Innateness and Contemporary Theories of Cognition

First published Wed Jul 22, 2026

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Mark Cain replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

The central debate between nativists and their empiricist opponents concerns the sources of the concepts and knowledge that we draw upon in thinking and which support our successful engagement with the external world. Put bluntly, a nativist with respect to a particular body of concepts/knowledge regards it as being part of the initial state of the individual or as developing from that initial state without the need for external input from the environment. An empiricist, on the other hand, regards the body of concepts/knowledge as being acquired on the basis of experience with learning being a particularly important form of experience based acquisition.

The debate has a long and rich history in Western philosophy. Plato had strong nativist commitments that were opposed by Aristotle and the issue was a key point of dispute between rationalists and empiricists in the seventeenth and eighteenth centuries. After a period of dormancy the debate exploded again in the second half of the twentieth century (as a result of the so called “cognitive revolution” in the study of the mind) and has continued to rumble since then. What is distinctive about the debate in its contemporary manifestation is its naturalistic character. Historically, nativists tended to invoke supernatural sources for innate mental items. For example, Plato regarded innate knowledge as recollection of a previous existence and Descartes regarded it as being implanted in our minds by God. In contrast, the contemporary nativist tends to be a thoroughgoing naturalist viewing the mind as being a component of the natural world. Thus, the ultimate source of any innate component of the mind will be a natural process such as that of evolution by natural selection. Accordingly, the debate is not conducted in a priori terms but draws upon evidence from the cognitive sciences.

This entry will provide an account of the contemporary state of play and its recent history. Unlike some commentators—for example, Griffiths (2002) and Griffiths, Machery and Linquist (2009)—the entry will proceed under the assumption that the concept of innateness is in good standing. This assumption is justified by the continued invocation of the concept of innateness in mainstream contemporary discussions of cognitive development in both the philosophical and empirical literature. For, if so many influential scholars frame their views of cognitive development in terms of their nativist credentials then it is hardly plausible that they are operating with a confused concept when they consider whether some aspect of the mind is innate.

This entry does not engage with the question of what it is for something to be innate. There is a substantial literature on this question (see Cain 2021 and Laurence & Margolis 2024 for recent discussion) but one can sensibly ask questions about what is innate without having a settled account of what innateness is just as one can ask what we know without having a settled account of the nature of knowledge.

1. Two Extreme Alternatives

In the course of everyday life an adult human typically has to interact both with inanimate physical objects and other people who act on the basis of their mental states. They need to quantify phenomena and carry out mathematical operations on the basis of such quantifications. They need to form cooperative relations with other people and doing this will involve using language and making moral judgements. In order to do all these things an individual needs to draw upon a number of distinct bodies of concepts and knowledge each of which relates to a particular subject matter or domain of reality.

Normally human individuals do acquire these various distinct bodies of concepts and knowledge and this raises the question of how they do so. In particular, are they innate or are they learned on the basis of experience? If learning plays a role with respect to a particular subject matter does it involve the application of domain-general or domain-specific learning mechanisms? (See Margolis & Laurence 2023 and Laurence & Margolis 2024 for a helpful discussion of the notion of domain specificity and the distinction between domain general and domain specific learning mechanisms.) There need not be a univocal answer to these questions. Perhaps, for example, mental concepts and a knowledge of the workings of the mind is acquired in one way and language or morality in a very different way. To explore the options that have emerged in the recent literature it will be helpful to start with a consideration of two positions that lie at opposite ends of the spectrum. These are radical empiricism, on the one hand, and the massive modularity thesis, on the other.

According to radical empiricism we have domain-general learning mechanisms that enable us to learn about the various domains of reality that we come to know about. Such learning relies upon perceptual input and builds concepts and knowledge out of perceptual resources. Radical empiricism is the view traditionally associated with such classical empiricists as Locke (1690) and Hume (1739) and was more recently resurrected by Jesse Prinz (2002, 2012). Connectionism is often viewed as a form of radical empiricism (Buckner 2019).

At the opposite end of the spectrum is the massive modularity thesis as championed by figures such as Tooby and Cosmides (1992), Tooby, Cosmides and Barrett (2005), Carruthers (2006), Pinker (1997) and Sperber (1996, 2005). According to this position, the mind/brain is composed of many distinct task-specific modules that evolved to deal with particular challenges faced by our ancestors. These modules are sometimes conceived as facilitating domain-specific learning (that is, learning about the specific domain of reality that they evolved to engage with) and are typically regarded as containing innate concepts and knowledge relating to the domain in question. Perhaps the most famous example of such a module is the cheater detection module postulated by Cosmides and Tooby (1992) that they argue evolved to detect cheaters in cooperative activities.

Both radical empiricism and the massive modularity thesis face significant challenges. A first problem for radical empiricism relates to evolution. Humans are the products of evolution by means of natural selection and so can be expected to have evolved various cognitive adaptations. Perhaps such cognitive adaptations could consist solely of perceptual systems and general learning mechanisms. But the problem with this suggestion is that learning takes time and can be very dangerous where the target of learning relates to concepts and knowledge that are crucial to survival. With respect to aspects of the external world that have remained constant throughout our evolutionary history and knowledge of which is crucial for survival, it seems plausible to suggest that we may well have innate concepts and knowledge (Spelke 2022).

A second problem for radical empiricism relates to the early emergence of some of the bodies of concepts and knowledge that we routinely possess giving rise to a poverty of the stimulus argument for their being innate. The basic idea is that if a body of concepts and knowledge routinely manifests itself early in development and at a stage before the individual could plausibly have had the experiences that would be needed to learn it, then it must be innate. Some specific poverty of the stimulus arguments will be discussed below.

A third problem relates to explaining how abstract concepts and knowledge can be learned solely on the basis of experience (Carey 2009). This is because the abstract transcends experience and so cannot be detected by purely perceptual means. Potential examples of abstract concepts include those of cause and moral concepts such as good and bad. And potential examples of abstract knowledge are cases of knowledge that involve those concepts as it relates to facts that cannot be directly perceived.

The challenges facing the massive modularity thesis include the following. First, decisive evidence for the existence of innate modules is difficult to come by and typical postulations can appear unduly speculative. Consider the cheater detection module that supposedly evolved in response to cheating in the context of cooperative activities. But how can we be sure that cheating was a problem at the relevant point in our evolutionary history? Both Sterelny (2012) and Tomasello (2016) point out that during our hunter-gatherer past humans lived in small tightly-knit bands of co-dependents where there was little opportunity or motivation to cheat.

A second problem relates to the wide variety of ways in which different groups of humans live their lives. As Robert Boyd (2018) and Joseph Henrich (2016) emphasize, humans are incredibly flexible. From our original home on the African savannah we have come to occupy most regions of the globe from the tropics to the Arctic regions. These environments place different demands on their inhabitants and, accordingly, their inhabitants have adopted different ways of living drawing upon divergent environmentally specific knowledge. How could we have evolved modules when we were hunter-gatherers living on the African savannah that support effective living in the Arctic or in a contemporary post-industrial society?

A third problem relates to the length of human childhood and dependency which far outstrips that of our great-ape relatives such as chimps and gorillas. Humans are born helpless and take many years to become competent and self-sufficient. What are the evolutionary benefits of this? A common answer is that childhood provides an opportunity for us to focus on learning as for a lengthy period of time we are freed from the need to focus on meeting our everyday material needs (Gopnik & Meltzoff 1997).

2. Core Cognition

In the light of the limitations of radical empiricism and the massive modularity thesis we need a convincing theory of human cognition that can shed a more nuanced light on the issue of the innate elements of cognition. Such an alternative has emerged over the past four decades in the form of what is known as the core knowledge or core cognition approach. This is a post-Piagetian approach in developmental psychology that has been championed by a number of key figures including Elizabeth Spelke (1994, 2003, 2022), Renee Baillargeon (1993, 2001), Susan Gelman (2003), Rochel Gelman (1990), Paul Bloom (2004), Karen Wynn (1998), Frank Keil (1989), Alan Leslie (2005) and Susan Carey (2009). Both Susan Carey (2009) and Elizabeth Spelke (2022) have written monumental books synthesizing a mass of experimental data and developing an overarching theoretical framework. The remainder of this section will focus upon their work.

For Carey (2009) we have evolved several systems of core cognition that enable us to deal with key elements of the external world. She identifies three systems of core cognition: one for dealing with medium sized inanimate objects, one for dealing with minded agents, and one for dealing with numerical values. These are akin to the modules postulated by Fodor (1983) in that they are domain-specific and informationally encapsulated (that is, in processing they draw on their own propriety body of information and don’t have access to all information stored in the mind). She also describes them as perceptual input analyzers as they take perceptual input and deliver conceptual output. This output is conceptual as it is abstract (in the respect that it cannot be cashed out in terms of perceptual primitives) and is made available to central processes for the purpose of action planning. Systems of core cognition utilize innate concepts and knowledge but also facilitate learning about the relevant domain of the external world.

Carey doesn’t think that the mind/brain is exhausted by systems of core cognition; in addition we have a non-modular central system. Although capable of learning, the central system does utilize some innate concepts including that of causation. Such innate concepts facilitate the integration of the output of distinct core systems as when one judges that a particular physical object moved [core object system] as the result of [central system causation] the action of a human agent [core minded agent system].

To give a more detailed sense of Carey’s perspective, we focus on her account of the core system for dealing with medium-sized inanimate objects (the core object system). At the heart of the operations of this system is the general concept of an object, that is, a thing that is independent of the perceiver, persists over time and can exist when not being perceived. In contrast to Piaget (1950 [1954]) Carey argues that this concept is innate and appeals to experimental evidence in support of this claim. Such evidence is taken to show that infants have the concept of an object at a very early stage of life before they have had any opportunity to learn it by a Piagetian process of exploring the world. In other words, such evidence supports a poverty of the stimulus argument for an innate concept of object. One such classic experiment was conducted by Baillargeon, Spelke and Wasserman (1985). Four month-old infants directly face a screen placed on a flat surface that can be rotated by 180º. The screen is gradually rotated through the full 180º. As the screen rises it blocks more and more of the space behind it from view until it reaches the 90º point and from then more and more of the space behind is revealed until it is fully visible at the 180º point. This scenario is repeated to the infants until they are bored as indicated by a lack of displayed attention. Following this, a block is placed on the surface at a point such that it would be obscured from view were the screen raised to the 90º point. Then the infants are shown two distinct scenarios. In one, the screen is raised so that the infant can no longer see the block and then allowed to fall back until its further rotation is prevented by the block. In the other, the block is surreptitiously removed when hidden from view so that the infant witnesses the screen rotating the full 180º without its progress being impeded by the block. If the infant applies the concept object in this situation then they will expect the first scenario but will be surprised by the second. What the data suggests is that the children are indeed surprised by the “impossible” event as they look longer at the second scenario than they do at the first.

In addition to the innate concept of an object Carey, drawing upon work by Pylyshyn and his colleagues (Pylyshyn 2001; Pylyshyn & Storm 1988; Scholl, Pylyshyn, & Franconeri 1999; and Scholl & Pylyshyn 1999) argues that the core object system also draws upon innate knowledge including that objects follow a continuous path through space and time rather than having “gappy” spatial or temporal existences.

Carey also gestures towards a more philosophical argument for the innateness of core concepts by claiming that they cannot be reduced to perceptual primitives or constructed out of them because of their abstract nature. She alludes to this argument at various points in connection with, for example, the concept object and causation. For example, she writes:

Human beings represent nonobservable entities (beliefs, protons), nonobservable properties of observable entities (functions, essences), abstract entities (numbers, logical operations), and fictional entities (Gods ghosts, Hamlet). Concepts for such entities are not themselves the output of sense organs. Of course, the empiricists held that these concepts are nonetheless definable in terms of perceptual primitives. No adequate definition has ever been provided for most concepts … and certainly no definitions for many concepts in terms of perceptual primitives can even be attempted. (2009: 28–29)

Despite the strong nativist credentials of the core cognition approach, Carey finds a significant place for learning in cognitive development, learning of both knowledge and new concepts. Some of this learning takes place in the core modules but much also takes place in central cognition by means of a range of learning mechanisms including association, hypothesis testing, Bayesian learning, and Quinean bootstrapping. A important products of such learning are what Carey calls intuitive theories. These are complex bodies of concepts and knowledge stored in the central system that are akin to scientific theories. Some of these intuitive theories are closely related to core knowledge systems as they concern the same subject matter, utilize some of the concepts of core cognition, and take input from core cognition. For example, adults have intuitive physical theories and an intuitive theory of mind. However, intuitive theories go beyond core cognition: they are much richer so as to have a greater explanatory and predictive power and feature concepts that are incommensurable with the concepts of the core system. For example, adults will typically have mathematical concepts—such as that of an integer—that are not part of our core number system and cannot be defined in terms of those concepts. Such concepts are learned.

Spelke (2022) postulates a greater number of systems of core cognition than Carey. (Some commentators suggest that there may well be more than six core systems. For example, Hespos and Rips (2024) argue in favour of a core system for dealing with substances.) Alongside an object system and a number system she postulates a further four core systems two of which relate to distinct aspects of our mental lives. These are the place system, the form system, the agent system, and the social being system. The place system represents the relatively unchanging features of the surface terrain of the environment that the individual moves around and does so in abstract geometrical terms. For, it represents “the distances and directions of its boundaries, ridges, cliffs and crevices” (2022: xxiii). The place system supports the individual’s sense of where they are located and enables them to navigate their local environment.

The form system evolved to enable us to learn and reason about the form and function of plants. In contemporary industrial societies where many people have become detached from the natural world, the form system is redeployed to focus on the form and function of human artefacts. The agent system evolved to enable us to understand people and animals, beings that act on the basis of their intentional states and whose actions causally impact on external objects. Finally, the social being system evolved to enable us to understand beings that share experiences and forms bonds with one another.

According to Spelke, although we utilize the systems of core cognition beyond infancy, we develop in such a way as to go beyond them. In particular, we become able to combine representations generated by distinct core systems and come to appreciate that different core domains overlap. A central example of this relates to the agent and social being systems. People share intentional states as well as experiential states such as feelings and emotions. Moreover, the sharing of intentional states is important for social bonding; for example, the success of a social interchange might depend on one person’s understanding that another has acted on an external object for their mutual benefit. This is something that core cognition doesn’t allow us to understand as it would require combining the output of two different core systems (which, moreover, as they compete for attentional resources are difficult to exercise at one and the same time). But by combining the output of the agent and social being systems we can represent individuals as social agents.

For Spelke language is an important means by which we move beyond the limitations of core cognition but learning a language does draw upon resources provided by core cognition. She claims that although content words don’t directly correspond to core system concepts:

infants learn the meanings of content words like cup and shoe by mapping those words to representations from three core knowledge systems: systems for representing objects as bodies with characteristic forms and functions for action. (2022: 396)

Drawing on the work of Strickland (2017) she suggests that function words can relate directly to core concepts and provides prepositions such as “in” and “on” as examples. We have seen how the combinatorial powers of language can be used to build complex concepts whose components originate in distinct core systems. In addition, the combinatorial resources of language can be used to combine information generated by distinct core systems as when an individual successfully navigates their local environment by relying upon information relating both to persisting features of the surface terrain and to features of movable objects previously encountered in the environment. This is something that both rats and human infants find difficult to do.

Carey and Spelke’s approach has significant benefits over both radical empiricism and the massive modularity theory. With respect the former, it doesn’t have a problem with respect to the acquisition of abstract concepts and sits happily with an evolutionary perspective. With respect to the latter, it can make sense of cognitive flexibility and doesn’t imply that we are trapped by our evolutionary history to the extent that our great ape relatives appear to be.

However, there is an important challenge to the kind of mixed economy view that Carey and Spelke endorse that was directed at the rationalists by Locke and has been resurrected by Prinz (2012). The charge is that empiricist theories are to be preferred to those of nativists who also accept the reality of learning on the grounds of simplicity. For, a theory that postulates two fundamentally distinct means of concept and knowledge acquisition is less simple than a theory that only postulates one such means. In response it could be argued that it is not always obvious which of two competing theories is the most simple. It is uncontentious that the human body is organized into distinct task specific systems that have a hierarchical organization and are the product of evolution. It is also uncontentious that the complex behavior of many animals is not a product of learning. For example, spiders do not learn how to spin webs, trout do not learn how to breed and where to lay their eggs, and many migrating animals rely upon specialized mechanisms to aid navigation (Gallistel 1990, 2000). Thus, the anti-nativist portrays the mind/brain as being very different both from the rest of the human body and the nervous systems of other animals with respect to its articulation into specialized, evolved components. Perhaps, a theory that implies the existence of such a lack of continuity is less simple than the theories developed by Carey and Spelke.

3. Rational Constructivism

Strongly nativist perspectives such as the core cognition approach have not gone unchallenged in the recent empirical literature. Opposition has been presented by an alternative post-Piagetian approach that has developed over roughly the same time frame. This is known as rational constructivism and is a particular development of what is known as the theory theory according to which we have evolved learning mechanisms that enable us to learn about key aspects of the external world during childhood. These include the familiar domains of medium-sized physical objects and the workings of the mind. The knowledge so learned takes the form of a theory akin to a scientific theory in virtue of being “abstract, complex, highly structured, veridical representations and rules” (Gopnik 2003: 240). According to Alison Gopnik (2003), one of its key champions, the theory theory is a species of empiricism as it characterizes childhood learning as drawing on domain general learning mechanisms. However, there is a concession to nativism in the form of a commitment to innate starting theories. But these starting theories, in contrast to systems of core cognition, are not held onto by the developing child for very long as they are overwritten in the light of experience.

Early advocates of the theory theory had little to say about the mechanisms that the developing child draws upon in constructing theories. However, over the last twenty years or so, inspired ideas in the philosophy of science and computer science (for example, Glymour 2001 and Pearl 2000) Gopnik and her colleagues have attempted to address this weakness by developing a Bayesian account of theory construction. The result is known as “rational constructivism” (Xu, Dewar, & Perfors 2009; Xu 2016, 2019).

When Bayesianism began to emerge in the philosophy of science it was largely viewed in normative rather than descriptive terms; that is, as providing an account of how we ought to reason rather than how we actually reason. However, many psychologists have come to view certain elements of human cognition as involving Bayesian reasoning processes, particularly with respect to early visual processing (Frith 2007; Feldman 2015). Gopnik and her colleagues have sought to extend Bayesianism in order to shed light on theory construction. For them, theories are networks of hypothesis as to what causes what in the external world. An important feature of such causal hypotheses is that they are underdetermined by evidence delivered by the senses. For nativists such as Spelke (2003) and Chomsky (1986) this insight motivates a poverty of the stimulus argument for innate knowledge. If children are committed to a particular hypothesis (for example, about language or the workings of the physical world) then that commitment could not be based on learning as any evidence they would have acquired through their senses would equally well have supported numerous competing hypotheses. For Gopnik and her colleagues (Gopnik & Bonawitz 2015; Gopnik & Wellman 2012) this nativist argument is undercut by the Bayesian nature of scientific reasoning; observable evidence might not definitively establish a particular hypothesis but it can help us to make judgments of probability that draw upon our prior commitments so that we can chose between competing hypotheses. Moreover, the theoretical commitments of the Bayesian learner are subject to an ongoing process of change and development; evidence is interpreted in the light of prior background commitments but such evidence can lead to a modification of those background commitments (Perfors et al. 2011). Such modifications can add up to significant theoretical changes akin to revolutions in the history of science.

Gopnik and her colleagues claim that a child’s theoretical commitments are represented by means of causal Bayes nets (Gopnik & Wellman 2012; Gopnik & Bonawitz 2015). These represent not only the causal relationships between distinct phenomena but whether those relationships are deterministic or probabilistic and whether they are discrete or continuous. Scientists engage in active intervention rather than mere passive observation when choosing between competing causal hypotheses. This motivates Gopnik and Wellman (2012) to endorse an interventionist view of causation developed by James Woodward (2003). According to this theory causation is not a matter of mere association between different types of events. As Gopnik and Wellman (2012: 9) put it

[t]he central idea is that if there is a direct casual relation between A and B, then, other things being equal, intervening to change the probability of A will change the probability of A.

For Gopnik and Wellman, the developing child is committed to such a view of causation and this leads them to intervene in the world when testing a particular hypothesis. For example, a child might test the hypothesis that pressing a button causes a toy to light up by pressing the button and observing what subsequently happens.

How plausible is rational constructivism and how powerful a challenge does it present to more nativist alternatives? The introduction of a Bayesian dimension constitutes an attempt to tighten up the theory theory by clarifying the manner in which children construct theories on the basis of their experiences but it is still early days for rational constructivism and a number of key questions are far from being answered. First, if children begin with innate starting theories with respect to particular domains of reality what is the content of those theories? Second, precisely how are the hypotheses that a developing child considers in learning formed and selected? After all, mature scientists have rich support mechanisms that are not plausibly available to the developing child in the form of structured training programmes, access to the research of other scientists through conferences and journal articles, funding to pursue particular well defined research topics, and so on.

Third, precisely what theoretical stages do children go through and is there consistency from one child to the next? Fourth, how are we to determine whether a child has undergone a significant theoretical change on the basis of learning or whether a change in how they perform in an experimental setting reflects performance constraints or maturation?

The difficulties of adjudicating between rational constructivism and more nativist approaches can be brought out by examining the much studied case of theory of mind development. A widely held view is that children typically pass through a number of distinct stages in a common order with each of those stages occurring at roughly the same point in the child’s life (Wellman 2014). According to the standard story, at around the age of twelve to eighteen months of age children normally come to appreciate that people can have different desires with respect to the same thing. At around three to three and a half years of age they come to appreciate that different people can have different beliefs about the same object or situation without thereby thinking that at least one of those beliefs is false. At around three and a half to four years of age they come to appreciate that a particular fact can hold without someone knowing that fact. At around four to four-and-a-half years of age they come to understand false-belief, that is, that someone could have a belief that is in fact false. Finally, at around five to five-and-a-half years of age they come to appreciate that a person’s emotions can be at odds with their visible behavior.

For many nativists (for example, Leslie 2005), the reliability of this schedule suggests that theory of mind development is a genetically directed process of maturation. However, evidence has emerged that puts pressure on the standard account of the typical developmental schedule. For example, it was widely held (by nativist and non-nativist alike) that children aren’t normally able to pass the false-belief test until they are at least four years of age. In a classic false-belief test (Baron-Cohen, Leslie, & Frith 1985) a child watches a puppet show involving two characters, Sally and Anne. Anne sees Sally place a marble in a basket. Anne then leaves the room and when she is absent Sally moves the marble from the basket to a box. The child is asked where Anne will look for the marble when she returns to the room. Children under the age of four typically answer by saying that Anne will look in the box. Children who are four and over typically answer that Sally will look in the basket thereby suggesting that they understand that Sally has a belief that is false by their own lights. (The false-belief test was first devised by Daniel Dennett 1978). Baillargeon and her colleagues argue that children are capable of passing non-traditional versions of the false-belief test at 15 months of age (Onishi & Baillargeon 2005; Scott & Baillargeon 2009; He, Bolz, & Baillargeon 2011; Scott et al. 2012; Scott and Baillargeon 2017). In such non-traditional tests displaying an understanding of false-belief does not require answering a question. For example, Scott et al. 2012 told two-and-a-half-year-old toddlers a story about a child called Emily who hides an apple which is subsequently moved to another location in Emily’s absence. At the end of the story the children are told that Emily is looking for her apple. As the story is read the children are shown the relevant page in an accompanying picture book where each page has two pictures, one that matches the story and one that does not. As the story progresses the toddlers preferentially looked at the matching picture indicating that they understand the story. At the end of the story the children are told that Emily is looking for her apple and on hearing this they preferentially looked at the picture where Emily is searching in the incorrect location, that where she originally hid the apple. This suggests that the toddlers have attributed a false-belief to Emily.

If children have an understanding of false-belief from an early age what explains their problems in passing traditional versions of the test? Scott and Baillargeon (2017) appeal to the processing demands generated by traditional versions of the task that overwhelm children younger than four years of age. Not only do children have to exercise their theory-of-mind skills but they also have to engage in linguistic processing to understand the question put to them and inhibit their natural tendency to express their own knowledge concerning the location of the hidden object.

In short then, the standard transition at age four might be due to a maturation of performance systems relating to memory, attention, executive control, or language rather than being a reflection of a significant theoretical change relating to the theory of mind. This could serve to support a nativist perspective as the earlier in development a theory manifests itself the less opportunity a child will have to learn it.

On the other hand, Wellman (2014) argues that evidence suggests that not all children undergo the same schedule when developing a theory of mind and that, therefore, experience plays a greater role than any nativist is willing to concede. For example, the theory of mind development can be delayed in the case of only-children who have fewer opportunities to interact with other children than their fellows who have siblings. Theory of mind development can also be substantially delayed in deaf children with hearing parents (who are often poor at sign language) in contrast to those with deaf parents (who are often competent signers) (Peterson 2009).

For Wellman this supports the radical constructivist perspective on theory of mind development. However, such evidence is not decisive and could be interpreted along the following more nativistically orientated lines. A theory of mind of the kind envisaged by the nativist will only go so far in enabling one to uncover the mental states of other people. This is because some of our behavior is driven by local cultural conventions and some of our behavior reflects our personal idiosyncrasies. Hence, it helps to have both knowledge of local conventions and knowledge about specific individuals, knowledge that no sensible person would claim to be innate. Though such knowledge is to be distinguished from the core of an individual’s theory of mind it couldn’t be learned without a theory of mind and it sits alongside such a theory once it is learned rather than superseding or replacing it.

As for the case of deaf children of hearing parents and only-children my suggestion is that the mindreading limitations they show may well reflect a lack of knowledge of local conventions and the specific characteristics of particular individuals rather than of any limitations relating to the core of their theory of mind. Such lack of knowledge would be due to the difficulties that parents have in communicating the relevant information (in the former case) and a dearth of contemporaries from whom to learn such information (in the latter case).

In sum, the debate between radical constructivists and their more nativistically inclined opponents is an ongoing one that awaits resolution.

4. Language Acquisition

The area where the debate about nativism has raged most vociferously relates to language acquisition. This debate has focused on the work of Noam Chomsky who revolutionized linguistics and initiated the cognitive revolution and the associated decline of behaviorism. Chomsky’s work remains important and influential but has faced increasingly significant challenges in recent years.

Language is central to human life and is possibly unique to humans (Fitch 2010; Hurford 2014). It is the primary means by which we communicate information, it supports our thinking, and it facilitates the development of culture and its transmission from generation to generation. No human is born being able to speak a language such as English, French, Japanese, Warlpiri, or whatever, but most develop a mastery of at least one such language during their early years. A natural suggestion is that such a mastery is based upon the possession of a body of knowledge about the language in question. This knowledge includes lexical knowledge concerning the words belonging to the language and their sound and meaning. It also includes syntactic knowledge, knowledge of the rules for combining lexical items into larger linguistic structures such as phrases and sentences. This raises the question of how such knowledge is acquired: is it learned by general learning mechanisms or does it have a language-specific innate component? It looks implausible to say that lexical knowledge is innate; for example, I know that “rabbit” is a word of English and what that word means but surely I learned such knowledge. Accordingly, the debate has focused on syntax.

According to Chomsky (2016) the mind/brain comprises of a number of distinct yet interacting subsystems akin to bodily organs. One of these is the language faculty. The mature state of an individual’s language faculty encodes their language in the form of a lexicon and a battery of syntactic rules or principles. The syntactic rules are recursive in the respect that they can be applied to their own output. As a consequence, an individual’s language will contain infinitely many distinct sentences and, barring performance limitations, the individual will be able to produce and understand infinitely many distinct sentences of their language. This is the so-called creativity of language (Chomsky 1965).

If the mature state of an individual’s language faculty serves to encode the syntax of the language that they speak then how did they acquire that “knowledge”? Chomsky rejects the idea that it is learned from scratch whilst accepting that experience plays an important role. The initial state of an individual’s language faculty is part of their innate endowment and takes the form of Universal Grammar (UG). UG constrains the form that any human language can take and provides the child with a head-start in acquiring their first language. In a prominent form of Chomsky’s approach that emerged in the 1980s UG takes the form of a small number of principles with associated options known as parameters (Chomsky 1986). Syntax acquisition thus becomes a matter of setting parameters on the basis of limited language exposure.

What reasons are there for thinking that we have innate language specific knowledge in the form of UG? Chomsky’s most famous answer invokes poverty of the stimulus considerations. With respect to syntax, children typically have a mature knowledge of the language that they speak by the age of four. However, there is reason to believe that their linguistic experiences are not sufficiently rich to facilitate learning by this age. In actual fact, there are several versions of the poverty of the stimulus argument with respect to language acquisition. The one most closely associated with Chomsky claims that the sentences the child encounters in their early years (the primary linguistic data) are equally consistent with conflicting bodies of rules and so don’t direct the child down any particular route. Chomsky (1968 [1972]) argues that the problem with the primary linguistic data is twofold. First, it is contains many ungrammatical structures. Second, it fails to contain instances of particular types of complex sentences that are needed to learn syntactic rules that appeal to structure rather than linear order (for example, rules for generating polar interrogatives from declarative sentences).

A second version of the poverty of the stimulus argument is known as the logical problem of language acquisition (Pinker 1989). According to this version the primary linguistic data contains little negative data, that is, data as to which constructions do not belong to the language. A major reason for this is that parents do not generally tell their children that the ungrammatical structures that they produce are ungrammatical (Brown 1973; Pinker 1994). In virtue of this paucity of negative data children are in danger of overgeneralizing, that is, endorsing rules that fit their experience but imply that ungrammatical structures that they have not yet encountered are in fact grammatical.

Chomsky’s position has received multiple objections over the past few decades. Some argue that corpus analysis suggest that the primary linguistic data is not as impoverished as Chomsky suggests (Cowie 1999; Scholz & Pullum 2006; Sampson 2005). Some argue that children focus on sentences spoken in Motherese or Child Directed Speech (Gopnik, Meltzoff, & Kuhl 1999) and as a result of this the primary linguistic data they learn from is much cleaner than Chomsky supposes (Newport, Gleitman, & Gleitman 1977; Snow 1977). Cowie (1999) draws a distinction between negative data and negative evidence and argues that children get negative evidence to the effect that the ungrammatical structures that they produce are ungrammatical even if they are not explicitly told that they are. Tomasello (2003) argues that children would attain syntactic maturity much earlier than they actually do were linguistic development a matter of parameter setting. Some linguists have questioned the reality of syntactic universals and argue that languages vary more than Chomsky thinks (Evans & Levinson 2009; Everett 2012). On the other hand, focusing on nativist positions that portray language as an evolutionary adaptation, (for example, Pinker & Bloom 1990 and Jackendoff & Pinker 2005) Christiansen and Chater (2008) argue that languages don’t vary as much as they would were they products of evolution. Finally, some connectionists argue that their success in modelling particular aspects of language acquisition motivate the idea that language is learned by means of experience driven changes to connectionist networks embodied in the brain (Elman 1991; Elman et al. 1996).

This entry won’t go into the details of these objections. Rather, it focuses upon the challenge to Chomsky provided by an alternative, anti-nativist theory of language acquisition that has become very prominent in recent years. This is the so-called usage-based theory of language acquisition as articulated by Michael Tomasello (2003) and incorporated in a broader picture of human evolution and cognitive development in later work (particularly, Tomasello 2014, 2019, 2022, 2024).

For Tomasello (2003, 2024) there is no language faculty and language is a cultural phenomenon invented and learned by humans in a socio-cultural context. The language learning process does utilize evolved capacities but those capacities did not evolve specifically for language. Rather, they evolved to support general learning and cooperation and group living. The capacities utilized in language learning are the capacity for pattern recognition and the capacity for shared intentionality.

Pattern recognition involves detecting statistical regularities in bodies of data and is clearly relevant in a wide range of contexts. Shared intentionality involves the sharing of mental states between individuals (such as beliefs, desires, intentions, goals, and the like) and the mutual knowledge of that commonality. Shared intentionality takes two distinct forms that emerged at different points in human evolution in response to different environmental pressures. The first form is joint intentionality and involves a relationship between two individuals and evolved in the human lineage some 400,000 years ago to support cooperation between pairs of individuals. Such cooperation requires the pair to have mutual knowledge of their shared goal, mutual knowledge of the role of each partner in achieving the goal, and mutual knowledge of the ideal way to perform each of these roles. Such mutual knowledge is stored in what Tomasello calls personal common ground. Joint intentionality involves forming rabidly higher-order mental states of the kind made famous by Grice (1957) in his discussion of communicative intentions and Lewis (1969, 1975) in his work on conventions. Tomasello (2014) calls this recursive mindreading. For example, suppose two-hunter gatherers X and Y have the joint goal of picking fruit from a particular tree. Then X must intend to pick the fruit with Y and Y must intend to pick the fruit with X. X must know that Y has that intention and Y must know that X has that intention. And X must know that Y has that knowledge of X’s intentions and Y must know that X has that knowledge of Y’s intentions.

The second form of shared intentionality is collective intentionality. This is a scaled up form of joint intentionality that first emerged around 200,000 years ago when humans started to form larger groups where it was not possible for every group member to know every other group member. Collective intentionality involves members of a cultural group having mutual knowledge of the conventional practices of that group and of the ideal way to perform the various roles people perform within the group. Such knowledge constitutes cultural common ground and enables individuals to interact effectively with those who they do not know intimately. For, they will know how they are generally expected to behave in any given cultural context and how the other participants in that context can be relied upon to behave. In terms of ontogenetic development, Tomasello (2019) claims that the capacity for joint intentionality typically appears at around nine months of age and the capacity for collective intentionality typically appears at around three years of age.

Tomasello (2003, 2024) has a detailed conception of what is learned when we learn language as he endorses construction grammar, the view that languages are inventories of constructions. A construction is a “symbolic unit with meaning” (Tomasello 2003: 160). Hence, any particular concrete word or sentence (such as “dog”, “chased”, “the dog chased the cat”, and so on) is a construction. Many constructions are abstract as concrete sentences instantiate more abstract forms. For example, the concrete construction “the dog chased the cat” instantiates the more abstract constructions:

  • X chased the cat
  • X chased Y
  • transitive-subject transitive-verbed transitive-object

Each construction in this list is more abstract that the one that it follows, the first two being item based constructions—as they feature at least one concrete word—and the third being an abstract utterance level construction. For Tomasello, when an individual utters a particular sentence in order to communicate a particular message (or understands the communicative intentions of someone else when they utter a particular sentence) they draw upon constructions represented in their mind. If an abstract construction is involved, then particular concrete words are placed into the slots that figure in that abstract construction.

For Tomasello the process of learning a language is a gradual and piecemeal one beginning around nine months of age that involves utilizing pattern recognition skills and the capacity for shared intentionality. An example will help crystalize the picture. Early in life a child will engage in routine activities with their carers such as feeding, washing, playing, and so on. The child and the carer will often engage in joint intentionality in such situations as they both attend to some element of the scene before them. Suppose that the pair are playing with a toy and jointly attending to it. The adult takes the toy and places it out of view and says “toy gone.” Drawing upon their personal common ground the child will have no difficulty working out that what the adult’s communicative intentions are in saying “toy gone” and thus what the adult meant in saying that phrase. Shortly afterwards the adult is feeding the child and when the child has cleared their plate the adult says “food gone.” Once again the child, drawing upon personal common ground shared with the adult, will have no trouble working out what the adult means by “food gone” and another construction will be added to their developing body of linguistic knowledge.

At this point the child will apply their pattern recognition skills. Realizing that both “toy gone” and “food gone” relate to the disappearance from view of something they conclude that “gone” refers to disappearance. In a similar manner they work out what both “toy” and “food” mean. In addition, the child will reflect on constructions bearing overlapping meaning and identify the patterns that they instantiate; for example, that both “toy gone” and “food gone” instantiate the pattern “X gone.” Thus, the child will learn the construction “X gone” representing it as meaning that item “X”, whatever it is, has disappeared. Armed with this construction they can build and understand previously un-encountered sentences by plugging in new words into the “X” slot.

This process of learning increasingly abstract constructions by means of joint intentionality and pattern recognition will continue as “children begin to form abstract utterance level constructions by creating analogies among utterances emanating from different item-based constructions” (Tomasello 2003: 163–164).

For Tomasello (2019) the early stages of language acquisition take place in the context of pairwise interactions between the child and a familiar individual and the constructions are learned by means of joint intentionality and stored in personal common ground. But if the child is to learn to communicate with anyone beyond a small group of intimates then they will need to come to exercise collective intentionality and appreciate that the constructions they learn are known and by all members of their cultural group and thus stored in cultural common ground. This transition takes place around three years of age once the capacity for collective intentionality has emerged. From this point the child conceives of the constructions that they learn as facilitating communication with all members of their cultural group including many people that they do not know.

Does Tomasello’s account of language acquisition constitute a viable alternative to Chomsky’s nativism? Two potential lines of objection to Tomasello can be sketched in the following terms. The first objection is that Tomasello’s account gives rise to poverty of the stimulus worries. As he portrays it, the task for an adult carer in supporting a child’s linguistic development is a demanding one. For, they will have to provide a body of richly detailed and structured input over a significant period of time. For that input to reliably support the acquisition of a language such as English it must meet three conditions. First, to enable the child to work out the communicative intentions of the adult the latter must produce concrete sentences that don’t contain too many unfamiliar words or are too complex relative to the child’s stage of development. Second, the adult must ensure that they regularly stretch the child by providing them with new increasingly complex constructions and resist the temptation to replace constructions that are not initially understood with more familiar ones that the child has already mastered. Third, the child needs to remember the precise concrete sentences that they hear and not merely their meaning otherwise the input to pattern recognition processes will not be such as to facilitate the learning new constructions. Memory limitations also mean that the instances of a given target construction must be encountered within an appropriately short timeframe.

These three conditions are very demanding and imply that the child is in a quite vulnerable position when trying to learn in Tomasello’s manner. Can we be confident that these conditions are systematically met?

A second objection relates to an internal tension in Tomasello’s position. As we have seen, he thinks that joint intentionality plays the central role in language acquisition up to the age of three and from that point collective intentionality takes over. In the context of his overarching theory of human cognitive evolution Tomasello (2014) portrays joint intentionality as having evolved for use in ad hoc collaborative activities involving only two people. Thus, any knowledge attained in the context of a particular collaborative activity is stored in personal common ground as it is not carried into collaborative activities with other people. The upshot of this is that up until the age of three the developing child will treat any constructions that they learn as a personal code that is shared with only one other person (or, worse still, only with that person on a particular occasion or when engaged in specific collaborative activity). Hence, none of what they learn will be seen as relevant when they turn to the task of learning the conventional language of their community conceived as such. The implication of this is that little that is relevant for genuine language learning can take place before the age of three as anything learned before that point will not be regarded in the right light. This is in tension with empirical evidence that children have made considerable progress in acquiring language before the age of three (Clark 2003 [2024]).

5. The Agency Based Account of Cognitive Development

The previous section provided an account of Tomasello’s anti-nativist theory of language acquisition and indicated how it was built into a larger perspective on human cognitive development that emphasizes the importance of the species unique capacities for shared intentionality. Tomasello (2016) extends this approach to morality arguing that morality emerges in two distinct stages both in human evolutionary history and individual development. These two distinct forms of morality both have the function of supporting cooperation; one in the context of collaborative activities between pairs of individuals who know one another and the other in the context of cooperation in large-scale cultural groups. This perspective on moral development stands in contrast to nativist approaches that postulate an innate moral module (Mikhail 2011) or portray morality as based on a dedicated element of core cognition (Hamlin 2023).

More recently Tomasello has broadened his perspective yet further in order to develop a wide-ranging and systematic approach to human cognitive development. This approach finds a role not only for human-specific skills and capacities (such as shared intentionality) but also for traits that are shared with many other species. Tomasello (2024) calls his perspective the agency based approach to cognitive development.

Tomasello (2024: 8) contrasts the agency based approach with what he calls “modern cognitive-developmental theory”. In identifying Carey (2009), Gopnik and Wellman (2012), Tenenbaum et al. (2011) and Xu (2019) as representatives, Tomasello conceives of this orthodoxy in such a way as to encompass both the core cognition approach and rational constructivism. For, collectively, they portray cognitive development as involving a steady and continuous process of development from a basis of domain specific innate information by means of learning (particularly Bayesian learning). Tomasello (2024: 1) argues that the modern orthodoxy has failed to recognize that human individuals pass through distinct stages in the course of cognitive development and that these stages are fundamentally different from one another to such an extent that “[c]hildren of different ages live in different worlds,” He postulates three such stages each of which is grounded in a particular cognitive architecture that utilizes a distinctive format of representation and manner of inference. Accordingly, the concepts and knowledge generated at each stage are fundamentally different from those generated at the others. It is only at the third stage (which typically begins between the ages of three and four years) that the child appreciates that different individuals have different perspectives on an objective reality that can be evaluated with respect to their truth-value and that individual behavior is answerable to moral and normative standards that hold independently of the individual. Hence, it is only at this stage that infants have such fundamental concepts as BELIEF, TRUE, FAIRNESS, and NATURAL NUMBER. With its appeal to qualitatively distinct stages of cognitive development the agency based account echoes Piaget (1950 [1954]). And due to the emphasis that it places on the social dimension of cognition (via the exercise of first joint and then collective intentionality) it echoes Vygotskiĭ (1978).

As its name suggests, the agency based approach emphasizes our agency; humans, like all animals, “are built for action” (Tomasello 2024: 11). Accordingly, cognition evolved in order to enable us to decide how to act so as to satisfy our needs. Tomasello (2022) argues that over the course of evolutionary history three distinct forms of cognitive architecture have evolved to support the process of deciding how to act thereby giving rise to three distinct forms of individual agency. The first of these is goal-directed agency as exemplified by lizard-like creatures. This form of agency involves making go/no-go decisions as when a creature in a particular situation has to decide whether or not to respond in a particular way (for example, whether or not to strike at a perceived insect). Learning is based on the perceived outcome of such go/no-go decisions.

The second form of agency is intentional agency and involves a form of simple executive monitoring and control. Intentional agency first appeared in squirrel-like creatures. Exercising such agency involves making either/or decisions concerning how to act and doing this involves imaging alternative courses of action and choosing between them on the basis of a comparison of their imagined likely outcomes.

The third form of agency is rational (metacognitive) agency and involves an extra level of executive monitoring and control as the agent reflects upon their past decisions as to how to act in the light of new information and revises and reorganizes their beliefs accordingly. Metacognitive agency is exemplified in chimpanzee-like creatures.

We humans have evolved a capacity for each of these forms of agency and they emerge at different points in ontogenetic development as our cognitive architecture is transformed. Up to around nine-months of age human infants are only capable of goal-directed agency. A cognitive architecture that supports intentional agency typically appears between nine and twelve-months of age and one that supports metacognitive agency typically appears between three and four-years of age. The human specific capacities of shared intentionality fit into this developmental schedule. The capacity for joint intentionality emerges between nine and twelve-months of age as it requires the cognitive architecture that supports intentional agency. And the capacity for collective intentionality emerges between three and four-years of age as it requires a cognitive architecture that supports metacognitive agency.

6. Conclusion

Tomasello’s agency based approach constitutes an important alternative to both the core cognition approach and rational constructivism and is the least nativistically orientated of the three with respect to the postulation of innate concepts and knowledge. Although Tomasello seems to be committed to the existence of innate cognitive mechanisms underlying our capacities for joint and collective intentionality he is parsimonious when it comes to the postulation of domain specific innate theories and modules. The battle between these three approaches lies at the forefront of the contemporary debate concerning the nature and extent of our innate cognitive resources.

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