1. The definition of peremptory norms of international law in Article 53 of the Vienna Convention is:

… a peremptory norm of general international law is a norm accepted and recognized by the international community of States as a whole as a norm from which no derogation is permitted and which can be modified only by a subsequent norm of general international law having the same character. (VCLT 1969: art. 53)

2. Secondary rules are rules about rules which

specify the ways in which the primary rules may be conclusively ascertained, introduced, eliminated, varied and the fact of their violation conclusively determined. (Hart 2012: 94)