates, among other things, in the experiential apprehension of the equality of all thing-events without discrimination.

The most distinguishing feature of this school of the Buddha-Way is its contention that wisdom, accompanied by compassion, is expressed in the everyday lifeworld when associating with one’s self, other people, and nature. By contrast, the everyday lifeworld for most people is an evanescent transforming state in which living is consumed, philosophically speaking, by an either-or, ego-logical, dualistic paradigm of thinking with its attendant psychological states such as stress and anxiety. Zen demands an overcoming of this paradigm in practice by achieving a holistic and nondualistic perspective in cognition. Then, the Zen practitioner can celebrate, with stillness of mind, a life directed toward the concrete thing-events of everyday life and nature. For this reason, the Zen practitioner is required to embody the freedom expressive of original human nature, what is commonly called “buddha-nature.”

Generally speaking, Zen cherishes simplicity and straightforwardness in grasping reality and acting on it “here and now,” for it believes that a thing-event that is immediately presencing before one’s eyes or under one’s foot is no other than an expression of suchness. In other words the thing-event is disclosing its primordial mode of being such that it is as it is. It also understands a specificity of the thing-event to be a recapitulation of the whole; parts and the whole are to be lived in an inseparable relationship through an exercise of nondiscriminatory wisdom, without prioritizing the visible over the invisible, the explicit over the implicit, or vice versa.

As such, Zen maintains a stance of “not one” and “not two,” that is “a positionless position,” where “not two” means negating the dualistic stance that divides the whole into two parts, while “not one” means negating the nondualistic stance occurring when the Zen practitioner dwells in the whole as one, while suspending judgment in meditation. The free, bilateral movement between “not one” and “not two” characterizes Zen’s achievement of a personhood with a third perspective that cannot be confined to either dualism or non-dualism, neither “not one” nor “not two”.

1. The Meaning of the Term Zen

The designation of this school of the Buddha-Way as Zen, which means meditation, is derived from a transliteration of the Chinese word Chán (禅). Because the Chinese term is in turn a transliteration of the Sanskrit term dhyāna, however, Zen owes its historical origin to early Indian Buddhism, where a deepened state of meditation, called samādhi, was singled out as one of the three components of study a Buddhist was required to master, the other two being an observation of ethical precepts (sīla) and an embodiment of nondiscriminatory wisdom (prajñā). Meditation was picked as the name for this school because the historical Buddha achieved enlightenment (nirvāna) through the practice of meditation. In the context of Zen Buddhism, the perfection of nondiscriminatory wisdom (Jpn.: hannya haramitsu; Skrt.: prajñāpāramitā) designates practical, experiential knowledge. Only secondarily and derivatively does it mean theoretical, intellectual knowledge. This is, Zen explains, because theoretical knowledge is a form of “language game” (Jpn.: keron; Skrt.: prapañca), i.e., discrimination through the use of language, constructed as it is at least in part on distinction-making. Zen believes that theoretical reference in itself ultimately carries no existential meaning for emancipating a human being from his or her predicaments, for it maintains that discriminatory knowledge of any kind is delusory/illusory in nature. (See Dōgen’s “Hachidai ninkaku,” in Shōbōgenzō, Vol. 2, Nihon Shisō taikei, p.494.) To this effect it holds that it is through a practical transformation of the psychophysiological constitution of one’s being that one prepares for embodying nondiscriminatory wisdom. This preparation involves the training of the whole person and is called “self-cultivation” (shugyō) in Japanese. It is a practical method of correcting the modality of one’s mind by correcting the modality of one’s body, in which practice (prāxis) is given precedence over theory (theōria) (Yuasa, 1987).

A typical pattern for developing Western philosophies is to begin with everyday observations and reasonings and then to refine those observations with further observations and reasonings to come to what are often not everyday (but philosophically more sophisticated and justifiable) understandings of reality. Zen mistrusts that approach because it is a vicious circle. If ordinary observations are unreliable, how can we trust further observations to correct them? If ordinary rational arguments and judgments are unreliable, why should further reasoning improve the situation? Zen maintains instead that we must begin by correcting the observing and thinking process itself by extirpating the roots of their delusion-generating functions. How can this be done? Through Zen praxis. Thus, this entry on Zen Buddhist Philosophy begins with a description of that praxis and the way it transforms how one engages self, others, and world. Only then can Zen’s philosophy be discussed in its proper context.

2. Zen’s Methods: Kōan [公案] Practice and Just Sitting

There are basically two methods utilized in meditation practice in Zen Buddhism to assist the practitioner to reach the above-mentioned goals, together with a simple breathing exercise known as “observation of breath count” (sūsokukan, 数息観); one is the kōan method and the other is called “just sitting” (shikan taza, 只菅打坐), a form of “single act” samādhi. The former is mainly associated with the Rinzai school of Zen Buddhism, while the latter with the Sōtō school; the two schools still flourishing today in Japan. In the Rinzai school, the kōan method is devised to assist the practitioner to become a “Zen person” (Kasulis, 1981) who fully embodies both wisdom and compassion. A kōan is formulated like a riddle or puzzle and is designed in such a way that intellectual reasoning alone cannot solve it without breaking through the barrier of ego-consciousness by driving it to its limit. It cannot solve it. This is, Zen believes, because ego-consciousness is fortified by the shield of a dualistic conceptual paradigm with all its attendant presuppositions and conditions. The ego-consciousness of a given cultural and historical milieu accepts that paradigm to be true in order to live a life anchored in the everyday standpoint and its binaries including subject-object, I-other, self-world, and so forth.

According to Hakuin (1685–1768), who systematized kōans in the modern Japanese Rinzai tradition, there are formally seventeen hundred cases of kōans, and if sub-questions are added, the total would be roughly three thousand. Aided by Zen meditation, the Zen practitioner of the Rinzai school must pass them in a private consultation with a Zen master who verifies the practitioner’s state of mind before he or she is granted a seal of transmission. This transmission is said to occur “only from a Buddha to a[nother] Buddha” (yuibutsu yobutsu).

Kōans are accordingly grouped into five categories in a most fully developed system: the first group is designed for reaching ri (suchness) (richi, 理至) or the body of truth (hosshin), i.e., an enlightenment experience; the second group for a linguistic articulation (gonsen, 言詮) of meditational experiences in order to master the skillful use of language; the third group for those kōans truly difficult to pass (nantō, 難透); the fourth group for the practitioner to make an insight of kōan experiences pertinent to daily life (kikan, 機関) in order to embody a middle-way in which the practitioner won’t be stuck either in the state of meditation or the activity of daily life; and the fifth group for going beyond the state of buddhahood by erasing all traces of enlightenment in order to achieve a traceless enlightenment (kōjō, 向上) (Ueda, p. 150).

The Rinzai school summarizes this process of self-cultivation in four mottoes: “being a special transmission outside of the scriptures,” “having no dependence on words and letters,” “pointing directly into [one’s] human mind,” and “seeing into [one’s] nature to become a buddha.” (See, for examples, The Gateless Gate and The Blue Cliff Record.) While the first two phrases point to the fact of discovering an extra-linguistic reality that naturally opens up in meditational experience and of articulating it linguistically in the “best” way according to the capacity of an individual practitioner, the last two phrases indicate a concretization of the original or inherent enlightenment (hongaku) in the Zen practitioner, where the original enlightenment means that human beings are innately endowed with a possibility of becoming a Buddha. (For a description and analysis of kōan training in today’s Rinzai monastic setting, see Hori 2020.)

On the other hand, the Sōtō school, of which Dōgen (1200–54) is the founder, does not rely on an elaborate kōan system to learn to become a Zen person, but instead follows a method called “just sitting” (shikan taza). It refers to a single-minded, diligent practice where the qualifying term “just” means the practice of meditation without any intervention of ego-logical interest, concern, or desire, so that the practice remains undefiled. This is a method of meditation predicated on the belief that the Zen practitioner engages in the practice in the midst of the original enlightenment. Or in Dōgen’s phrase, it is a method of “practice-realization” (shushō, 修証). By hyphenating practice and realization, the implication is that meditation is not a means to an end, i.e., a means to realization. Thus, Dōgen closes a dualistic gap, for example, between potentiality and actuality, between before and after. As a result, he also collapses the traditional distinction between “acquired enlightenment” (shikaku, 始覚) and “original enlightenment,” (hongaku), 本覚) where the “acquired” enlightenment means an enlightenment that is realized through the practice of meditation as a means. With this collapsing, the Sōtō School holds that practice and realization are non-dual in relation to each other; they are “not two.”

According to the Sōtō school, the meditational practice, when it is seen as a process of discovery, is a deepening process of becoming aware of the original enlightenment with an expansion of its corresponding experiential correlates and horizons, and it is for this reason called the school of “silent illumination.” On the other hand, the Rinzai school stresses moments of breakthrough and insight (kenshō, 見性), typically triggered by kōan practice. Even though there is the above difference in approach between Rinzai and Sōtō schools, the outcome is the same for both insofar as the embodiment of wisdom and compassion is concerned. This is because they both emphasize the same practice of sitting meditation. Whatever differences there are between the practitioners of the two schools in regard to the linguistic articulation of their meditational experience, they arise from individual practitioners’ personalities, dispositions, intellectual capacities, and/or linguistic abilities.

3. The Practice: A Three-Step Process

Although there may be variations in the details, when one engages in Zen meditation, the practitioner generally follows a three-step procedure: adjusting one’s body, breathing, and mind (see Dōgen 1972, 2-6). The practitioner follows these adjustments in the order mentioned when he or she begins. When concluding a sitting session, the procedure is reversed so that he or she can return to an everyday standpoint. We now briefly explain these three steps in the order mentioned.

3.1 The Adjustment of the Body

Generally speaking, the adjustment of the body means to prepare oneself (one’s mind-body) in such a way that one can achieve an optimal state of being free. To do so, the practitioner needs to have a proper diet, engage in appropriate physical exercise, and avoid forming habits contrary to nurturing a healthy mind-body condition. Specifically, however, when Zen mentions the adjustment of the body, it has in mind seated meditation postures. There are two postures which Zen recognizes: the lotus-posture and the half-lotus posture. A long Zen tradition takes them to be effective for stilling the mind and dissolving various psychological complexes and psychosomatic disorders. However, if a lay practitioner cannot at first assume these postures, they can be substituted initially by sitting on a chair with the spine straight, as it can bring about a similar effect. The adjustment of the body is necessary for the practitioner in order to experience the practical benefits of doing meditation.

3.2 The Adjustment of Breathing

The benefits of Zen meditation are closely tied to the practice of breathing. Generally speaking, Zen doesn’t recommend any complicated, strenuous breathing exercises as in Yoga. Zen’s breathing exercise is called “observation of breath count.” In this exercise, the practitioner counts an in-coming breath and an out-going breath. Before counting the breath, the practitioner breathes in through the nostrils and breathes out through the mouth a couple of times. Then one starts counting breaths, but this time breathing in through the nostrils and breathing out through the nostrils. The breath count is performed while performing an abdominal breathing: one brings in air all the way down to the lower abdomen, and breathes out from there. This exercise has the effect of infusing one’s mind-body with fresh life-energy and expelling a negative toxic energy out of the practitioner’s system. For this reason, it must be done in a place where there is ample ventilation. A key to performing breathing exercises successfully is just to observe the in-coming and out-going breath.

Though these are simple instructions, they are difficult to execute because the neophyte tends to become distracted. Present concerns, worries, fears, and past memories often surface. Zen calls them “wandering thoughts,” which refers to any mental object that prevents the practitioner from concentrating. If one wants to make progress in meditation, this is one of the first things that the practitioner must learn to overcome.

We now turn to the psycho-physiological meaning of the breathing exercise. Ordinarily, we breathe sixteen to seventeen times per minute, which we do unconsciously or involuntarily. This is because under ordinary circumstances, breathing is controlled by the autonomic nervous system. Neurophysiologically, the center where breathing is controlled is found in the hypothalamus, in the mid-brain. The autonomic nervous system is so-called because it functions independently of our will. Zen breathing is a shift from unconscious, involuntary breathing to conscious, self-aware breathing. This means that Zen meditation is a way of regulating the unconscious-autonomic order of our being. Psychologically, counting the breath trains the unconscious mind and neurophysiologically, it trains the involuntary activity of the nerves that control the function of the various visceral organs. Here we find a reason why Zen recommends abdominal breathing. Nerves are bundled in the upper part of the abdominal cavity, and the abdominal breathing exercise stimulates this bundle. As it does so, parasympathetic nerves still the mind.

This point is significant in learning to control emotion. Ordinarily, we are told to control our emotion by exercising our will. This is, for example, what Kant recommends. This method works to a certain extent, but we expend our energy unnecessarily in exercising our will. Think of a situation where one tries to submerge a ball in water. When the size of the ball is relatively small, this can be accomplished with little effort. But as the size of the ball becomes larger, it becomes increasingly difficult. Analogously, a lot of psychic energy is required to suppress one’s deeper emotions. There comes a time then when one can no longer hold them down. Consequently, one may end up exploding in various ways, ranging from personal fits to violent social crimes. If we observe a person in an angry state, we will notice that such a person’s breathing pattern and rhythm is shallow, rough, and irregular.

On the other hand, if we observe a person in a peaceful state, the breathing is deep, smooth, slow, and rhythmical. These examples show that there is a strong correlation between the pattern and the rhythm of breathing and a person’s emotional state, or more generally, state of mind. Zen breathing has a way of naturally heightening the positive correlation between the activity of the autonomic nervous system and emotion. Neurophysiologically, it happens that the center where breathing is regulated and the region where emotion is generated coincide. This means that the conscious breathing psychologically affects the pattern of how one generates emotion, and at the same time it also has a neurophysiological effect on how the autonomous activity of the unconscious is regulated. We will now move on to the third step involved in meditation. (See Yuasa, 1993, pp.47–60.)

3.3 The Adjustment of the Mind

Once the bodily posture and the breathing are adjusted, the practitioner next learns to adjust the mind. This means that the practitioner consciously moves to enter a state of meditation. In so doing, the practitioner learns to disengage him- or herself from the concerns of daily life. That is to say, one tries to stop the operation of the conscious mind. However, if one tries to stop the mind by using one’s mind, the mind which is trying to stop itself is still operative. In other words, it is practically impossible to stop the mind by using the mind. Instead, Zen tries to accomplish this by the immobile bodily posture and the breathing exercise. In this connection, it will be informative to know how the practitioner experiences breathing as he or she deepens meditation.

We can identify three basic stages: initially the practitioner can hear the audible sound of the in-coming and out-going breaths. This is rough and “gross” breathing. This is followed by the second stage in which he or she can feel the pathway of the in-coming and out-going breaths. Breathing at this point becomes “subtle” in that there will no longer be audible sound of the breaths but simply a stream of life-energy. In the third stage there is no more feeling of the in-coming and out-going breaths. When this occurs, the practitioner can settle into a deeper meditational state. Also, it is significant to note that as the practitioner enters a deeper state of meditation, the interval between inhalation and exhalation is prolonged, i.e., the retention of breath is prolonged, as the reduction of breathing activities occurs.

Meditation trains one to sit face-to-face with one’s self, while creating a psychological isolation from the external world. With this, one enters into an internal world of psychē. As the practitioner attempts to enter the world of psychē, various things start surfacing in the field of the practitioner’s meditative awareness. These are mostly things of concern that have occupied the practitioner in the history of his or her life, or things the practitioner has consciously suppressed for various reasons. Initially, the practitioner experiences recent desires, anxieties, concerns, ideas, and images that have surfaced in his or her daily life. A psychological reason that the practitioner experiences these various things is due in part to the fact the practitioner has lowered the level of conscious activity, by assuming the meditation posture, and doing the breathing exercise. This mechanism is the same as when one has a dream at night. When the level of consciousness is lowered, the suppressive power of ego-consciousness weakens, and consequently the autonomous activity of the unconscious begins to surface.

However, these desires, images and ideas are distractions insofar as meditation is concerned. This is because in meditation you must learn to focus your awareness on one thing. One must learn just to observe without getting involved in them. That is, one must learn to dis-identify oneself with them. In the deepening process of meditation then, one can roughly identify three distinct stages: 1) the stage of concentration (dhāraṇā), wherein a dualistic standpoint is operative, i.e., there is a practitioner who concentrates and an object on which he/she concentrates, 2) the stage of meditation (dhyāna), in which this dualistic framework will gradually start crumbling, and 3) the stage of absorption (samādhi), wherein this framework will disappear and be replaced by a non-dualistic framework. In this deepening process, we can discern (movement from a dualistic stance to a non-dualistic stance.

As the practitioner repeats this process over a long period of time, he or she will come to experience a state in which no-thing appears. Zen uses the phrase “no-mind” (mushin, 無心) to designate this state. No-mind does not mean a mindless state. Nor does it mean that there is no mind. It means that there is no conscious activity of the mind that is associated with ego-consciousness in the everyday standpoint. In other word, no-mind is a free mind that is not delimited by ideas, desires, and images. No-mind is a state of mind in which there is neither a superimposition of ideas nor a psychological projection. That is, no-mind is a practical transcendence from the everyday mind, without departing from the everydayness of the world.

4. Zen as Anti-Philosophy

As may be surmised from the foregoing explanation on Zen’s methodological stance, it is perhaps best to understand Zen as an anti-philosophy if the term “philosophy” is taken to mean the establishment of “the kingdom of reason.” That enterprise has been launched as an intellectual effort of the most brilliant minds in Europe since the modern period to find new ways to ground our conception of human nature, something beyond the traditional Christian dogmas that had incorporated classic Aristotelian and Platonic views. Since then, various Western philosophers have attempted to capture human nature with this goal in mind by using ego-consciousness as a starting point as well as a destination in philosophy. For example, human nature has been characterized in terms of ego-consciousness (Descartes), Reason, Personality, Transcendental Subjectivity (Kant and Husserl), Life (Dilthey), Existence (Existential philosophers such as Kierkegaard, Jaspers and Sartre) and Dasein (Heidegger). (See Yuasa 2003, 160–61.)

By contrast, Zen’s stance of “anti-philosophy” maintains among other things that reason in its discursive use is incapable of knowing and understanding in toto what reality is, for example, what human beings are and what their relation to nature is. For this reason, Zen contends that physical nature and human nature must be sought in an experiential dimension practically trans-descending, and hence transcending, the standpoint of ego-consciousness. (For the way the modern Kyoto School philosopher, Nishitani Keiji, uses this term “trans-descedence,” see the entry on the Kyoto School, Sect. 3.7.) That is to say, it must go beyond “the one” and “the two,” as both of these stances are prone to generate a one-sided stance, and hence incomplete world-view. Instead, they must be sought in the depths of one’s psychē and beyond. For example, Zen Master Seigen (Chin; Qīngyuáng, 660–740) expresses the process of self-cultivation to the effect that: “Before the practice, mountains are mountains, during the practice, mountains are not mountains, and after the realization, mountains are [truly] mountains [again]” (see Abe, 1985, p.4). In the meditational process of discovery then, Zen moves from an ordinary, commonsensical standpoint to an extraordinary standpoint, and with this transformation returns to the everyday lifeworld, wherein no Aristotelian either-or logic is accepted as the standard for knowing and understanding reality. As a result, paradoxes, contradictions, and even what appears to be utter nonsense abound in Zen literature. The kōan method mentioned above exemplifies this point. To cite just one such example: “the river does not flow but the bridge does.” If one attempts to understand that by relying on an Aristotelian either-or logic as the standard for understanding, one will be under the impression that this expression is nonsensical or meaningless.

As may be surmised, by relying on the above-mentioned methodological stance, Zen Buddhism has produced an understanding of reality—one’s own self, nature with life activities and human nature—quite different from those offered by Western philosophy. Therefore, we can say that Zen is an anti-philosophy in that it is not a systematization of knowledge built on the use of a discursive mode of reasoning anchored in the (alleged) certainty or transparency of ego-consciousness, one that follows an epistemological paradigm built on an ego-logical, either-or, dualistic mode of knowing. Yet, it upholds something like a philosophy that springs forth through a reflective restatement of the practice, though this “upholding” must be understood with a proviso that it maintains, as mentioned in the foregoing, a “positionless position.” (Abe, 1989.) This is because Zen abhors “holding onto” anything, which Zen considers a case of “self-binding without a rope.” Such a self-binding would trap the Zen practitioner into a mode of attachment that is the source of suffering and, consequently, would disrupt the sense of embodied freedom it cherishes.

5. Overcoming Dualism

Accordingly, Zen demands that the practitioner overcome the dualism operative in the everyday standpoint, which it speaks of by using the phrase “not two.” The use of the phrase “not two” expresses Zen’s proclivity to favor the simple and the concrete, while not taking a stance that is merely a theory, which is a negation of dualism. This overcoming is an existential, practical project, a goal for the Zen practitioner, although it is paradoxically stated as “if you face it, it goes away.” This is because “facing” presupposes a dualistic stance. “Two” in “not two” designates any “two” things appearing from within the everyday standpoint, especially when it is taken to designate an absolute sense of reality. This standpoint, as mentioned in the foregoing, relies on the discursive mode of reasoning to understand reality, while presupposing an ego-consciousness as the standard referential point. From this perspective for example, a distinction between the outer and inner worlds emerges, using a sensory perception as the point of reference. One of the salient characteristics of this standpoint is that the world appears to be dualistic in nature, that is to say, it recognizes two (and by implication, many) things to be real. Zen questions this standpoint when it is used as the paradigm for daily living, including philosophical thinking, for this standpoint accepts as its foundation an individual’s discrete “I” with a belief that “I” am self-contained and self-sufficient, and therefore am distinguished and isolated from other individuals and things of nature, “I” am “here” and things, including others, are “over there,” creating both a psychological and physical distance between them.

Epistemologically speaking, Zen observes that this renders opaque, or at best translucent, the experiential domains beyond the sensible world as well as ego-consciousness, whether either taken naturalistically or by means of theoretical speculation. The inability to go beyond these experiential domains occurs because ego-consciousness is physiologically rooted in the body but psychologically in the unconscious. This points to a philosophically important consequence. Namely, once the practitioner accepts this outer-inner dichotomy even provisionally, he or she is led to accept as true a host of other “two” things that are affirmed to be real, as is seen in pairs of opposites such as mind vs. body, I vs. others, love vs. hate, good vs. evil, and I vs. nature.

5.1 Logical Meaning of Not Two

Logically speaking, Zen explains that “two” things arise because the everyday standpoint stipulates the above-mentioned epistemological paradigm as the standard for cognizing the whole, however the whole may be construed (Nagatomo, 2000, 213–44). This logic thinks it reasonable to divide the whole into two parts when knowing or understanding reality. That is, when this logic is applied to the whole, it compels the user of this logic to choose, reasonably in the mind of the user, one part, while disregarding the other part(s) as irrelevant or meaningless. It prioritizes one part at the expense of the other part(s), while celebrating the exclusion. In so doing, it looks to the explicit while becoming oblivious to the fact that the implicit equally exists as a supporting ground for the explicit, where the explicit is something “obvious” to the senses and the rational mind. It champions one-sidedness in cognition and judgment as the supreme form of knowing and understanding reality.

Zen maintains, however, that this prioritization, this exclusion, violates a cardinal principle of knowing, for knowledge of anything demands an understanding of the whole. Either-or logic fails on this account. Moreover, it contends that when this logic attempts to understand the whole, it theoretically reduces the other to the one that is judged to be true and/or real. For example, if one maintains that the mind is real, one disregards the body as unreal, yielding an idealist position. On the other hand, if one thinks the body is real, it disposes of the mind in the same way, favoring materialism as true. That is the presupposition of natural science, for example. Either position commits itself to reductionism. Questioning this reductionism and its consequences, Zen instead speaks of mind-body oneness, a holistic perspective that avoids one-sidedness. However, it warns that as soon as “one” is contrasted with “two” in a discourse, it is no longer genuine and authentic, because once it is objectified linguistically or reflectively, it slips into being an idea, an abstraction.

5.2 An Epistemological Meaning of Not Two

From the point of view of epistemology developed by modern European philosophy, the “two things” are the subject who knows and the object that is known. Zen finds that these two things impose on the epistemological subject a structuring that is framed dualistically into an egological either-or paradigm. The ego then extends the paradigm to itself for self-understanding as well as things other than itself in the same manner. Consequently, the subject stands opposed either to the outer world (e.g., nature) or to the inner world (the world of psychē), or both, and hence it promotes an oppositional mode of thinking. Moreover, Zen notes that the subject cannot by definition become the object or vice versa, for they are distanced from each other either really or ideally. It depends on whether the “distance” and “opposition” occur in space-consciousness or in time-consciousness; an object appears to be “out there” with space-consciousness, while it appears to be “in here” as an immanent object in the field of consciousness in time-consciousness. Suppose one applies this epistemological structure to knowing others, for example, one’s friend. When one attempts to know her from the everyday standpoint, one relies on the language she speaks and her body language. Here one cannot know her in toto, let alone the destiny of her life-history, because she is shielded from an observer by the spatial-temporal density of her being. (For an analysis of Dōgen’s view of the interpersonal, see Kasulis 2018, 234 ff.)

5.3 Zen’s Meaning of Not Two

Zen maintains that the situation created by assuming this epistemological paradigm is not ideal, or even real, for that matter. Hence, Zen says “not two.” “Not two” is in part a recommendation for experientially achieving oneness through the practice of meditation, informing the holder of the “two” of the narrow and limited scope of her/his understanding, where the idea of oneness may, for now, be conceived at many levels, starting with the physical, the subtle, and the samādhic. For example, a physical oneness may be seen when two physical objects are joined together, while a subtle oneness is observed when psycho-physiological ki-energy is harmoniously circulated in the physical body. On the other hand, a samādhic oneness occurs in a deep state of meditation, wherein many paranormal phenomena are observed. Generally speaking then, Zen takes “not two” to designate a negation of any “two” things that are affirmed to be individually real, in which the perspective that realizes the place or domain where two things occur is ignored. The dualistic standpoint also ignores the logical fact that any “two” things cannot be individually one because for one to be, it must be dependent on, and interconnects with, the other one. An either-or logic ignores this interdependence, in part because it operates within a conceptual and linguistic space with the assumption that there is no temporal change. This assumption enables a thinker to establish the law of identity, namely that A remains the same with itself, or identical with itself. With this recommendation, Zen maintains that mind and body, I and others, I and nature ought to be experienced as one by those who remain in the everyday standpoint. To express this idea, Zen states that “Heaven and Earth share the same root, and I and the myriad things are one (-body).” (Yanagida Seizan, Mu no tankyū [An Investigation into Nothing], p. 93 and p. 184) It demands an holistic perspective necessary to achieve knowledge that is genuine and authentic. Otherwise, Zen fears that the practitioner will fall into one-sidedness, in which the knowledge claim ends up being partial, imbalanced, and even prejudiced. Dōgen captures this by stating: “When one side is illuminated, the other side remains in darkness.” (Dōgen 2010. v 1, p. 30) To characterize the dualistic, either-or, ego-logical standpoint by borrowing Nietzsche’s phrase, Zen would say that it is “human, and all too human.”

Care must be exercised in understanding the meaning of “not” in the phrase “not two” however. Zen insists that the “not” primarily refers to an existential, practical negation of the “I,” which the practitioner achieves by “up-rooting the ego-consciousness,” and in turn yields, by implication, a logical negation as well. This is because Zen thinks the practitioner cannot achieve this negation simply by following either-or logic, or for that matter by following the intellectual process of reasoning, because both logic and reasoning intrinsically involve two things, for example, the thinker and the thought. With either-or logic a mere logical negation involves an infinite regress in negating the “I”; one who negates the “I” retains the affirmative act of holding “I” in the mind as that which negates. And when the “I” further attempts to negate this affirming act, there still remains an “I” who negates it and the process goes on ad infinitum. For this reason, Zen recommends the practitioner to “forget the ‘I” when engaging oneself in any action, be it a mind-act, bodily-act, or speech-act, as is seen for example in both Dōgen and Takuan (1573–1645). (See Dōgen, “Genjōkōan,” tr. Abe, p. 41; see Takuan, p. 4. )

To recapitulate the idea of the Zen meaning of negation as expressed in “not two,” Zen sees its self-cultivation as involving a thoroughgoing negation of the “I” to the point that no problem, either existential or psychological, entrenched in the “I” remains. Hence, we have Rinzai’s phrase: “if you becomes a master in any place, wherever you stand is true.” (Iriya, 1989, 70) Truth for Zen is not merely a matter of formulating or uttering a propositional statement, but rather embodying it by becoming, to use his phrase again, a “true person of no rank,” (ibid, 20) where “no rank” designates the freedom of standing beyond social or linguistic conventions such that a Zen person can use convention freely. Equally important is Zen’s contention that both logical and intellectual methods are abstract, for they become divorced from the actual reality of day-to-day existence. In other words, in the eyes of Zen, these methods lack consideration for the concreteness and immediacy of lived experience. This is because the theoretical standpoint defines the human being who observes things of nature from the outside, which can be characterized, by using Yuasa’s phrase, as a “being-outside-of-nature.” Instead, Zen maintains that the human being must be understood as a being rooted in nature. To use Yuasa’s phrase again, it is a “being-in-nature.” This point is well portrayed in Zen’s landscape paintings wherein a human figure occupies the space of a mere dot in a vast natural scenery (Yuasa, 2003, 160–1).

6. An Experiential Meaning of Not Two

How then does Zen articulate the experiential meaning of “not two”? Throughout its long history, which spans from the sixth century in China to the twenty-first century in Japan, Zen has produced numerous ways of linguistically capturing a response to this question, depending on what “two” things are thematized in the Zen dialogue (Zen mondō). As a textual study, these dialogues are a primary way for the non-practitioner to learn what “two” things are by studying a discourse that unfolds between a Zen master and his disciple. Moreover, this situation is complicated by the fact that a Zen master’s response is usually tailored to an individual disciple’s capacity. This is in keeping with a general method of teaching in Buddhism, i.e., speaking to the caliber of a listener (taiki seppō). This complication is further compounded by the differences in the personality of Zen masters. Hence, Zen’s responses to the above question are as varied and numerous as there are Zen masters. In spite of this situation, it is reasonably possible to provide a glimpse into the experiential meaning of “not two” by looking into a phrase that often appears in Zen dialogues. This phrase is “no-thought and no-image” (munen musō), whose experience points to the practical aspect going beyond “not one” and “not two.”

6.1 Zen’s No-Thought and No-Image

If asked the meaning of “no thought and no image,” the Zen master must first determine if the inquirer is anchored in the everyday or meditational standpoint when asking the question. If the question is theoretical and relies on an either-or logic, the inquirer could never understand the Zen meaning of the phrase. To ask theoretically about no-thought and no-image is to treat them as referents, that is, as things that are or are not. When “no-thought” or “no-image” is treated as an idea in a linguistic space without consideration for its referent, can one ask if “there is” or “there is not” such a thing as “no-thought.” That is, Zen maintains that when “there is” or “there is not” is topicalized in its tradition, it is not the same as “there is” or “there is not” as understood from within the everyday standpoint. Zen claims that neither “no-thought” nor “no-image” can be linguistically or logically apprehended from its standpoint.

Why does Zen insist on this? Zen explains that both “there is” and “there is not” (or more generally “being” and “non-being”) are intellectually framed from within the everyday standpoint by accepting the oppositional ontology where the meaning of “is” is predicated on the meaning of “is not,” and vice versa. Therefore, Zen maintains that to understand “no-thought” or “no-image” we need an experiential dimension that goes beyond the oppositional thinking of the everyday standpoint. Zen tries to maintain a philosophical position that allows for an experience of difference that is not based in conceptual opposition or binary logic. This brings us to the role of “nothing” in Zen Buddhism.

6.2 Zen’s Nothing

Zen condenses “no-thought and no-image” into a singular word “no” in keeping with its proclivity to favor the simple, as this contraction allows Zen to expand the scope and the meaning of “no-thought and no-image.” This “no,” for example, is made pivotal by Zen Master Joshū (Chin., Zhaozhōu; 778–897). It is usually rendered in English as “nothing” and has been presented to the Western reader as if it is the central and cardinal concept of Zen philosophy. At the risk of de-emphasizing other important aspects of Zen such as how it understands the living phenomena of nature, humanity‘s relation to them, and aesthetic sensitivity, we will here focus on the scope and meaning of this Zen “no,” (無). (For the various analyses and applications of central Zen notions in twentieth-century Japanese philosophy, see the entries on The Kyoto School esp. Sect. 3, Nishida Kitarō, esp. Sect. 3.1, and Watsuji Tetsurō esp. Sect. 4.)

This “no” appears in a Zen dialogue between Joshū and a monk, in which is thematized an issue of whether or not a dog has Buddha-nature (Yanagida, Mu no tankyū, p. 181). It reads as follows: A monk asks Joshū: “Does the dog have buddha-nature?” He replies: “No[thing].” The monk says: “All sentient beings have buddha-nature. Why doesn’t the dog have it?” Joshū replies: “He has discrimination due to his karma.” Joshū’s response of “no” to the monk’s question points to the latter’s inadequate, and hence also mistaken, understanding of being. However, as articulated in the Nirvānasūtra, Mahāyāna Buddhism, of which Zen is an offshoot, asserts that all sentient beings have buddha-nature. With this understanding in mind, the monk asked the question, to which Joshū replied 無 (“no”). His “no” points to the fact that the way the monk formulates his question regarding being is predicated on an either-or logical understanding or an affirmation-negation linguistic device. In so doing, the monk relativizes Buddha-nature qua being, while contrasting and opposing it with non-being. Buddha-nature is not something that the dog can have or not have; Buddha-nature is not something contingent. Joshū’s “no” allows the monk to return to the ground from which the idea of the Buddha-nature springs forth as an essential characterization of all beings. As such, Joshū’s “no” points to a transcendence of being and non-being. Insofar as Zen’s “no” is turned into an issue questioning the ground of being, it is appropriate to understand it as “nothing,” and in fact as “absolutely nothing,” because the latter goes beyond the relative nothing that is contrasted with being.

As Joshū’s “nothing” has been made a kōan, numerous Zen masters have used it to test a student’s progress in meditation. In such a case, a Zen master expects a monk to come up with his or her original response by stipulating a condition: “I don’t expect you to answer that the dog has buddha-nature nor that the dog does not have buddha-nature. Nor do I expect you to reply that the dog both has and does not have buddha-nature. Nor do I expect you to reply that the dog neither has nor does not have buddha-nature. How do you respond to this?” This is a warning that a monk cannot rely on Nāgārjuna’s tetralemma as an acceptable response, namely the four possible ways of understanding thing-events insofar as logic is concerned: “there is,” “there is not,” “both ‘there is’ and ‘there is not,’” and “neither ‘there is’ nor ‘there is not.’” This master is admonishing that as long as a monk’s response is framed from within the logic of the everyday use of language, no answer is forthcoming. Here the reader can sense that the scope and the meaning of “no-thought and no-image” has been expanded to include the logical use of language, not simply a rejection of oppositional thinking.

A further expansion of the scope and the meaning of “no” can be found in an instruction Zen Master Daie (Chin., Dàhuì; 1089–1163) gives to his students, though it is given via negativa—when they attempt to discover a response to Joshū’s “nothing” (Yanagida, 1974, 181–2). Prefacing his remark that “this one word [i.e., ‘no(-thing)’] is a cane that shatters numerous [instances of] erroneous knowledge and perception,” Daie instructs the students not to take “no[thing]” in the context of being or nonbeing by applying either-or logic. An appeal to discriminatory thinking based on the standpoint of [ego-]consciousness is of no use either. It is also unacceptable to appeal to bodily action, let alone to engage in a mere verbal exchange. Not even a metaphysical response will do either, for Daie states: “Do not throw it out into an empty-void where there is nothing. Do not swallow it where something is generated.” To seek an answer in a text is also out of the question. Daie demands that the practitioner come up with his/her own original answer.

What is evident in the above instructions is that the Zen practitioner must tackle this “no[thing]” by mobilizing the whole of his or her person in order to delve into the ground of his or her personhood, where the “whole” in question involves both the mind and the body, both the consciousness and the unconscious. This is, no doubt, an existential challenge to Zen practitioners, and so they make an all-out effort, staking life and death, because it guarantees them an embodiment of truth and freedom. In this context, Zen metaphorically speaks of reaching the whole as “kicking through the bottom of a bucket” to designate the ground of a person, which Zen understands to be bottomless. That is, it understands this ground to have “no” bottom, i.e., it is a bottomless ground. To avoid the danger of interpreting this ground nihilistically or relativistically, the modern Japanese thinker, Nishida Kitarō (1870–1945) adds that it is absolutely nothing, where “absolutely” means cutting off all pairs of polar opposites. (See the entry on Nishida Kitarō.)

6.3 Zen “Seeing”

The experiential dimension in which Zen’s “nothing” becomes understandable refers to a quiescent state of meditation in which is arrested the activity of an individual practitioner’s ego-consciousness that functions in a close correlation with his or her body. Upon reaching such a meditational state, the Zen practitioner comes to experience an event generally known as “seeing into one’s nature” (kenshō), an initial satori experience. Although this phrase may on the surface suggest a dualistic state, namely that there is something that is called “nature,” which the Zen practitioner comes to see as an object. This interpretation occurs because “seeing”is understood to be an intentional activity of the practitioner. However, this “seeing” has a sense of becoming visible such that “one’s own nature” emerges in the meditative awareness when the activity of ego-consciousness is arrested. Once this experience occurs, the practitioner gradually turns the seeing into one’s nature (according to the interpretation vis-à-vis the acquired enlightenment), or the practitioner realizes that one’s nature is seeing (according to the interpretation vis-à-vis the original enlightenment). The Zen tradition interprets “nature” to be “buddha-nature,” i.e., the possibility to be awakened from fundamental ignorance. That is to say, to become a Buddha, and the way of its being is designated by the term tathatā, suchness or a thing-event’s being such that it is showing its primordial mode of being. When this aspect of knowledge is emphasized, Zen calls it “original” or “natural” knowledge. In this connection, it contends that the “seeing” is “not two,” i.e., it is non-dualistic in nature.

To illustrate an experiential basis for the above observation, we may cite another example, namely Dōgen’s enlightenment experience. This will aid the reader to catch a glimpse of an experiential meaning of “not two,” for it is descriptive of the experience itself. He expresses it as “dropping off the body and the mind” (shinjin datsuraku, 身心脱落). (In order to get an idea of this experience from a contemporary point-of-view, or from outside of Zen tradition, one may also consider out-of-body experiences.) The experience of “dropping off the body and the mind” informs us that the dualistic relationship between the mind and the body has disappeared in meditational awareness and by implication “I” and others, and “I” and nature. Hence they are “not two.” If the distinction has disappeared, it implies that the Zen practitioner is thrown into a non-dualistic domain of experience. It points to a practical transcendence from the everyday either-or, ego-logical, dualistic standpoint.

In light of the outer-inner distinction Zen interprets the non-dualistic experience to mean that the distinction has been epistemologically collapsed, as it arises in such a way to respond to the dualistic perspective from which the outer and the inner worlds appeared. It understands this collapsing of the distinction then to be the meaning of “not two,” from which an holistic perspective emerges. Conceptually, Zen takes this holistic perspective to mean the de-substantialization and de-ontologization of any two polar concepts, such as one and many, being and non-being, universal and particular, absolute and relative, transcendence and immanence, and birth and death. Zen’s observation is that each of the polar terms is non-dualistically related to each of the other polar terms such that they are connected with, interdependent on, and relative to, each other for their being and meaning. They are thrown into a holistic context of an interdependent causal series. And for this series to be operative, Zen maintains, following Nāgārjuna, that each of these terms that enters the relationship is empty of self-nature, where self-nature means a power to generate itself on its own without dependence on anything. For if thing-events designated by these terms are endowed with self-nature, they cannot enter into the series; what enters such a series is only an accidental attribute or property. According to the substantialistic or essentialistic ontology, nothing can really change. For example, criminals who want to correct their criminal behavior cannot change themselves if being a criminal is the essential characterization of their being. This would pose an insurmountable challenge, if not impossibility, to a correction officer at a prison. Or, for that matter, anyone who wants to correct one’s own psychological characteristic or tendency, particularly if it happens to be pathological, cannot succeed in such self-correction if it is an essential characterization of one’s being.

In order to give a still more concrete sense of what Zen-seeing is like, we now return to the question of how Zen understands the experiential meaning of “seeing into one’s nature.” Zen’s contention is that the bottomless ground is that which non-dualistically “sees” when the practitioner experiences the state of nothing (or no-thought and no-image). How then does Zen articulate this “seeing”? This question points to an examination of the epistemic structure of how knowledge operates in Zen experience. For this purpose, the following Zen dialogue between Jinne and Chōsetsu concerning “no-thought” is illuminating. Although it is lengthy, we quote it in full in order to provide a sense of how a Zen dialogue unfolds:

The disciple asks: Then what is it [i.e., no-thought]?

The master replies: It is nothing like “what is.” Therefore, we can not explain “no-thought.” The reason why I am speaking about it now is because you have asked about it. If you hadn’t asked about it, there would be no need to explain it. Suppose that there is a clear, transparent mirror. If it does not face a thing, no image is reflected in it. To say that it mirrors an image means that because it faces something, it just mirrors its image.

The disciple asks: If it does not face any thing, is there or is there not a reflection in the mirror?

The master replies: That the mirror reflects a thing means that it always mirrors regardless of whether it is facing or not facing a thing.

The disciple asks: If there is no image and since you do not give an explanation, how can all beings and nonbeings become an issue? Now when you say that it always mirrors, how does it mirror?

The master replies: When I say that the mirror always mirrors, it is because a clear, transparent mirror possesses an original nature as its essential activity of always mirroring things. Analogously, people’s mind is originally undefiled, and naturally possesses a superb light of wisdom that illuminates the perfect world of nirvāna.

The disciple asks: Insofar as people’s minds are originally like that, when do people get it?

The master replies: It just sees nothing.

The disciple asks: When it is nothing, what can it see?

The master replies: Seeing is not like something you can call a thing.

The disciple asks: If it is not like anything one can call a thing, what does it see?

The master replies: it sees no-thing. That is the true seeing. It always sees. (Yanagida, 1974, 132–3.)

Unlike most Zen dialogues that are often enigmatic and puzzling to people outside the tradition, this dialogue provides an explanation that indicates what “seeing” is like in Zen experience. This “seeing” is said to be “seeing nothing or no-thing,” and Jinne speaks of it by appealing to the analogy of a mirror, although he makes a disclaimer that it cannot adequately be explained in words. To get a glimpse of what he means by “seeing,” it is helpful to take note of the following points regarding this analogy. Jinne conceives of a mirror in terms of two modalities: the mirror in and of itself and the mirror as it engages an object other than itself. It is important to keep in mind that both are understood in light of their activity. He characterizes the “original nature” of the mirror in and of itself as being “clear, transparent” (or “undefiled”), wherein it is said to always mirror. “Original” means that it is not contingent on experience, while “always” refers to the mirror’s ceaseless activity of mirroring. Whether “there is” or “there is not” a specific object to mirror is a contingent matter for the mirror in and of itself. What makes a mirror what it is is its activity of always mirroring, and when considered in and of itself, it possesses no specific image to mirror. There is no characteristic to it and hence no image appearing in it, i.e., “no-thought” or “no-image.” This is the meaning of “no-thing or nothing” in the phrase “seeing no-thing or nothing.” In other words, the mirror is turned into nothing, or to use the earlier phrase, the bottomless ground is nothing except, epistemologically speaking, its capacity to mirror, and even this capacity is rendered “nothing” when it is in no use.

Zen explains the fact that the mirror “just sees no-thing or nothing” when its act of seeing is mobilized in “facing” a thing. The adverb “just” is crucial. “Just” here means without discrimination, without superimposition, without projection, or in short, without positing an ego-consciousness as that which sees. In phenomenological terms, there is no thetic positing in this kind of seeing. Zen maintains that these characterizations obtain because the Zen practitioner “kicked through the bottom of the bucket,” a practical transcendence. In other words, Zen’s contention is that there is no determination whatsoever in the mirror’s activity of “just seeing.” That there is no determination means to Zen that because the bottomless ground is nothing, it does not impose form on things that are mirrored. When these qualifications are taken together, Zen interprets “just seeing no-thing or nothing” to mean seeing or mirroring things without discrimination, that is, with a sense of equality. When a mirror, for example, reflects an image of a beautiful object, it does not make any discriminatory value judgment that it is beautiful. And neither does it make any discriminatory value judgment when it mirrors an ugly object. It mirrors thing-events as they are. That is, the mirror does not take any stance of likes and dislikes; it does not take a stance of “for” or “against.” It is non-egological in mirroring each thing equally.

Moreover, Zen observes that the nature of the mirror is such that it does not change due to the kind of object it mirrors. For example, it does not increase or decrease in size in virtue of the fact that it mirrors an object. (Bankei, for example, expresses it as the “unborn.”) It remains as it is in its original nature of always mirroring, which highlights the fact that it is clear and transparent. Because equality is the characteristic of this seeing, Zen speaks of the activity of this seeing as nondiscriminatory. Yet, because an object is mirrored as object, whether beautiful or ugly, Zen considers the act of mirroring to be a “discernment.” Therefore, Zen characterizes the “seeing” in “seeing no-thing or nothing” in its act-aspect as a discernment vis-à-vis nondiscrimination (mufunbetsu no funbetsu, 無分別の分別). This, Jinne says, is “true seeing,” which is non-discriminatory wisdom (prajñā). Through this mirror analogy, Zen wants to point out what the minds of people are like in their original nature and activity. Zen summarizes all of the above characteristics of seeing by employing a simple phrase: “motion in stillness” (seichū no dō, 静中の動). However, an objection may be raised against Zen’s holistic, non-dualistic “seeing” or “mirroring,” namely, the objection that if there is something that is mirrored, does that not still imply a dualistic epistemological structure? Zen would respond that this objection ignores the fact that the ground of seeing is the bottomless ground that is nothing. What appears against mirror qua nothing is just an object. In such a seeing, the object alone shines forth. Hence, it is characterized, to use Nishida’s terminology, as “seeing without a seer.” (See the entry on The Kyoto School, Sect. 3.3.) Below, we will explore further the structure of how things appear in Zen.

Although it may sound paradoxical, Zen maintains that this ground is also a fount of creativity. Because there is no determination in the ground, it is pregnant with many possibilities or meanings to be realized. Zen maintains, via the influences from philosophical Daoism, that this creativity is in the same order as that of nature, for the practitioner reaches the original source prior to the distinction between the outer world and the inner world. (Hence, Zen understands, as was mentioned in the foregoing, the human being to be “a being-in-nature.”)

It often uses the phrase “no-mind” (mushin) to generally designate the above experiential dimension. However, Zen does not mean it to be a mindless state, much less losing the mind. Nor does it mean a disappearance of the mind. Rather it designates a dimension of experience in which the ego-logically discriminatory activity of the mind disappears. This may be illustrated in terms of seeing things that occurs in a deep state of meditative absorption, where “seeing” means becoming visible as mentioned above. Zen adepts are said to acquire a power of meditation (Jpn.: jōriki, 定力), which is related to abilities like clairvoyance, clairaudience, and retrocognition. These abilities coincide with those of two of the three night-watches on the night of historical Buddha’s enlightenment experience. Once such a power becomes available to the meditators, they intentionally focus on seeing whatever they want to see. This is an activity of ego-consciousness, but after settling into a deeper state of absorption, the person’s ego-conscious activity ceases and an image appears from the unconscious in response to the meditator’s intention. This is because the unconscious has an autonomous activity that works independent of conscious will. This occurs once the meditator eliminates or lessens the oppositional and conflicting relationship between the consciousness and unconscious. If, however, the meditator tries to see an image by relying on his or her ego-consciousness, the image which has surfaced in the field of meditative awareness immediately disappears, because the meditator slips back into a dualistic state from the non-dualistic state. The meditator must remain in a non-dualistic state in order to see what appears in the field of meditative awareness.

Philosophically speaking, we can characterize this experiential event that the Zen practitioner trans-descends into, and hence transcends, the ego-logically discriminatory activity of the mind. Zen contends that this arises due to adhering to “name-form” (Jpn.: myōshiki, 名色; Skrt.: nāmarūpa). This transcendence results in a rejection of the belief that there is a reality corresponding to a name, or generally that there is a reality corresponding to a linguistic activity. Through the state of no-mind, Zen observes that each individual thing that is mirrored is recognized for the first time to be individual qua the individual with a sense of equality that is due to other individual things.

7. Zen’s Understanding of Time and Space

Given Zen’s seeing as articulated above, one may then raise the next question: how does Zen understand time and space? Is it significantly different from how time and space are conceived by many other theories of time and space? In what follows, we will briefly provide the experiential foundations for understanding time and space, how Zen understands “here and now,” and “integrated time and space.”

7.1 Zen’s Experiential Foundation for Understanding Time and Space: Zero-Time and Zero-Space

The proceeding analysis has prepared us to describe Zen’s experiential foundation for understanding time and space, which we will do by unpacking the phrases “motion in stillness” (Seichū no dō, 静中の動) and “stillness in motion” (dōchū no sei, 動中の静). Before moving into drawing implications from these phrases, we will first clarify logical issues involved in these phrases. To start then, let us acknowledge that these two phrases cannot be explained by appealing to an active-passive explanatory model, whose logical foundation rests on either-or logic, because, according to this logic, a thing must be either active or passive: they cannot both occur at the same time. However, Zen claims that this is exactly what happens in the meditative experience of emptiness (Skrt, śūnyatā; Jap., kū, 空). An image which captures the meaning of this experiential state is a top spinning at full speed, while its shaft remains absolutely stationary. Here, the top is not still, as this stillness is also in motion: the top is not just in motion, as this motion is also still. From the point of view of either-or logic, stillness and motion cannot occur at the same time, and hence are contradictory. To use an often-used expression in Buddhism, they are the same, but also they are different: they are different, but they are also the same. Nishida Kitarō characterized this situation as “absolutely contradictory self-identity” (zettai mujun no jikodōitsu, 絶対矛盾の自己同一).

Now, what do these phrases disclose to us concerning Zen’s understanding of time and space? To respond to this question, we will look at the term, “śūnyatā” (i.e., emptiness). This term designates a deep state of meditation, which is often taken to mean the same as the meditative state of no-thing or nothing. What is noteworthy in the present context of analyzing Zen’s understanding of time and space is that the term “śūnyatā” is the origin for the mathematical concept of zero. Given this meaning, we can interpret “stillness” in both of these phrases as corresponding to the experience of emptiness (śūnyatā), and when this is translated to the terms of time and space, “stillness” means “zero-time” and “zero-space” in that there is no temporalization of time or spatialization of space. On the other hand, “motion” appearing in these two phrases, means temporalization as well as spatialization. Taking these points together, we can state that the experience of emptiness is the experiential foundation for Zen’s understanding of time and space. Moreover, this foundation reveals that time and space are inseparable from each other, i.e., when temporalization occurs, spatialization occurs. Or conversely, when spatialization occurs, temporalization occurs. This means that time and space are integrated together in the experience of “śūnyatā,” i.e., an integrated space-time. Moreover, one time is all of time and all of time is one time, i.e., the part reflects the whole and the whole reflects the part, just like a holographic dry place in which a part contains the whole and the whole contains its parts. Consequently, to speak of either time or space separately is a conceptual abstraction divorced from the experience of time and space, or better, the experience of space-time.

In order to fully understand the meaning of both zero-time and zero-space, it would be helpful to examine the following often-quoted Zen phrase. Zen demands that the practitioner “show one’s original face before one’s parents were born.” This demand points to an experiential dimension prior to the bifurcation between the subject and the object, where “prior” means the negation of spatial-temporal ordering principles such as in Kant’s understanding of time and space as an a priori form of intuition. It points to a non-dualistic experiential dimension of emptiness (śūnyatā) by which Zen means that neither time nor space is a delimiting condition for Zen seeing. To be more concrete, for a piece of information to travel from one point to another point, there is no temporalization and spatialization in zero-time and zero-space. (Here, we may recall a propinquity between Zen’s understanding of zero-time and zero-space and the EPR principle in quantum physics.) Moreover, in zero-time and zero-space, there is no distinction between past, present and future, or between “before” and “after,” as they are enfolded in them: in zero-time and zero-space, there is no distinction, as mentioned above, between the whole and its parts. We can also note that distinction, as we will examine later, is a consequence of segmentation, and as such it is also a fragmentation. Accordingly, Zen contends that zero-time and zero-space are the natural and primordial state of all things including human beings, for they are all grounded in this bottomless ground. Taking these points together, Zen’s enlightenment experience suggests a leap from a causal temporal series.

7.2 Zen’s Understanding of Here and Now?

How then are the zero-time and zero-space related to the “here and now,” upon which Zen urges us to focus in living our life? In order to understand this question, we must point out that it involves a perspectival shift from the nondualistic epistemological paradigm to the dualistic epistemological paradigm. This perspectival shift effects a fragmentation of the whole, and in the context of the present analysis, this means that the whole of the integrated space-time becomes segmented. With this point in mind, when we reflect upon how we live our daily life, in which the dualistic paradigm operates, we realize that our consciousness functions as an incarnate, embodied awareness even when we are engaging in thinking. Moreover, our body is open to the outside world, situating ourselves within our perceptual range. All of this means that the integrated space-time is always experienced “now” and “here,” or better yet “here-now.” As such, it is a fragmentation of integrated space-time, or zero-space and zero-time, due to the operation of either-or logic in the dualistic thinking. However, when “here” and “now,” or “here-now,” are seen in view of the nondualistic paradigm that is the positionless position of integrated space-time, “now” then designates a fragmentation of both zero-time and zero-space in which one time contains all of time, and one space is all of space. This analysis, for example, helps us understand why William James explained time as “a knife edged point” as well as “a saddle,” where the difference between them reflects a different degree of absorption in activities and perceptual attention. Similarly, “here” is a fragmentation of integrated space-time, or zero-space and zero-time, in which one space is all spaces and all spaces are one space. “Here” designates a spatial awareness in which integrated space-time falls within the range of perceptual experience, disclosed by the body’s situatedness in this range. This is unlike either-or logic, which champions dividing the whole into fragments in view of a set of ego-logical assumptions.

In spite of, or rather because of, the above-mentioned experiential dimension of Zen-seeing, Zen insists that the Zen practitioner plant his or her feet in the everydayness of “here and now.” In this respect, Zen philosophically advocates a position of “not one,” where “one” here means remaining in the state of meditative absorption. Otherwise, it fears that if the practitioner remains in the stillness of meditation, while suspending judgment about action, he/she falls into one-sidedness, a source of prejudice and misunderstanding of reality. How then does Zen understand “here and now”? In this connection, one may reasonably ask: “how far and wide is ‘here’ and how long is ‘now,’” when Zen speaks of “here and now”? Are they each limited by a present perceptual experience? In the case of “now,” for example, is it an internal phenomenon of consciousness that allows the practitioner to experience time sometimes as a “memory” (or retention) and other times as “anticipation” (or “protention”) in the ever-flowing stream of the “present” (e.g., as described by St. Augustine, Husserl and Merleau-Ponty)? And in the case of “here,” is it delimited by the practitioner’s spatial range of perception within a sensory field, situating the Zen practitioner as the point of reference? Insofar as the Zen practitioner is anchored in the state of “not one,” wherein he/she assumes the everyday standpoint, the way he/she lives is to physically exist as he/she is an incarnate being. In this state, the perceptual model of how time and space is experienced applies to him/her. Therefore, he/she experiences time and space within the range of his/her perceptual field. Now, remember that the Zen practitioner enjoys a free bilateral movement between “not two” and “not one.” This means that he/she can freely switch from the state of “not two” to the state of “not one,” or vice versa. So, when and if the Zen practitioner decides to effect the perspectival shift, he/she is no longer subject to the constraints of the perceptual model, when experiencing time and space. This is because “not two” is a state of practical transcendence, which allows him/her to depart from the perceptual model. When this perspectival shift is effected, “now” will be every time and “here” will be every place (see Nagatomo forthcoming).

In the preceding analysis, we spoke about the fragmentation of zero-time and zero-space when thematizing “here” and “now.” As was mentioned above, Zen contends that “here and now” is enfolded in both zero-time and zero-space. This means that one time contains all times and one place contains all places, as in the case of a holographic dry plate in which each part contains the whole. (See the entry on Japanese Philosophy, Section 2.2.) Seen in this manner, “now” for the Zen person is a temporalization of zero-time, while “here” is equally a spatialization of zero-space, even though he or she may be anchored in the perceptual field of “here and now” as understood above. In other words, for the Zen person both “now” and “here” are experienced as an expression of thing-events in their suchness, because Zen takes zero- time and zero-space to be the original abode of thing-events. Caution must be exercised here, however. Zen’s zero-time should not be confounded with the idea of eternity standing outside a temporal series (Thomas Aquinas’s or Newton’s “absolute time,” for example) by means of a logical or intellectual transcendence, nor should its zero-space be identified with a Newtonian-like “absolute space” wherein there is no content of experience. In other words, Zen does not understand time and space by imposing formal categories on them, by presupposing in advance a form-matter distinction, which indicates the operation of a discursive mode of reasoning by appealing to the either-or, dualistic, and ego-logical epistemological structure.

7.3 An Integrated Time and Space

Just as importantly, Zen maintains that time and space are lived as integrated space-time in the interfusion of a concrete temporalization and spatialization. For example, Dōgen speaks of it as “being-time” (u-ji) to indicate their inseparability; being cannot be apart from time, and time cannot be apart from being, where a being spatializes through the process of temporalization, and where it temporalizes through the process of spatialization. (See Dōgen 2010, vol. I, 104–111.) This is a concrete spatialization-temporalization that is lived without any intellectual abstraction, reflecting the Buddhist position that everything, without exception, is impermanent. Zen abhors an intellectual abstraction that merely thinks time and space. This is because the Zen person rides on the rhythm of living nature. That is, “here and now” is one experience (and hence “not two”), and for this reason they should be designated as “here-now.”

In living this integrated, living space-time, Zen does not understand time to be a quantifiable (the move prepared by Aristotle’s understanding of time as the measurement between before and after) and homogeneously punctuated unit (i.e., the clock time of natural science). Nor does it conceive of it as a linear progression from past to future through the present, although it does not exclude them insofar as they are useful for everyday life. The negation of the linear idea of time also includes the negation of the idea of time as symmetrical and reversible, because in the Zen experience of space-time, a teleological intentionality, an “in order that,” is absent. Yet Zen does not accept time as a “fleeting image of eternity” (as in Plato). Zen understands time to be living. According to Zen, theories of time built through conceptual abstraction are distanced and separate from the immediacy of “here-now.”

Space, too, is neither a container (as with Newtown’s “absolute space”) nor an a priori limiting condition (as in Kant), nor the place of displacement for the volume of an extended thing (as in Aristotle). Rather it is a living space. Dōgen for example captures this sense of space as “the bird flies the sky and the sky flies the bird.” In this statement Dōgen recognizes the independence of the sky and the bird, but also recognizes that the sky and the bird each become themselves only through their interdependence. In other words, what makes this space a living space is the dynamic, interdependent, bilateral play of both bird and sky, from which the living space-time as the continuum of “here-now” emerges as an ambience, where each of the terms entering the relationship through this activity is granted a full recognition of their being. (Dōgen 2010, vol. 1, 31–32.)This is because the Zen person lives the dynamic activity of non-dualistic “coming-together” of “the two,” whether this “two” happens to involve the “betweenness” of two individuals, an individual and nature, or an individual and the trans-individual.

7.4 The Structure of Things Appearing

Given Zen’s mode of seeing, which is non-dualistic in nature, occurring in zero-time and zero-space, one may ask how things appear to the Zen mind under these conditions. We can interpret Zen’s nondualistic experience epistemologically as that experience which arises from a nondiscriminatory state of meditational awareness. To be more specific, nondiscriminatory awareness signifies that it is the foundational background, as articulated in the foregoing, that is bottomless or nothing, and as such does not participate in discriminatory activity. However, when a thing appears, a discrimination occurs on this foundational, though bottomless, background. Because it occurs on this foundation, it does not distort the shape of things to appear along with its force. We have designated its activity as discernment vis-à-vis nondiscrimination. It may also be characterized as nondiscriminatory discrimination, in order to capture a sense of how things appear in meditational awareness. In such awareness no ego is posited either as an active or a passive agent in constituting the things of experience, as this awareness renders useless the active-passive scheme as an explanatory model. This awareness lets a thing announce itself as a thing. Therefore, it avoids, on one hand, the idealist position, including Husserl’s intentionality model in which a thetic meaning-bestowing activity is assigned to the act of consciousness. On the other hand, it also rejects the British empiricist’s stance in which the epistemological subject is considered a passive tabula rasa upon which attributes are impressed. This is because Zen’s nondiscriminatory/discriminatory awareness arises out of the state of no-ego in which no projection from the unconscious and no superimposition of intellectual ideas occur in the field of meditative awareness.

Moreover, because things are experientially “constituted” in this manner, we can interpret the epistemological structure of appearing to be such that things appear in the field of meditative awareness without presupposing Gestalt psychology’s distinction between foreground and background. Why? Because the ego is turned into nothing in the state of nondiscriminatory discriminatory awareness, and hence no-ego. This nothing is paradoxically a background that is not background at all, because it is a bottomless background. To use Nishida’s terminology again, the nondiscriminatory/discriminatory awareness is an act of “seeing without being a seer.” Or, to use the terminology of phenomenology, the bottomless background or the background of nothing is the stance in which the noetic act is rendered nothing. Accordingly, the noematic object is allowed to announce itself without an intentional constitution by the latter. This is the meaning of “no projection” and “no superimposition” mentioned above. It consequently opens up a bottomless horizon, on which a noematic object announces itself in toto as a phenomenon.

This opening up simultaneously accompanies, as mentioned in the foregoing, a de-substantialization and de-ontologization of the things of experience, because there is no act of the ego that substantializes and ontologizes them; substantialization and ontologization both arise as a consequence of anthropomorphic activity that is intricately tied to the discursive mode of reasoning. Consequently, we are led to conclude that the things of experience announce themselves in toto without concealing anything behind them. This is because there is nothing in the bottomless background to determine or delimit how things appear. Zen uses such terms as “suchness” or “thusness” to designate it. For example, Dōgen captures it by stating in “the Buddha Nature” fascicle that “nothing is concealed in the universe.”

In order to see how the above-mentioned structure of appearing operates under the conditions of zero-time and zero-space, we must capture a sense of a temporal-spatial awareness reflective of the nondualistic experience. We previously discussed zero-time temporalizing and zero-space spatializing in which temporalization is spatialization and spatialization is temporalization. This is compared to Dōgens theory of “being-time,” wherein there is no formal separation between the two. Hence, neither time nor space is conceived to be a container. Rather, they are expressions of things “thing-ing” the primordial mode of their being. This thing-ing of things springs from zero-time and zero-space. One must stand on ground zero to see the “thing-ing” of things where there is no temporalization and no spatialization of things.

8. Returning to the Everyday Lifeworld: Not One

If we are to stop at sketching what Zen-seeing is together with its understanding of time and space as an integrated space-time, there is the danger of fixing the stance thus “obtained.” (Although we must keep in mind that Zen “obtains” the stance of “not two” in such a way that it cannot be obtained, for in the non-dualistic dimension nothing can be “obtained.”) Zen recognizes at the same time that any stance that is fixed is one-sided and partial. It will deprive Zen, for example, of an opportunity to utilize Zen-seeing in the actions of everyday life. For this reason, Zen insists that the practitioner move to the stance of “not one.” What then is Zen’s stance of “not one”? This question affords the reader, for the purpose of the present article, to get a glimpse into Zen’s movement from “not two” to “not one,” although in actuality this movement operates in a dynamic bilateral movement between them. This movement is symbolized in Zen by a circle, an image of the whole, which is also an image of perfection. Insofar as “one” is a negation of “not two,” “not one” then brings the Zen practitioner back to the everyday lifeworld, the world of multiplicity that is ordinarily constructed ego-logically and dualistically.

8.1 Zen Person

For the Zen person, the move from “not two” to “not one” is an issue of concretely instantiating in the everyday lifeworld what is experienced through the stance of “not two.” This point, for example, is well illustrated in the following Zen dialogue between Zen Master Ungen (Chin. Yúnyán, 780–841) and a fellow practitioner, Dōgo (Chin., Dàowú; 769–835). When Ungen is making a cup of tea, the dialogue runs as follows:

Dōgo: To whom are you going to serve the tea you are preparing?

Ungen: There is the person who wants it.

Dōgo: Can’t the person who wants it make the tea himself?

Ungen: Fortunately, I am here to do it for him. (Ueda, 1981, 165–66.)

This dialogue points to an activity of “trans-individual qua the individual,” where the “trans-individual” designates a Zen person with nondiscriminatory wisdom, while the “individual” designates those who remain in the everyday lifeworld. (In the above quote, the former is designated by the phrase “the person,” while the latter by the pronoun “you.”) However, in the everyday human lifeworld, the “trans-individual” cannot “make the tea himself,” because he is not incarnate like the individual who remains in the dualistic, either-or ego-logical, everyday standpoint. This is because he or she is one who follows the non-dualistic, non-ego-logical standpoint having practically transcended the former. This creates the dilemma of how to be trans-individual while assuming the form of an individual. If this is not properly dealt with, Zen warns that it results in developing a pathological condition or a mana-personality. For this reason, Ungen says “fortunately ‘I’ am here to do it for him.” Here, Zen conceives of the relationship between the individual and the trans-individual as one, i.e., “not two,” and yet they are “not one.” Insofar as both the trans-individual and the individual refer to the same person (in the above quote, “I”), they are “not two,” but insofar as their stances operate differently, they are “not one” (“I” and “him” in the quote). “Both individual and trans-individual” designates a harmonious assimilation of the two stances, a consequence of which is a person who can avail him or herself of both of these perspectives, i.e., the dualistic world of the everyday life and the non-dualistic world of “not two.” On the other hand, “neither individual nor trans-individual” refers to a person who cannot be pinned down or delimited by linguistic means. In spite of, or because of this, such a person is a carrier of freedom who goes beyond these perspectives, i.e., a person in whom the trans-individual and individual have disappeared in action, in which case the individual qua trans-individual is no longer ordinary, but extraordinary. Yet, he or she is quite ordinary in appearance. All of these points are synthesized into a Zen person.

8.2 Zen’s Freedom

How then does the Zen person, thus understood, live freedom? The term that Zen uses to express the idea of “freedom” is “jiyū” and it consists of two characters: “ji” meaning “self on its own,” while “yū” means “out of.” When they are used together as a compound, the phrase as a whole designates an action arising out of self on its own. This action then carries a sense of spontaneity, much like the spontaneous creative act of living nature. This idea of freedom is foreign to the Western intellectual tradition, however. For example, consider how freedom is defined by British empiricists like John Locke. According to Locke, freedom (or to be specific, liberty) is defined as a lack or absence of external constraint. According to this model, where and when there is no external constraint, an individual, whether in the state of nature or in the state of war, can express freedom by mobilizing his/her ego-desire through the exercise of his/her will. By contrast, because it arises out of the self on its own, where the self in Zen is a groundless ground that is nothing, Zen’s free action is not delimited by ego-desire, because it arises out of nothing. It “kicks through the bottom of the bucket,” that is, it purifies all the “defilements” interlaced with the activity of the ego-consciousness, as well as the personal and collective unconscious. For this reason, there is no issue involved in the Zen person’s action that addresses the will of ego-consciousness. For what motivates the Zen person to action is a thrust he or she feels, surging from the creative source in the bottomless ground. Moreover, the Zen person does not experience, as Nietzsche has it, “bad-faith” or “self-deception” when explaining a motivation for action as a rationalist would, because a rationalist must rationalize an irrational desire rooted in the body and the unconscious. (See, for example, Nietzsche’s Beyond Good and Evil.)

Does this mean then that the Zen person has eliminated the demand of instincts or desires? If they are eliminated, the Zen person would turn into a living corpse. Such a person can perform no action, let alone a free action. Obviously then, the Zen person does not eliminate them, but rather transforms them into “non-defilements,” into a higher spiritual energy. We see a heightened spirituality upheld by Zen master Baso (Chin., Mäzū; 709–788), which he insists to be concretely expressed in the everyday lifeworld. He expresses it by phrasing it as “the mind as it is is the Way.” (Yanagida, 1974, 147.) This statement, “the mind as it is is the Way” (heijōshin kore michi) is sometimes rendered in English as “the everyday mind is the Way.” This rendition can be misleading if we ignore Baso’s qualification that this “everyday mind” operates without defilements such that it is not “[entrenched in the samsāric cycle] of birth and death,” and moreover that it is not dominated by a teleological intentionality, i.e., it negates the “in order that.” Otherwise, there is a danger of interpreting Baso’s statement as promoting an evil naturalism. That is, whatever a person desires in the state of “nature,” i.e., “the everyday mind,” is the expression of the Way. There is no problem of a misinterpretation then, as long as Baso’s “everyday mind” is understood to mean the mind which is freed from “the samsāsric cycle of birth and death,” and yet it is the mind which is concretely instantiated in the everydayness of a human everyday lifeworld.

Let us see how Baso’s idea of “the mind as it is is the Way” is carried to a highly artistic action, whether it be a performance technique of martial artist, dancer, actor/actress or musician. Takuan’s reflection on this point is illuminating. He speaks of a “nondiscriminatory knowledge” realized in action as “immovable wisdom”: “It [immovable wisdom] moves as the mind is wont to move: forward or back, to the left, to the right, in the ten directions and to the eight points; and the mind that does not stop at all is called immovable wisdom.” (Takuan, 1986.) Zen’s free action is predicated on the fact that the mind “does not stop at all,” what Takuan paradoxically calls “immovable wisdom.” Here one can discern an echo of Jinne’s mirror analogy. Takuan calls it “immovable” because the mind remains absolutely still (i.e., not two) in the midst of action, like the stationary shaft of a top. Such a mind does not fluctuate in its center, in the deep region of psyche. In this state, because the mind moves in such a way that it does not dwell on anything, there is no obstruction for the mind to move freely.

Generally Zen describes the freedom of bodily movement as “stillness in motion” (dōchū no sei) and is contrasted with “motion in stillness.” It is noteworthy that “stillness in motion” cannot accurately be analyzed by appealing to the active-passive scheme, which presupposes a dichotomy as a proper method for understanding. However contradictory it may seem, this is a description of how Zen understands its freedom as expressed through an integrated mind and body. In order for this sense of freedom to be embodied, however, Zen emphasizes that a performer of any kind repeatedly undergoes mind-body training. Takuan calls this the “body’s learning,”—that is the core meaning of self-cultivation—because in the “body’s learning,” both the mind and the body are brought to action in one integrated whole. (The “body’s learning,” neurophysiologically speaking, is closely related to an activity of the cerebellum in conjunction with the hippocampus, although it is not only that.) When a skill or performing technique is learned through this method, one’s own body moves freely as it is habituated to move without waiting for a command from the mind. This describes a freedom of action in a Zen person for whom the mind is completely assimilated into the object-body, while the body is equally rendered into the subject-body. They are one. At such a time, Takuan says, a spiritual life-energy of psychophysiological nature, called “ki,” permeates “one’s body”—an energy that cannot be delineated by either the mind or the body (Yuasa, 1993). In this connection, Zen also speaks of Zen’s free action as a purposeless purpose, as an actionless action, for neither the purpose nor the action arises from the everyday consciousness which sets up a purpose or a goal for action. Zen calls it “samādhi-at-play,” where there is no individual qua the trans-individual, but what there is is just “play,” for the Zen person is absorbed in the activity when engaging a thing of the everyday lifeworld. In short, Zen freedom designates a term of achievement. What Zen says about freedom of action has an implication for every action people perform in daily life, from the simple act of opening a door to the magnificent play of a great athlete or performer of any kind. In them, Zen contends however, the spirituality of a performer must be expressed. Zen extends an invitation to all of us to act in this way, so that our quality of life will be enhanced with a sense of satisfaction and fulfillment, free from stress and anxiety.

9. Concluding Remarks

This article has articulated a Zen Philosophy, though as anti-philosophy, by thematizing such topics as “overcoming dualism,” “Zen-seeing,” “Zen’s understanding of time and space,” “Zen person,” and “Zen freedom,” and in the process has noted a sense of the movement from “not two” to “not one.” This was to indicate Zen’s sense of achieving personhood. Zen’s methods of meditative practice are concrete ways for an individual to become a Zen person by awakening to the fundamental reality in the everyday human lifeworld. In so doing, it teaches us to participate in the whole, and to express freedom in daily action, by showing one’s “original face” right here-now and right in front of one’s eyes.

In closing this entry, a cautionary remark is in order, however. All of the preceding accounts are simply a heuristic way of conceptually articulating Zen philosophy. Or to use a Zen phrase, this conceptual articulation is only “a finger pointing to the moon,” where Zen insists that there should not be a confounding of the moon with a finger. In Zen language, the moon metaphorically designates an experience of enlightenment and the finger a linguistic or reflective endeavor.

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Other Internet Resources

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