Indexicals

First published Fri Sep 14, 2001; substantive revision Thu Sep 3, 2026

An indexical is, roughly speaking, a linguistic expression whose reference can shift from context to context. For example, the indexical ‘you’ may refer to one person in one context and to another person in another context. Other paradigmatic examples of indexicals are ‘I’, ‘here’, ‘today’, ‘yesterday’, ‘he’, ‘she’, and ‘that’. Two speakers who utter a single sentence that contains an indexical may say different things. For instance, when both John and Mary utter ‘I am hungry’, Mary says that she is hungry, whereas John says that he is hungry. Many philosophers hold that indexicals have two sorts of meaning. The first sort of meaning is often called ‘linguistic meaning’ or ‘character’ (the latter term is due to David Kaplan, 1989a). The second sort of meaning is often called ‘content’. Using this terminology, we can say that every indexical has a single unvarying character, but may vary in content from context to context.

Philosophers have several reasons for being interested in indexicals. First, some wish to describe their meanings and fit them into a general semantic theory. Second, some wish to understand the logic of arguments containing indexicals, such as Descartes’s Cogito argument. Third, some think that reflection on indexicals may give them some insight into the nature of belief, self-knowledge, first-person perspective, consciousness, and other important philosophical matters.

1. Preliminaries

1.1 Some Further Examples of Indexicals, Some Terminology, and a Contrast with Ambiguity

The indexicals that philosophers have studied most are the pronouns ‘I’, ‘he’, ‘she’, ‘it’, ‘this’, and ‘that’; the adverbs ‘here’, ‘now’, ‘today’, ‘yesterday’, ‘tomorrow’, and ‘actually’; and the adjectives ‘my’, ‘his’, ‘her’, ‘present’, ‘past’, and ‘actual’. The items on this list come mostly from David Kaplan’s influential work on indexicals, Demonstratives (Kaplan 1989a).

Indexicals are commonly called context-sensitive expressions (or context-dependent expressions) but the two terms tend to be used differently. The term ‘indexical’ tends to be restricted to simple expressions, such as ‘I’ and ‘today’. The term ‘context-sensitive’, however, is commonly applied both to simple indexicals and to complex expressions that contain simple indexicals, for example, the definite description ‘the dog she is looking at’, the verb phrase ‘sat next to me’, and the sentence ‘He is standing’.

The rough characterization of indexicals in the first sentence of this article might be rejected by some theorists, for it relies on the notion of a linguistic expression (such as ‘you’) varying in reference, and content, among contexts. But some theorists instead describe indexicality in terms of expressions varying in reference or content relative to utterances or other sorts of speech acts, such as assertions. Other theorists speak of utterances or tokens varying in reference or content, without any relativization to context or speech act. Some theorists speak several ways. The differences may be theoretically significant, and more will be said about them below. In addition, some philosophers would prefer to speak entirely about shifts in extension, rather than shifts in reference, from context to context. Some theorists, for instance, hold that ‘you’ is not a singular term that refers to an individual in a context. Rather, it is a quantifier phrase, and so its extension, in a context, is not an individual, but rather a certain sort of set. (See section 4.2 below for an analogous view of complex demonstratives.) Such a theorist may also wish to use the term ‘reference’ only for expressions whose extensions are individuals. This article, however, will use ‘reference’ and ‘extension’ more-or-less interchangeably. On this use of ‘reference’, the word ‘you’ varies in reference from context to context, even if it is a quantifier phrase whose extension, in a context, is not an individual, but a set.

Indexicality should be distinguished from ambiguity. Ambiguous simple expressions, such as ‘bank’ and ‘bat’, have a fixed, limited number of different meanings determined by linguistic convention. Indexicals, by contrast, seem to have a single linguistic meaning that is fixed by linguistic convention, but also another sort of meaning (content) that varies from occasion to occasion, or context to context. For instance, it seems that ‘you’ has a single meaning fixed by linguistic convention, and it is because of this fixed linguistic meaning that the sentence ‘You are hungry’ can have a virtually unlimited number of contents, in different contexts.

1.2 Indexical and Non-Indexical Uses of Pronouns

Some of the expressions in the earlier list of indexicals have both indexical and non-indexical uses. In particular, the pronouns ‘he’, ‘she’, ‘his’, and ‘hers’ appear to have three different types of use: indexical uses (sometimes called deictic or demonstrative uses), bound variable uses, and unbound anaphoric uses (Kaplan 1989a, pp. 489–90; Partee 1989).

The pronouns in (1)–(2) would typically be used as indexicals in utterances of (1)–(2) that are accompanied by pointing gestures.

  • (1) He was born in Detroit. [Pointing at John]
  • (2) Her paper was published. [Pointing at Mary]

When used demonstratively, the extensions and contents of ‘he’, ‘her’, and sentences (1) and (2) can vary from context to context, depending in some way on the speaker’s demonstrations or referential intentions or other contextual factors.

By contrast, the occurrence of ‘he’ and ‘her’ in (3) and (4), on the relevant ways of understanding them, function like occurrences of variables bound by quantifier phrases.

  • (3) Every young boy thinks that he will go to school.
  • (4) Every young girl rode her bike.

Consequently, we could reasonably symbolize (3) and (4) with (5) and (6) below.

  • (5) (Every \(x: x\) is a young boy) x thinks that x will go to school.
  • (6) (Every \(x: x\) is a young girl) x rode x’s bike.

The contents of (5) and (6) do not vary from context to context (or at least do not do so in virtue of the occurrences of the pronouns).

Finally, these same pronouns are also sometimes used as unbound anaphors. That is, some occurrences seem not to be used demonstratively, and not to be within the scope of prior explicit quantifier phrases or other binding linguistic expressions, and yet seem to depend for their interpretation on prior occurrences of linguistic expressions. (See the entries on anaphora and discourse representation theory.) For example, ‘he’ appears to be used as an unbound anaphor in discourse (7) and ‘she’ seems to be so used in (8).

  • (7) Johnny was riding a bike. He was having a good time.
  • (8) A woman came to my office today. She worked for Gigantic Academic Press. She tried to persuade me to adopt their logic book.

These three uses of pronouns seem quite different. Consequently, Kaplan (1989b, p. 572) sometimes says that ‘he’ is lexically ambiguous, and that the demonstrative ‘he’ and the anaphoric ‘he’ are homonymous expressions (Kaplan 1989b, p. 593). Most theorists, however, do not hold that these pronouns are ambiguous or that these uses involve distinct homonymous words. Many theorists who work on demonstratives and anaphora emphasize their similarities to variables. For demonstratives and variables, see Heim and Kratzer 1998, chapter 9; for anaphora and variables, see Kamp and Reyle 1993, Chierchia 1992, and Salmon 2006. For related discussion, see Partee (1989), Condoravdi and Gawron (1996), and Neale (2005).

For the rest of this article, we concentrate exclusively on demonstrative uses of the above pronouns.

1.3 Distinctions among Types of Indexicals

Various theorists classify indexicals into types, depending (roughly) on how their references and contents are determined in a context. Kaplan (1989a), for instance, distinguishes between pure indexicals and true demonstratives. The pure indexicals, he says, include ‘I’, ‘today’, ‘tomorrow’, ‘actual’, ‘present’, ‘here’, and ‘now’. The true demonstratives include ‘he’, ‘she’, ‘his’, ‘her’, and ‘that’. Kaplan claims that the reference and content of a true demonstrative, in a context, depends (roughly) on the speaker’s accompanying demonstrations or intentions. For example, Kaplan says that the reference and content of ‘that’ in a context is determined (in part) by the speaker’s pointing gestures or by the speaker’s intention to refer to a particular object. The reference and content of a pure indexical does not. For example, the reference of ‘I’ in a context is always the speaker, whether or not she points at herself, and the reference of ‘tomorrow’ is always the day after the day of the context, no matter which day the speaker intends to refer to.

John Perry (1997; 2001, pp. 58–62) makes a closely related distinction between automatic and discretionary indexicals. Automatic indexicals include ‘I’ and ‘tomorrow’; Perry says they are indexicals whose references are determined by their linguistic meanings and public contextual facts, such as the speaker and the day of utterance; intentions (other than the intention to use the indexical with its usual meaning) are irrelevant. Discretionary indexicals include ‘he’, ‘she’, ‘that’, and ‘this man’; they depend for reference on speakers’ intentions. Perry also makes an orthogonal distinction between narrow and wide indexicals. Narrow indexicals are those whose references are determined by narrow contexts, where narrow contexts include only a speaker, a time, and a location. Wide contexts include other facts, such as speakers’ intentions, assumptions made by conversational participants, and so on. The expressions that Kaplan calls ‘true demonstratives’ Perry would call ‘wide discretionary indexicals’.

Various complications arise in categorizing indexicals as pure indexicals and true demonstratives, or as automatic and discretionary. Kaplan (1989) classifies ‘here’ and ‘now’ as pure indexicals, though he thinks that the temporal and spatial extents of their extensions depend on speakers’ intentions (Kaplan 1989a, 419, n.12). Perry (1997, 2001) thinks that this sort of variation justifies classifying them as discretionary rather than automatic. Other indexicals may raise similar issues. For example, ‘today’ may initially appear to be an automatic indexical in Perry’s sense, but sometimes it is seemingly used to refer to temporal periods longer than a single day, as in ‘Today we ride in automobiles rather than in horse-drawn carriages’. Another test case has been the second person singular pronoun ‘you’. It typically refers to the addressee, which makes quite similar to the first person pronoun, a pure indexical. On the other hand, the speaker’s intention to address someone plausibly plays a role in determining who is being addressed, and thus it resembles demonstratives. For further discussion of these distinctions, and their viability, see Mount 2008; Salje 2017; Radulescu 2018; Verdejo 2021; Zhou 2025.

1.4 Reference-Fixing, and Content-Fixing, for True Demonstratives

Many theorists accept a distinction between true demonstratives and pure indexicals, or some similar distinction, such as Perry’s distinction between automatic and discretionary indexicals. Thus many think that true demonstratives (from here on, simply demonstratives) require something more than pure indexicals to acquire a reference and content. The nature of this “extra something” is controversial, but we can group the views according to where they place the locus of the extra something: some mental states (which may be the speaker’s, the audience’s, or a combination thereof), some other features of the context (like demonstrations), or some purely linguistic facts.

In his 1989a, Kaplan emphasizes the role of pointing gestures in fixing the reference (and content) of a demonstrative. More precisely, he says that the reference of a demonstrative in a context is fixed by a demonstration, which he describes as “typically, though not invariably, a (visual) presentation of a local object discriminated by a pointing.” (1989a, p. 490). Kaplan changes his mind in his 1989b. He there states that he had always thought that a demonstration is “typically directed by the speaker’s intention to point at a perceived individual on whom he has focused.” He then calls such intentions directing intentions and says that he has come to “regard the directing intention, at least in the case of perceptual demonstratives, as criterial, and to regard the demonstration as a mere externalization of this inner intention.” (1989b, p. 582).

Other theorists have proposed other accounts. Michael Devitt (1981) says that the referent of an utterance of ‘that’ is the item that stands in a certain causal relation to the utterance. Colin McGinn (1981) proposes that the referent of an utterance of ‘that F’ is the first F to intersect the line projected from the speaker’s pointing finger. Howard Wettstein (1984) says that the reference of ‘that’ is determined by the cues that a competent and attentive addressee would reasonably take the speaker to be exploiting. Marga Reimer (1991a, 199b) argues that demonstrative utterances can refer to objects that are not the targets of the speaker’s directing intentions, contrary to what she takes Kaplan (1989b) to be arguing. Kent Bach (1992a, 1992b) claims that the object to which a speaker refers with a demonstrative is fixed by the speaker’s communicative intentions. Perry (2009, p. 60) argues that the referent of an utterance of a demonstrative is the object of a directing intention, and offers a rather elaborate theory of directing intentions that is inspired by some brief remarks from Kaplan. Jeffrey King (2012) argues that the semantic value of a demonstrative in a context is the object such that (a) the speaker intends it to be the demonstrative’s semantic value and (b) an attentive hearer would take it to be the speaker’s intended semantic value.

One prima facie problem for demonstration-theories is that demonstratives sometimes refer in contexts in which the speaker does not produce a pointing gesture. If ‘here’ and ‘now’ are true demonstratives, or discretionary indexicals, then they may present a particular difficulty for demonstration-theories, for pointing gestures often seem irrelevant to determining their referents and contents in contexts. Much here depends on what one takes to be a demonstration, and whether any gesture is required; see Ciecerski and Makowski 2022 for discussion. King 2014 points out that speakers may gesture vaguely in a certain direction, with the demonstration likely encompassing many objects, which seems to make demonstrations insufficient to determine the referent.

There have been many objections against intentionalist theories. One is that speakers typically have many intentions when they use demonstratives, and these intentions may conflict (Bach 1992a, 1992b; Perry 1997, 2001 p. 60, 2009; King 2013). For example, a speaker who utters ‘he’ may intend to speak about Joe, about the man that she sees, about the man that others are referring to, and about the man at whom she is pointing. The speaker may think these are the same person when they are not. Speaks 2016 claims that it is psychologically implausible that young children who do use demonstratives would have referential intentions. Extreme intentionalist views, which claim that the speaker’s intentions are both necessary and sufficient for determining the referent face the usual Humpty Dumpty objection (Michaelson 2022): if the speaker can refer to anything they intend to, the rhetorical question asks, why is that not just Humpty Dumptyism? For other objections, see Stokke 2010, Buchanan 2018, Gauker 2019, Lewis 2020, Devitt 2022, Rostworowski 2026, Tamburini 2026. For an intentionalist response, see Radulescu 2019. Another speaker-centered view is that the relevant mental states are not intentions, but something less demanding on the speaker (see Pavese and Radulescu 2026).

Another family of views appeals to the notion of salience: the referent of a demonstrative is the most salient thing at the time of its utterance. The challenge here is to settle on a particular notion of salience, and make it work on standard examples of demonstrative uses. One worry, for example, is this: if salience amounts to what the actual conversation participants are attending to, an unattentive addressee will make it too hard for the speaker to refer by their uses of demonstratives. One might think that moving to an ideal addressee would solve the problem, but much depends on how one specifies an ideal addressee. For discussion, see Mount 2008, Nowak and Michaelson 2021, Michaelson and Nowak 2022, De Leon 2026.

Another type of view, conventionalism, claims that demonstratives need nothing extra-linguistic in order to secure a referent (Stojnić et al. 2013, 2017, Stojnić 2021). The key move here is to enlarge what counts as a linguistic feature. We start from the observation that some sequences of sentences can be interpreted in several ways, depending on the discourse relation between them:

  • (9) Phil tickled Stanley. Liz poked him.

‘Him’ can be interpreted as picking out Stanley, in which case we are taking the second sentence as describing a parallel situation to the first one. Or ‘him’ can be interpreted as referring to Phil, in which case the sequence is interpreted as an event-result one (e.g. Liz poked Phil because he tickled Stanley). Suppose we include these discourse relations as part of the input for the semantics. Using the notion of discourse coherence developed in Kehler 2002, conventionalism claims that in any discourse there are stacks of prominent objects (e.g. one for the subject position and another one for the object position). Linguistic prominence, they claim, is a feature encoded in the grammar, and rising and falling in prominence happens only via intra-linguistic means. In order to make this last claim work, objectivism counts demonstrations as linguistic expressions, since pointing at an object can raise it into the top prominent position. A central argument here is that demonstrating is done differently in different parts of the world, and thus a conventionalized action, on a par with other kinds of language use. And for this to work, conventionalism needs to hold that demonstrations have their referent essentially: when a demonstration makes it into a discourse, its referent automatically comes with it.

To see conventionalism at work, suppose that I point at Mary and say ‘‘She is right-handed’’. My pointing is a linguistic item, which puts Mary at the top of prominence stack. ‘She’ picks out the most prominent single, female thing, i.e. Mary. So the referent of ‘she’ is determined purely linguistically.

Conventionalism is supposed to explain how we interpret discourses so easily and quickly, without seeming to read the speakers’ minds: we merely interpret them by figuring out their linguistic structure. In Stojnić 2021, this is also coupled with a dynamic semantics for English, along with definitions of logical consequence and validity within a dynamic framework, which yield the same results as Kaplan’s logic, provided that we fix the dynamic elements of the logic. An advantage over Kaplan’s logic is that multiple occurrences of demonstratives are unproblematic: if a new object rises to the top of the prominence stack mid-sentence (or mid-utterance), then that will change what the next demonstrative will refer to, with no need for indexing, etc.

Conventionalism has been the topic of much recent discussion, and several challenges have been raised. Nowak and Michaelson 2020 claim that all the problems allegedly solved by conventionalism are merely moved to a different place in the theory (see Stojnić et al. 2020 for a response). Dowell 2025 claims that the two possible readings of (9) are indeed easy to come by, but merely saying that they are part of the discourse does not help explain how we interpret them. The challenge is that if we now need to appeal to the audience’s take on the speaker’s mental states, for example, then we are back to the old debates between non-conventionalist views, though relocated somewhere else. Georgi 2023 challenges conventionalists’ arguments in favor of introducing demonstrations into logical form. Radulescu 2023 responds on behalf of intentionalism, claiming that when conventionalists appeal to data about how we naturally interpret discourses, intentionalists can sometimes reject the data, and other times adopt it into their view. Pavese and Radulescu 2026 argue that some of the core motivating cases used by conventionalists are underdescribed, and that further inspection does not support conventionalism.

One possibility is that there is no single mechanism of reference for demonstratives, which would explain why each theory we have been discussing seems open to counterexamples. See Nowak and Michaelson 2022 for a defense of this view.

2. Which Expressions are Indexicals?

Nearly all semantic theorists would agree that the list of simple indexicals given in section 1.1 is incomplete. Nearly all would agree that a more complete list includes the plural terms ‘we’, ‘us’, ‘ours’, ‘they’, ‘them’, ‘theirs’, ‘these’ and ‘those’, and most would be willing to add the adjective ‘current’ and the adverbs ‘then’, ‘presently’, ‘currently’, and ‘there’. Many theorists have proposed further additions to the list of simple indexicals, but these additions are controversial.

2.1 Some Expressions that Have Been Said to Be Indexicals

A semantic theory that says that an expression is context-sensitive, or is an indexical expression, is a contextualist theory of that expression. A theory that says that an expression is context-insensitive is an invariantist theory. Below is a list of types of expressions for which contextualist theories have been proposed, along with some discussion.

Tense Some theorists hold that sentences containing verbs in the present tense vary not only in truth-value from time to time, but also in content, from context to context. For example, some hold that the content of ‘Fred is hungry’ at a context whose associated time is t is (roughly) that Fred be hungry at t. The variation in content is said to be due to the occurrence of ‘is’, which is context-sensitive. More generally, tense markers and tense morphology are claimed to be context-sensitive expressions. See Reichenbach 1947, Partee 1973, Enç 1987, Salmon 1989, Ogihara 1996, and King 2003.

Modals Paradigmatic modal terms include ‘necessary’ and ‘necessarily’, ‘possible’ and ‘possibly’, ‘contingent’ and ‘contingently’, ‘must’, ‘might’, ‘could’, ‘may’, ‘can’, and ‘able’. Some theorists would include many more expressions (Portner 2009). Speakers who utter a modal may mean different sorts of modality on different occasions. Examples: (a) Someone who utters ‘Sue can go to the party’ may mean (roughly) that her going to the party is consistent with her plans (practical or circumstantial possibility) or instead that her going is (merely) consistent with the laws of nature (nomological possibility). (b) If Jill utters ‘Joe might have been in London this morning’, she may mean that Joe’s being in London is consistent with her knowledge, whereas if Bill utters that same sentence, he may mean that Joe’s being in London is consistent with his (Bill’s) knowledge. In both cases, epistemic possibility is involved. (c) If Susan utters ‘Alice might have run three miles’, she might mean that Alice’s having run three miles is consistent with Alice’s metaphysical essence (metaphysical possibility) or that Alice’s having run is consistent with her (Susan’s) knowledge. (d) Someone who utters ‘Mary may go to school’ may mean that her going to school is morally permissible or instead that it is legally permissible. In both cases, a variety of deontic possibility is involved. Many theorists attribute the preceding sorts of variation to context-sensitivity in the relevant modals. Those who think that modals are semantically like quantifiers over possible worlds typically hold that the content of a modal, in a context, is the same as a restricted quantifier over possible worlds, where the relevant restriction varies from context to context. See Kratzer 1977, 2012; and Lewis 1979b.

Gradable Adjectives Paradigm examples of gradable adjectives are ‘tall’, ‘old’, ‘rich’, ‘fast’, ‘smart’, and ‘hot’. They are called ‘gradable’ because they can be felicitously modified with adverbs such as ‘fairly’ and ‘very’. Suppose that Susan is both a professional philosopher and a professional basketball player. A speaker who utters ‘Susan is tall’ might use ‘tall’ to mean (very roughly) tall for a philosopher. That same speaker, on another occasion, might utter ‘Susan is not tall’ and use ‘not tall’ to mean (roughly) not tall for a basketball player. Some theorists explain the variability by holding that gradable adjectives are context-sensitive. See Kennedy 2007.

Adjectives and Nouns that Optionally Take Complements Paradigm examples of adjectives of this sort are ‘ready’, ‘late’, ‘relevant’, ‘local’, and ‘eligible’, and paradigm examples of nouns of this sort are ‘neighbor’ and ‘enemy’. A speaker who utters ‘Tipper is ready’ typically means that Tipper is ready for X, where X is some event or activity the speaker has in mind. In one context, a speaker might mean that Tipper is ready to work; in another context, he might mean that Tipper is ready for a certain party. Therefore, some theorists hold that ‘ready’ is context-sensitive. Somewhat similarly, a speaker who utters ‘Smith is a neighbor’ may mean that Smith is a neighbor of his (the speaker’s) or that Smith is a neighbor of someone else (say, Jones). Again, it may be claimed that ‘neighbor’ is context-sensitive. See Partee 1989, Condoravdi and Gawron 1996, Bach 2005, Gauker 2012.

‘Know’ Speakers in some contexts may judge that the sentence ‘John knows that the bank will be open on Saturday’ is true. Speakers in other contexts who are aware of the same facts about John may, at the same time, judge that this same sentence is false. Consequently some philosophers hold that ‘know’ has different contents in different contexts, depending on the standards of justification that speakers of the context take for granted, or depending on the epistemic alternatives that are salient to the speakers of that context. See Cohen 1988, DeRose 1995, Lewis 1996, and the entry on epistemic contextualism.

Quantifier phrases Examples of quantifiers are ‘every’, ‘all’, ‘some’, ‘no’, ‘most’, ‘many’, and ‘few’. Quantifier phrases are (roughly) noun phrases or determiner phrases that include both a quantifier and a common noun or noun phrase, for example, ‘every student’, ‘some dog’, and ‘no black cats’. Two speakers who utter the same sentence containing a quantifier phrase may mean different things. If Smith is teaching a class of first-graders and utters ‘Every student has a pencil’, he means something like every student in Smith’s first-grade class has a pencil’. If Jones is proctoring a multiple-choice exam in a large college course, and utters that same sentence, then she means something like every student taking exam E has a pencil, where E is the relevant exam. This phenomenon is often called quantifier-domain restriction. Some theorists propose to explain this variation by hypothesizing that quantifier phrases are context-sensitive. See von Fintel 1994, Stanley and Szabo 2000.

Theorists have proposed contextualist theories for many other expressions, including: Conditionals (Lewis 1973, Kratzer 2012, and the entry on conditionals); deontic terms, such as ‘ought’ and ‘should’ (Lewis 1973, Kratzer 2012, Portner 2009); perspectival expressions, such as ‘come’, ‘go’, ‘left’, ‘right’, and ‘behind’ (Lewis 1979b); weather predicates, such as ‘rain’ and ‘hot’ (see Sennett 2008 for an overview); propositional attitude verbs, such as ‘believe’ (Richard 1990, and the entry on propositional attitude reports); common nouns, such as ‘student’ and ‘table’ (Stanley and Szabo 2000); and vague expressions, which include nearly all expressions in natural languages (Raffman 1996, Soames 1999, Fara 2000, and the entry on vagueness).

If the above expressions are indexicals, then their contents seem to depend (at least in part) on speakers’ intentions. They are not, however, appropriately called ‘true demonstratives’, for pointing gestures seem completely irrelevant to fixing their contents and references. Perry’s term ‘discretionary indexical’ would be more apt.

2.2 Strict Contextualism, Invariantism with Hidden Indexicals, and Invariantism with Unarticulated Constituents

Contextualist theories for an expression should be distinguished from invariantist theories that hypothesize hidden indexicals. On views of the latter sort, the expression itself is context-insensitive, but its occurrences are (often) accompanied by occurrences of an unpronounced expression that is context-sensitive. These context-sensitive expressions are sometimes said to be, or to resemble, indexicals, pronouns, or variables. For illustration, consider the gradable adjective ‘rich’. A strict contextualist theory would claim that this adjective is a unary predicate whose content in any context is a unary property. In some contexts, the content of ‘rich’ is (roughly) the property of being rich for a philosopher, while in others its content is the property of being rich for the CEO of a large company. By contrast, an invariantist theory with hidden indexicals for ‘rich’ would claim that the content of ‘rich’ does not vary from context to context: its content, in every context, is the same binary relation, roughly rich for, that can hold between a person and (roughly) a property. Sometimes the predicate ‘rich’ appears in sentences in which it has two (linguistic) arguments, as in ‘George is rich for a philosopher’. But in sentences in which there is no pronounced second argument, as in ‘George is rich’, the predicate ‘rich’ is accompanied by an unpronounced occurrence of a context-sensitive expression that resembles a pronoun. In some contexts, the content of the hidden indexical is the property of being a philosopher and in others it is the property of being a CEO of a large company. See Partee (1989), Condoravdi and Gawron (1996), Stanley and Szabo 2000.

A third type of theory for ‘rich’ is an invariantist theory with unarticulated constituents (Perry 2000, Chapter 10). On such views, ‘rich’ is a binary predicate whose content in all contexts is the previously mentioned binary relation rich for, but the word is never accompanied by a hidden indexical. Thus the content of the sentence ‘George is rich’, in all contexts, is less than fully propositional. However, according to some views of this sort, a speaker who utters that sentence typically asserts a full proposition, such as the proposition that George is rich for a philosopher. For discussion, see Bach 1994, 2005.

2.3 Strategies for Resisting Attributions of Context-Sensitivity

Some theorists , as we have seen, hold that indexicality extends far beyond Kaplan’s list, and pervades natural language. Others deny this. Many opponents of pervasive context-sensitivity rely heavily on pragmatics and speech act theory to explain away the phenomena that others take to be evidence for pervasive context-sensitivity. For example, Bach (2001) and Soames (2009) argue that quantifier phrases are context-insensitive. The content of ‘every student’, in all contexts, quantifies over absolutely all students. So, the content ‘Every student has a pencil’, in all contexts, is equivalent to the content of ‘Every student in the entire universe has a pencil’. But Bach and Soames say that speakers who utter that sentence almost always mean, convey, or assert a proposition other than the content of the sentence. When Smith utters ‘Every student has a pencil’ he asserts or means that every student in Smith’s first-grade class has a pencil (or some similar proposition), though this is not the content of the sentence in his context. Cappelen and Lepore (2005) similarly hold that ‘tall’ is context-insensitive. The content of ‘Mary is tall’, in every context, is simply the proposition that Mary is tall, with no relativization to a property (or scale or comparison class). However, a speaker who utters that sentence usually asserts or means a richer proposition, such as that Mary is tall for a philosopher. For discussions of related views, see Bach 1994, Carston 2002, Borg 2007, Recanati 2004, Gauker 2012, Braun 2012.

Other theorists resist pervasive context-sensitivity by appealing to shiftiness in extension without shiftiness in content. To obtain shiftiness in extension without shiftiness in content, these theorists relativize extensions of expressions to non-traditional parameters. Such views are often called relativist. For example, Egan, Hawthorne, and Weatherson (2005) and MacFarlane (2011) argue for relativist theories of epistemic uses of ‘might’. On their views, ‘Susan might be in Boston’, when used epistemically, has the same content in all contexts, but the truth-value of this content varies not only from one possible world to another, but also from one body of knowledge to another within a single possible world. Lasersohn (2005) similarly argues that predicates of personal taste, such as ‘tasty’ and ‘fun’, do not vary in content from context to context, but do vary in extension with respect to judges, or standards of taste, within a single world. See also Stephenson 2007, Richard 2008, Cappelen and Hawthorne 2009.

2.4 Proposed Tests for Indexicality

Given the disagreements about the context-sensitivity of various expressions, one might wonder whether there is a reliable test for context-sensitivity. In practice, many philosophers seem to employ the following tests.

Sentence S is context-sensitive iff it is possible for there to be two speakers who utter S (at the same time) and say different things.

Sentence S is context-sensitive iff it is possible for there to be a speaker who utters S and another speaker who utters the negation of S (at the same time), and yet the speakers do not contradict each other.

Sentences that contain paradigm indexicals pass these tests. But some opponents of pervasive context-sensitivity would reject them. For instance, Soames and Bach might admit that Smith and Jones say different things when they utter ‘Every student has a pencil’, but they would not attribute this variation to the alleged context-sensitivity of the sentence and its quantifier phrase. Rather, they would claim that Smith and Jones can use the sentence to say, or assert, propositions that are distinct from the sentence’s constant content.

Another test for context-sensitivity uses attitude ascriptions (Cappelen and Lepore 2005). Paradigmatic indexicals behave differently from non-indexicals in attitude ascriptions. Consider the following utterances.

  • (10) Smith: “Mary is a philosopher.”
    Jones: “Smith said that Mary is a philosopher.”
  • (11) Smith: “I am hungry.”
    Jones: “Smith said that I am hungry.”

Jones disquotes Smith in both of these cases: that is, Jones utters a says-that ascription whose embedded clause contains the very sentence that Smith utters. But Jones’s says-ascription in (10) is true (in Jones’s context), whereas Jones’s says-ascriptions in (10) is false (in Jones’s context). So, disquotation can fail when the subject of the ascription utters a context-sensitive sentence. Thus, Cappelen and Lepore propose roughly the following test for context-sensitivity.

S is context-sensitive iff: it is possible that [(i) A utters sentence S and yet (ii) “A said that S” is false in some context].

If this test is accepted, then it could be used to argue against the context-sensitivity of many simple expressions that do not appear on Kaplan’s list. Consider, for instance, the gradable adjective ‘rich’. At first glance the following seems impossible: Smith utters ‘George is rich’ and yet ‘Smith said that George is rich’ is false in some context. If so, then the above test entails that the sentence is not context-sensitive. The disquotation test, however, is controversial. For discussion of this test and others, see Cappelen and Lepore 2005, Cappelen and Hawthorne 2009, Leslie 2007, Viebahn and Vetter 2016.

3. Kaplan’s Theory of Indexicals

As mentioned above, Kaplan’s theory of indexicals is highly influential and serves as a starting point for much current theorizing about indexicals. This section presents some details of his theory.

3.1 An Example (Again) and Kaplan’s Distinctions

Let us consider again an example that can motivate Kaplan’s theory.

  • (12) Mary: “I am a philosopher.”
    John: “I am a philosopher.”

Mary and John utter the same unambiguous sentence, yet they say different things, for Mary says that she is a philosopher whereas John says that he is a philosopher. Moreover, we can imagine that Mary is a philosopher and John is not, so what Mary says is true whereas what John says is false. In view of these considerations, Kaplan (1989a) proposes a distinction between two kinds of meaning, character and content. The sentence ‘I am a philosopher’ has a single character, but has different contents with respect to different contexts. Kaplan usually identifies character with linguistic meaning, which is a kind of meaning fixed by linguistic convention.

3.2 Some Basics of Kaplan’s Theory

On Kaplan’s (1989a) theory, indexicals have contents in, or with respect to, contexts. Each context has associated with it at least an agent, time, location, and possible world. The content of ‘I’ with respect to a context c is the agent of c. The content of ‘here’ is the location of c. The content of ‘now’ is the time of c. The content of ‘actually’ is (roughly) the property of being the case (being true) with respect to the world of c.

Kaplan extends his theory of content to linguistic expressions in general, both simple and complex. On his view, the content of a predicate, with respect to a context, is a property or relation. The content of a sentence, with respect to a context, is a structured proposition, that is, a proposition with a constituent structure whose ultimate constituents are individual, properties, and relations. (See the entry on structured propositions.) The content of a sentence S with respect to a context c has, as its ultimate constituents, the contents of (roughly) the words in S with respect to c.

To illustrate, consider the sentence ‘I am a philosopher’. Suppose that the agent of context \(c_1\) is Mary. Then the content of ‘I’ in \(c_1\) is Mary herself, while the content of ‘is a philosopher’ in \(c_1\) is the property of being a philosopher. The content of the whole sentence, in \(c_1\), is a proposition whose constituents are just those two items. We can represent this proposition with the ordered pair \(\langle \text{Mary},\) \(\text{being a philosopher} \rangle\). A structured proposition which, like the preceding one, has an individual as a constituent, is a singular proposition. The content of ‘I’ with respect to another context \(c_2\), in which John is the agent, is John, and the content of ‘I am a philosopher’ in \(c_2\) is the singular proposition \(\langle \text{John},\) \(\text{being a philosopher} \rangle\).

(Before continuing, we need a few interpretive qualifications. The description of contents in the two previous paragraphs, and in the rest of this subsection, follows the informal parts of Kaplan’s work (1989a, 1989b), in which he often identifies contents with individuals, properties, relations, and structured propositions. See especially the preface to Demonstratives. But when Kaplan turns to more technical matters, he represents contents with intensions: see the end of this section below and also section 3.7. Kaplan even goes so far as to assert that singular propositions are not a part of his theory (1989a, p. 496). He might mean by this that they are not a part of his formal logic of demonstratives; or he may wish to emphasize that one could accept the core of his theory of indexicals, including his distinction between character and content, while rejecting structured contents. In any case, for the rest of this section, we will continue to describe a version of Kaplan’s theory that uses structured propositions.)

Propositions, on Kaplan’s theory, have truth-values with respect to circumstances of evaluation, which Kaplan identifies with pairs of times and possible worlds, \(\langle t, w \rangle\). A single proposition may be true with respect to one circumstance of evaluation and false with respect another. For example, the proposition \(\langle \text{Mary}, \text{being a philosopher} \rangle\) may be true at \(\langle t_1, w_1 \rangle\) and yet false at \(\langle t_1, w_2 \rangle\) because, in \(w_1\), Mary is a philosopher at time \(t_1\), whereas in world \(w_2\) she is not a philosopher at time \(t_1\). Similarly, if time \(t_0\) is a time before Mary became a philosopher in \(w_1\), and \(t_1\) is a time after which she became a philosopher in \(w_1\), then \(\langle \text{Mary},\) \(\text{being a philosopher} \rangle\) is false at \(\langle t_0, w_1 \rangle\) but true at \(\langle t_1, w_1 \rangle\). In the remainder of this section, we will usually, for the sake of simplicity, pretend that Kaplan’s circumstances of evaluation are just possible worlds, and ignore variation in truth-value over time.

On Kaplan’s theory, we can speak not only of the truth-values of propositions at worlds, but also of the truth-values of sentences at pairs of worlds and contexts. The reason we can do this is that a context determines the content of a sentence, and the content of that sentence determines a truth-value at a world. For example, the content of the sentence ‘I am a philosopher’ in the context \(c_1\) described above is the singular proposition that Mary is a philosopher. This proposition is true with respect to world \(w_1\). So, the sentence ‘I am a philosopher’ is true with respect to \(c_1\) and \(w_1\). By contrast, the content of the sentence ‘I am a philosopher’ at the context \(c_2\) (in which John is the agent) is the singular proposition that John is a philosopher, and this proposition is false at \(w_1\) (let’s suppose). So, the sentence ‘I am a philosopher’ is false with respect to \(c_2\) and \(w_1\). So, the truth-value of the sentence ‘I am a philosopher’ is doubly relativized to both context and world. This sort of double-relativization is often called double-indexing. (See Vlach 1973 and Kamp 1973 for early examples of semantic theories that use double-indexing.)

Each context c is associated with a world, called ‘the world of c’. When a sentence is true with respect to context c and the world of c, we say simply that the sentence is true at c, without mentioning a world. But the notion of a sentence’s being true at context c and world w is more fundamental than the notion of a sentence’s being (simply) true at c, for the latter notion is defined in terms of the previous notion. Now suppose that the two contexts mentioned above, \(c_1\) and \(c_2\), have the same associated world \(w_1\) (in which, recall, Mary is a philosopher but John is not). Then the sentence ‘I am a philosopher’ is true at context \(c_1\) and false at context \(c_2\).

The content of a sentence, at a context, can also be evaluated for truth at a world other than the world of the context. This is how the truth-values of sentences that contain modal operators, such as ‘possible’, are determined. For example, the content of ‘I am a philosopher’, with respect to \(c_1\), is the singular proposition that Mary is a philosopher. This proposition is true at \(w_1\), the world of context \(c_1\). But this proposition is false at world, \(w_2\), in which Mary goes into mathematics rather than philosophy. So, the sentence is true with respect to \(c_1\) and \(w_1\), but false with respect to \(c_1\) and \(w_2\). Therefore, the modal sentence ‘It is possible that I am not a philosopher’ is true with respect to our original context and its associated world, \(c_1\) and \(w_1\). Therefore, the modal sentence ‘It is possible that I am not a philosopher’ is simply true with respect to \(c_1\). (Notice that this last remark did not mention a world.)

We can similarly speak of the content of a singular term with respect to a context, and the extension or referent of that term, with respect to a context and a world. For example, the definite description ‘the person who invented bifocals’ has the same content with respect to all contexts. (Its content is some type of structured entity that has various properties and relations as constituents, such as the property of being a person, the relation of inventing, and so on.) This content determines different individuals at different worlds, because different people invent bifocals at different worlds. So, the referent of ‘the person who invented bifocals’, with respect to a context and a world, varies from world to world, because the person who invented bifocals varies from world to world. (We assume here, with Kaplan, that definite descriptions are singular terms rather than quantifier phrases.)

The situation is reversed for ‘I’. The content of ‘I’ varies from context to context: its content is Mary in \(c_1\), John in \(c_2\), someone else in \(c_3\), and so on. But given a single context c, the referent of ‘I’ with respect to c and world w is the same for any world w whatsoever. For example, if Mary is the content of ‘I’ with respect to \(c_1\), then Mary is the referent of ‘I’ with respect to \(c_1\) and any world whatsoever. That is why, for any world w, ‘I am a philosopher’ is true at \(c_1\) and w if and only if Mary is a philosopher in w.

When a singular term refers to object o with respect to context c and the world of c, we can simply say that it refers to o in c, without separately mentioning a world. So, ‘I’ refers to Mary in context \(c_1\) above. But once again, the notion of referring with respect to (or in) c is the less fundamental notion, and is defined in terms of the more fundamental relation of referring with respect to a context c and a world w.

The content of a linguistic expression, at a context, determines a corresponding intension, which is a function from possible worlds (circumstances of evaluation, really) to extensions. For example, the content of ‘I’ with respect to the context \(c_1\) described above is Mary, and the extension of ‘I’ with respect to \(c_1\) and any world w whatsoever is Mary. The corresponding intension of ‘I’ with respect to \(c_1\) is the function whose value at any world w is the extension of ‘Mary’ with respect to \(c_1\) and w, which is just Mary herself. The intension of ‘I’ varies from context to context, just as the content does; for instance, in context \(c_2\), the intension of ‘I’ is the function on worlds whose value at any world is John.

Two expressions may have different contents in c and yet have the same intension in that context. For instance, the contents of the sentences ‘I am a philosopher’ and ‘I am a philosopher and either I smoke or I do not smoke’ with respect to \(c_1\) are distinct structured propositions, for the content of the second sentence in \(c_1\) has the property of smoking as a constituent, whereas the content of the first one does not. Yet these propositions have the same truth-values at all worlds, and so they have the same intension in \(c_1\). Though contents and intensions are distinct, we can use intensions to represent contents, when we are willing to ignore fine-grained differences in content. This is what Kaplan does when he sets out his logic for indexicals (see section 3.7).

3.3 True Demonstratives in Kaplan’s Theory

Kaplan contemplates two ways of extending his theory to true demonstratives. In his 1989a, he uses dthat-terms to do so. A dthat-term is a term of the form “dthat[t]”, where t is a singular term, such as a definite description or proper name. The content of ‘dthat[t]’ in a context c is the object to which the term t refers in c. For example, the content of ‘dthat[the dog I see now]’, in a context c, is Fido iff: there is exactly one dog in the world of c whom the agent of c sees at the time of c in the world of c, and that dog is Fido. Kaplan (1989a) uses dthat-terms to represent the demonstrative ‘that’ together with a type of demonstration. Kaplan holds that a type of demonstration presents a demonstratum in a particular way, and a definite description (that may contain indexicals) can capture the way in which the demonstration presents the demonstratum. Thus, Kaplan (1989a) might use the dthat-term ‘dthat[the dog I see to my left]’ to represent Mary’s use of the word ‘that’ together with the type of demonstration that she uses to present a dog to her left. If Mary utters ‘That is larger than that’ while pointing first to a dog to her left and then to a dog to her right, then Kaplan might use the formal sentence (13) to represent Mary’s sentence-plus-demonstrations.

  • (13) Dthat[the dog I see to my left] is larger than dthat[the dog I see to my right].

If c is a context in which the agent of c sees Fido to her left and Rover to her right, then the content in c of the first dthat-term is Fido and the content of the second dthat-term in c is Rover. Kaplan anticipates treating other true demonstratives, such as ‘you’, in similar ways. (For critical discussion, see Salmon 2002.)

Kaplan presents a different treatment of true demonstratives in his 1989b. Kaplan adds to each context an addressee and a demonstratum, and stipulates that the content of ‘you’ in any context c is the addressee of c and the content of ‘that’ in any context c is the demonstratum of c. Contexts may have sequences of multiple addressees and sequences of multiple demonstrata. Corresponding subscripts can be added to ‘you’ and ‘that’. If so, the content of ‘you1’ with respect to c is the first addressee of c, the content of ‘you2’ in c is the second addressee of c, and so on; similarly, the content of ‘that1’ is the first demonstratum of c, the content of ‘that2’ is the second demonstratum, and so on.

3.4 Character

Kaplan (1989a, p. 505) says that he represents the character of an expression with a function on contexts whose value at any context is the expression’s content at that context. At times, Kaplan writes as if characters are functions, especially in more formal sections, but that is unlikely to be the fundamental notion: which function they would be would vary depending on the structure of the models, whereas he holds that ‘I’ has only one character. For example, the content of ‘I’ at any context c is the agent character of c. So the character of ‘I’ is represented by a function on contexts whose value at any context c is the agent of c. The value of the character of ‘I’ at a context in which Mary is the agent is just Mary herself, and its value at a context in which John is the agent is just John himself. The character of a sentence is represented by a function whose value at any context is the structured propositional content of that sentence at that context. For instance, the character of ‘I am a philosopher’ is represented by a function whose value at any context c in which A is the agent of c is the proposition \(\langle A, \text{being a philosopher} \rangle\). If Mary is the agent of c, then the value of this function at c is \(\langle \text{Mary}, \text{being a philosopher} \rangle\).

3.5 Direct Reference and Rigid Designation

Kaplan (1989a) claims that indexicals are devices of direct reference. By this he means that the content of an indexical, with respect to a context c, is the object to which it refers in c; its content is not a property or descriptive condition that determines the referent. For example, the content of ‘I’ in c is the agent of c; its content in c is not the property or descriptive condition of being the agent of c, or being the speaker of c, or being the person uttering ‘I’, or any other sort of property or descriptive condition.

Kaplan (1989a) also says that indexicals are rigid designators. The notion of a rigid designator comes from Kripke (1980), who (roughly speaking) defines a rigid designator to be an expression that designates the same thing with respect to all possible worlds in which that thing exists. When Kaplan claims that indexicals are rigid designators, he means that if object o is the referent of expression E with respect to context c and the world of c, then o is also the referent of E with respect to c and any other world. For example, if Mary is the referent of ‘I’ with respect to c and the world of c, then Mary is also the referent of ‘I’ with respect to c and any other world.

3.6 Utterances and Expressions in Kaplan’s Theory

Linguistic expressions should be distinguished from utterances. Linguistic expressions are abstract objects. Utterances are events in which an agent utters a linguistic expression. The word ‘the’ is a single linguistic expression, but two utterances of it occur in every utterance of the sentence ‘The philosopher saw the linguist’.

Kaplan’s theory does not ascribe characters or contents to utterances. Rather, it ascribes characters to linguistic expressions, and contents to expressions with respect to contexts. In fact, Kaplan’s theory ascribes contents to expressions with respect to contexts in which no one utters those expressions. For example, on Kaplan’s theory, the sentence ‘I exist’ has a content with respect to every context, and is true in every context, including contexts in which the agent does not utter that sentence, and including contexts in which no one in the world of the context speaks English. The sentence ‘I utter nothing’ is true in some contexts, on Kaplan’s theory, for there are contexts c in which the agent A of c utters nothing in the world of c, and the content of the sentence in c is the proposition that A utters nothing, which is true in the world of c. This is why Kaplan speaks of the agent of a context rather than the speaker of a context.

Nevertheless, Kaplan’s theory still has implications for utterances and speech acts. Suppose that Mary utters the sentence ‘I am a philosopher’ in world w. Mary’s utterance has an agent in w, namely Mary, and it occurs at a certain location and time in w. So, her utterance in w determines a Kaplanian context. Call this context ‘Mary’s context’. On Kaplan’s theory, the sentence Mary utters has a content in Mary’s context, namely the singular proposition that Mary is a philosopher. If Mary utters the sentence assertively, then she (probably) asserts the content of that sentence in her context. So, Kaplan’s theory, together with other plausible assumptions, has important implications for what Mary asserts in her utterance.

A related question is whether indexicals are token-reflexive, i.e. whether their meaning involves a rule that gives a semantic value for each token. For example, one might think that each token of ‘I’ refers to the speaker of that token, which sounds like a more precise way to say that ‘I’ refers to the speaker of the context. One way to develop this is to claim that token reflexive rules just are synonymous with indexicals, so saying ‘‘I am right-handed’’ would be synoymous with saying ‘‘The speaker of this token is right-handed’’. Kaplan argued against such a proposal from Reichenbach (1947), on the basis of the claim that indexicals are both rigid and directly referential, whereas descriptions like ‘‘The speaker of this token’’ are neither. Another possible view is that indexicals have token-reflexive characters, though they are not synonymous with their characters. This also raises the question of the possibility of a token-reflexive logic. For further discussion, see Reichenbach 1947, Garcia-Carpintero 1998, Kaplan 1999, Perry 2000, Georgi 2015, Radulescu 2018, Ciecierski 2020, Ciecierski and Rudnicki 2023.

3.7 Kaplan’s Logic for Indexicals: A Few Formal Details

Kaplan (1989a) presents an elaborate logic of indexicals. We shall concentrate here on aspects of this logic that can be understood without going deeply into formal details.

The language of Kaplan’s logic is that of modal first-order predicate logic with tense operators and other additions. The additions include a distinguished predicate ‘Exists’, a distinguished binary predicate ‘Located’, a distinguished constant ‘I’, a distinguished constant ‘Here’, and a function-term ‘dthat’.

In standard first-order predicate logic, validity is defined as truth in all structures (sometimes called ‘models’) of a certain sort. In modal logic, validity is typically defined as truth at every world in every structure of a certain (different) sort. Kaplan similarly defines validity as truth at every context in every LD structure. (‘LD’ stands for ‘the Logic of Demonstratives’.) Each LD structure contains a set of contexts, a set of worlds, a set of individuals, a set of positions (common to all worlds), a set of times (common to all worlds), and a function that assigns to each predicate and individual constant an intension, which is a function from time-world pairs to extensions. (Thus Kaplan’s LD structures do not assign structured contents to expressions in contexts. LD structures use intensions to represent contents.) Each context has an associated agent, time, position, and world. Various stipulations about structures and contexts together ensure that, for every context c in every structure M: (i) the agent of c is a member of the extension of ‘Exist’ at the time and world of c, and (ii) the ordered pair \(\langle \text{the agent of } c, \text{the position of } c \rangle\) is a member of the extension of ‘Located’ at the time and world of c.

Kaplan uses standard methods to define truth for a formula, and denotation for a term, with respect to any given structure, context, time, world and assignment of values to variables. (Assignments will not be mentioned from here on.) Kaplan defines the notions of Content and Character for formulas and terms in terms of truth and denotation. The Content of a formula, with respect to a structure and context, is a function whose value at any time-world pair is the truth-value of the formula with respect to the preceding structure, context, time, and world. In short, the Content of an expression, with respect to a structure and context, is an intension. The Content of a singular term, with respect to a structure and context, is also an appropriate intension. Finally, the Character of a formula or term is the function from structures and contexts to Contents whose value, for any structure and context, is the Content of that expression with respect to that structure and context.

A formula is true at a context c in a structure M iff: the formula is true with respect to c and the time and world of c in M. A formula is valid iff: for every structure M, and every context c of M, the formula is true at c in M. Kaplan says that the notion of logical consequence can be defined in any of the usual ways.

3.8 More on Kaplan’s Logic for Indexicals: Contingent Validities, A Priority, and Valid Arguments

Sentences that are valid in standard (modal) first-order predicate logic are also valid in Kaplan’s logic of indexicals. But there are also valid sentences peculiar to Kaplan’s logic of indexicals. For instance, the formal analogs of ‘I exist’ and ‘I am here now’ are true in every context in every structure, and so are valid. This result is due to Kaplan’s stipulations that the agent of a context c exists at the time and world of c, and that the agent of c is located at the position of c at the time and world of c. In addition, every (formal) sentence of the form “S if and only if actually S” is valid. This is so because S is true at a context (in a structure) if and only if “Actually S” is.

A striking feature of Kaplan’s logic is that some valid sentences are contingently true, at some contexts in some LD structures. One example is ‘I exist’. We saw above that it is valid. Now consider an LD structure M in which Mary exists at some of the worlds in M but fails to exist at others. (More exactly, Mary is in the extension of ‘Exist’ at some pairs \(\langle t, w \rangle\) but is not in the extension of ‘Exist’ at some other pairs \(\langle t, w' \rangle\).) Next, consider a context c in which Mary is the agent. The formal analog of the sentence ‘I exist’ is true with respect to c and the time and world of c in M, and so is true at c in M. But that sentence is false with respect to c, t, and other worlds in M. Therefore, ‘Necessarily, I exist’ (or its formal analog) is false at c in M. Thus, ‘I exist’ is only contingently true at some contexts in some LD structures. Parallel points holds for ‘I am here now’: it is valid, but only contingently true at some contexts in some structures. Similarly, every sentence of the form “S if and only if actually S” is valid, but some sentences of this form are only contingently true at some contexts in some structures.

Kaplan holds that since ‘I exist’ is valid, one could know a priori the proposition that it expresses, in a context. For example, if Mary considers and understands the sentence ‘I exist’, then she can know a priori the proposition that it expresses in her context. Thus Kaplan concludes that she can know a priori the proposition that she exists. But this proposition is contingent, so Mary can have a priori knowledge of a contingent proposition. Thus Kaplan claims that his logic of indexicals provides examples of contingent a priori truths. (For discussion, see Salmon 1991, Forbes 1989)

One way to state the reason for these results is to claim that all contexts must be proper; Kaplan’s argument for this restriction is that “[improper] contexts could exist and thus there is no interest in evaluating the extensions of expressions with respect to them” (Kaplan 1989a: 509). This raises important questions about the relation between bits of possible worlds (what could exist) and what semantics is interested in. If we follow Kaplan and we introduce limits on contexts based on metaphysics, then we need a principled reason about which limits we should introduce. For example, Kaplan argued that the metaphysics of utterances is too restrictive, because a sentence may change its truth value by the time it is metaphysically possible to finish uttering it, which would make Repetition (P therefore P) invalid. Another argument is that if we required utterances for truth values, “I am in a coma right now” would turn out to be a logical falsehood, since prima facie it seems like it cannot be uttered (for both, see Kaplan 1989b: 584, though see \(\S\)4.4 below for ways to resist this). If this is correct, we need a principle to decide why some metaphysics may be inserted into the foundations of semantics, and some cannot.

3.9 Some Criticisms of Kaplan’s Theory

Kaplan’s theory of indexicals is influential, and so has been subject to much critical scrutiny. A few criticisms will be described immediately below. Others criticisms will emerge later in this article.

Kaplan sometimes argues for his theory by appealing to intuitions about what is said. For instance, Kaplan claims that if John utters ‘I am hungry’ and Mary utters ‘I am hungry’ then what they say is different, whereas if John utters ‘I am hungry’ and Mary utters ‘You are hungry’ while addressing John, then what they say is the same. David Lewis (1980) says that Kaplan’s appeals to judgments about what is said are unpersuasive. Lewis also maintains that Kaplan fails to justify his claim that Kaplanian contents have a distinctive role to play in semantics. Lewis (1980) claims that the primary task of semantics is to describe how semantic values of sentences determine truth-values at contexts and circumstances of evaluation, the latter of which Lewis calls ‘indices’. Lewis holds that this can be done in (at least) two equally good ways. First, we can (like Kaplan) allow the semantic value of a sentence to vary from context to context, and design these varying semantic values so that they determine truth-values with respect to indices. Second, we can instead once-and-for-all assign to a sentence a single semantic value that determines a truth-value given both a context and an index. On views of this latter sort, semantic values are functions from pairs of contexts and indices to truth-values. Lewis claims that there is no theoretical reason to prefer one sort of theory over the other.

Kaplan’s semantics entails that that propositions can vary in truth-value from one time to another. He also assumes that propositions are the things that agents assert and believe. But he admits (1989a, 503, n. 28) that the objects of assertion and belief are traditionally thought to be eternal, that is, not to vary in truth-value from time to time. Salmon (1989) argues that Kaplan’s theory needs to be amended so as to make contents eternal. Salmon argues that once this amendment is made, it becomes evident that to deal adequately with tense, a semantic theory needs both (a) content-like meanings that vary in extension from time to time in the way that Kaplan’s contents do and (b) content-like meanings that are eternal. Jeffrey King (2003) also criticizes Kaplan for allowing contents (propositions) to be non-eternal. See Cappelen and Hawthorne (2009) for related discussion.

Bach (2005) says that the only indexicals that have contents with respect to contexts are the pure indexicals, such as ‘I’ and ‘today’. True demonstratives, such as ‘she’ and ‘that’, have no content in any context, and so the contents (in contexts) of sentences that contain them are propositional radicals (incomplete structured propositions). However, a speaker who utters such a sentence typically asserts a full proposition that completes the propositional radical that the sentence semantically expresses. Bach’s main argument is based on the claim that when they use demonstratives, speakers have communicative intentions, but not semantic intentions, i.e. that speakers intend to communicate something about a particular object, but not to refer to it. Viebahn (2020) responds that speakers may have semantic intentions as parts of their overall communicative intentions, and claims that this solution is not ad hoc, since the same phenomenon happens when a speaker uses an ambiguous term, with their intention fixing which meaning is operative in that context.

Braun (1995) argues that the functions that Kaplan uses to represent characters in his formal logic (functions from structures and contexts to contents) misrepresent the more interesting notion of character described in the less formal parts of Kaplan’s theory (where Kaplan seemingly uses functions from contexts to contents in the intended structure to represent characters). Richard (2003) and Braun (1994) argue that structured characters, in addition to structured contents, are needed to distinguish between the linguistic meanings of certain pairs of expressions.

For further criticisms of Kaplan’s theory (other than those that will emerge below), and for presentations of alternative theories, see Burge 1974, Weinstein 1974, Roberts 2002, and Elbourne 2008.

4. Other Topics Concerning Indexicals

4.1 Quasi-Indicators and Attitude Ascriptions that Seemingly Attribute First-Person Indexical Attitudes

Castañeda (1966, 1967) argues that ‘he himself’ and ‘she herself’ can be used to ascribe first-person indexical beliefs and cannot be used to ascribe beliefs that are not first-person indexical. Consider again the messy shopper, and let \(t_0\) be the time at which John first utters ‘He is making a mess’. Castañeda would hold that ascription (19) is true but ascription (20) is false.

  • (18) John [at \(t_0\)]: “He is making a mess.”
  • (19) John believed at \(t_0\) that he was making a mess.
  • (20) John believed at \(t_0\) that he himself was making a mess.

Castañeda uses the term quasi-indicator for expressions such as ‘he himself’ and ‘she herself’ that he claims can be used to ascribe (only) indexical beliefs that the subject would express with a first-person pronoun such as ‘I’. Castañeda uses ‘he*’ and ‘she*’ as abbreviations for ‘he himself’ and ‘she herself’.

Perry (2000, Chapter 5) argues that belief attributions containing ‘he himself’ in their ‘that’-clauses do not semantically require that the subject have a first-person belief. Instead, utterances of such belief attributions merely suggest that the subject has a first-person belief. Schlenker (2003), however, claims that some languages other than English contain lexical items that are quasi-indicators in Castañeda’s sense. See also Rabern and Ball 2019.

There are other attitude ascriptions that do not contain ‘he himself’ or ‘she herself’, but which also seem to require, or at least strongly suggest, that their subjects have first-person attitudes. Suppose that John is in a pizza parlor, and observes a customer in a mirror who appears to be too thin to be healthy. John points at him in the mirror and sincerely utters ‘I want him to eat a large slice of pizza’. John, however, is not feeling hungry, and so he says ‘I do not want to eat a large slice of pizza’. In fact, however, the person that John sees in the mirror is himself. Attribution (21) seems to be true in this situation, whereas attribution (22) seems to be false.

  • (21) John wants him to eat a large slice of pizza [pointing at John in the mirror].
  • (22) John wants to eat a slice of pizza.

Some theorists would claim that (22) is true only if John has a first-person desire, that is, a desire that he would naturally express with ‘I want to eat a large slice of pizza’. Some of these theorists would attribute the seemingly mandatory first-person reading of (22) to the presence of a silent, pronoun-like expression that serves as a subject for the embedded infinitival phrase ‘to eat a slice of pizza’. This sort of pronominal expression is often called ‘PRO’. For discussion, see Dowty 1985, Chierchia 1989, and Cappelen and Dever 2013.

4.2 Complex Demonstratives

Complex demonstratives are expressions of the form that N or this N, where N is a common noun phrase. Examples include ‘this man’, ‘that red car’, and ‘that woman who is wearing a blue coat’. One major question about complex demonstratives is whether they are singular terms or quantifier phrases. Singular terms are expressions that refer, with respect to contexts, to individuals. Most semantic theories of the simple demonstratives ‘this’ and ‘that’ treat them as singular terms. Speakers seem to use complex demonstratives to refer to individuals in much the way that they use simple demonstratives. That is some reason to think that complex demonstratives are singular terms. However, complex demonstratives syntactically resemble paradigmatic quantifier phrases, such as ‘some woman’ and ‘every man’. That is some reason to think that complex demonstratives are quantifier phrases. But quantifier phrases are not singular terms; they do not refer, with respect to contexts, to individuals. Their references, or extensions, with respect to contexts, are usually taken to be sets of sets.

Singular-term theories of complex demonstratives must deal with two major issues. First, do the common noun phrases that appear in complex demonstratives play a role in determining their referents in contexts? Second, do the contents of those common noun phrases contribute to the contents of complex demonstratives, in contexts? (Does, for instance, the content of ‘philosopher’ appear as a constituent of the content of ‘that philosopher’, in a context?) Minimal theories assign minimal, or no, semantic role to common noun phrases in complex demonstratives. The common noun phrase merely gives an auditor a clue as to the speaker’s intended referent. Since the predicate ‘philosopher’ plays no role in determining the referent of ‘that philosopher’ in a context, its referent, in a context, need not be a philosopher. Furthermore, the content of ‘philosopher’ is not a constituent of the content of ‘that philosopher’ in a context; its content simply is its referent in that context. Larson and Segal (1995) endorse a minimal theory (but they do not accept the existence of Kaplan-style contents). Intermediate theories say that the common noun phrase helps determine the referent. So, an individual must be a philosopher to be the referent of ‘that philosopher’ in a context. But the common noun phrase does not contribute its content to the complex demonstrative’s content. Instead, the content of the complex demonstrative is simply its referent. Kaplan (1989a) hints that he accepts an intermediate theory. Braun (1994, 2008), Borg (2000), and Salmon (2002) explicitly argue for intermediate theories. Maximal theories say that the common noun phrase helps determine the referent, and its content appears as a constituent of the content, in a context. Richard (1993) endorses a maximal theory.

The arguments for and against these views are complicated. To take one example: intermediate theorists might claim that (23) is false in some contexts, and argue that this is incompatible with maximal theories.

  • (23) It is a necessary truth that if that philosopher exists, then something is a philosopher.

But maximal theorists, if they agree with this judgment about (22), can add rigidifying devices, such as ‘actually’, to obtain this result.

Taylor (1981), King (2001), and Neale (2004) endorse quantificational theories of complex demonstratives. For example, on King’s view, the content of (24), in some contexts in which the agent perceives Mary and believes Mary to be a philosopher, is necessarily equivalent to the content of (25) in that same context (assuming that definite descriptions are quantifier phrases, not singular terms).

  • (24) That philosopher was born in Boise.
  • (25) The individual that is actually a philosopher and is identical with Mary was born in Boise.

The arguments for and against singular-term theories and quantifier phrase theories are (again) complicated. For example, King argues that intermediate singular-term theories of complex demonstratives have difficulties dealing with cases of quantifying into complex demonstratives, as in examples like (26) below.

  • (26) Every university professor cherishes that first publication of hers.

Borg (2000), Lepore and Johnson (2002), Salmon (2002), and Braun (2008) respond to King’s argument, and criticize his view. King defends his argument, and his view, in King 2008a and 2008b. See Lepore and Ludwig 2000, Dever 2001, Roberts 2002, and Elbourne 2008 for views of complex demonstratives that do not fit easily into the above classification scheme.

One reaction to (26) is to claim that complex demonstratives are just definite descriptions, perhaps with some special features to account for the difference between seemingly singular and seemingly quantificational uses. This claim has the problem that there are sentences where the complex demonstrative cannot be exchanged for a definite description (27–28), where other very similar sentences do allow it (29–30) (see Wolter 2006, 2006, 2009; Nowak 2021):

  • (27) The author of Waverley also wrote Ivanhoe.
  • (28) #That author of Waverley also wrote Ivanhoe.
  • (29) The guy who wrote Waverley also wrote Ivanhoe.
  • (30) That guy who wrote Waverley also wrote Ivanhoe.

Nowak argues that these pairs of sentences also pose problems for hidden-argument views like King’s, because those views cannot explain why (30) is acceptable, but (28) is not.

4.3 Multiple Occurrences of Demonstratives

Multiple occurrences of demonstratives present difficulties for some theories. Sentence (31) below contains multiple occurrences of the demonstrative ‘that’.

  • (31) That is not identical with that.

In the right circumstances, a speaker could use (31) to assert a true proposition. This strongly suggests that (31) is true in some contexts. But ‘that’ is unambiguous, and so has a single linguistic meaning. If linguistic meaning determines reference in a context (in the way that Kaplan’s characters do), then all occurrences of ‘that’ in (31) have the same reference with respect to any given context. So, (31) should be false in all contexts.

Kaplan’s theories of true demonstratives allow sentences that resemble (31) to be false in some contexts, but at the cost of attributing a type of ambiguity to ‘that’. For example, on his later indexical theory of demonstratives, some formal analogs of (31), such as (32), are true in contexts in which the first demonstratum of the context is distinct from the second.

  • (32) That1 is not identical with that2.

But on this theory each subscripted ‘that’ has a different character. So this theory does not identify a reasonable candidate for the single linguistic meaning of the unsubscripted English word ‘that’. This may be why Kaplan (1989b) speaks of the “exotic ambiguity” of demonstratives.

There are various options for responding to the problem of finding a single meaning for ‘that’. One could stipulate that each context has only one demonstratum, and say that the content of ‘that’ in a context is the demonstratum of the context, but then insist that the content of a sentence containing multiple occurrences of demonstratives is determined not by a single context but by a sequence of contexts. Then (31) is true with respect to certain sequences of contexts that have different demonstrata. Second, one could distinguish linguistic meaning and character. ‘That’ has a single linguistic meaning, but this meaning does not determine reference in a context; linguistic meaning instead determines the characters of occurrences, and these characters determine reference in a context. Third, one could move to a theory that assigns contents to utterances rather than expressions. This might help because every utterance of (26) contains two utterances of ‘that’. There are other possibilities. For discussion, see Kaplan 1989a, 1999; Wettstein 1986; Taschek 1987; Braun 1996; Garcia-Carpintero 1998; Salmon 2002; Richard 2003; Georgi 2015, 2020.

A similar issue can arise for indexicals, in at least two ways. First, a sentence like ‘‘It is hotter here than here’’ could be true, if the speaker is moving mid-sentence; or ‘‘My birthday is not today, but it is today’’ could be true if the word ‘but’ is said exactly at midnight. Second, one may want to count arguments such as ‘‘I am right-handed. Therefore you are right-handed’’ as valid, when the premise is spoken by the addressee of the conclusion. A problem here is that if we allow such context shifts, no argument seems to remain valid, in the sense that even the rule of repetition may seem to have counterexamples (‘‘I am F. Therefore I am F’’, but spoken by different speakers). This would be a form of logical nihilism. For discussion, see Zardini 2014, Radulescu 2015, Cotnoir 2018, Russell 2018, Dicher 2021, Georgi 2025.

4.4 Answering Machine Cases

Kaplan maintains that ‘I am here now’ is logically valid, and yet he admits that the sentence ‘I am not here now’ is commonly used for answering-machine messages, where it seems able to express a true sentence if the owner of the machine is not available (1989a, 491, n. 12). This observation has led to a discussion of what is commonly called “the answering-machine puzzle”. ‘Paradox’ is also used, though it is only paradoxical from within Kaplan’s theory.

Kaplan himself only addresses it in a footnote, and seems to think that it does not merit much attention. One way to understand this reaction would be to think of answering machine responses as false at best, or even as mock-assertions, as if the goal is merely to be humorous. There are good reasons to take it more seriously, though: as prefigured in Kaplan’s original footnote, the crucial feature of the original puzzle is that words are not only used in face to face conversations, but also at some temporal or spacial distance, especially with the help of some recording technology. It would be odd to restrict semantics to instantaneous communication, and leave all else to pragmatics, without some special argument. Once we become interested in uses of indexicals in notes, letters, emails, etc., a need arises to give a meta-semantics of indexicals that accounts for these uses too.

The scope of the answering machine puzzle turns out to be quite wide, and it allows us to focus on some systematic variation among uses of indexicals. Egan 2009 pointed out quite a few different uses of indexicals that involve inscriptions: for example, ‘now’ picks out the moment of inscription in a postcard saying ‘‘it’s raining here in Venice right now, but it won’t be for long’’, but it picks out the moment of reading when a will is read out, if it contains the text ‘‘if my lawyer is reading this, I am now dead’’. Or consider ‘you’: in billboards saying ‘‘Jesus loves you!’’, ‘you’ seems to pick out whoever reads the message (though see Zakkou 2017 for a contrary view). But consider this adaptation of a case from Bianchi 2014: when Homer leaves a note for his butler saying ‘‘I am leaving you in charge of my affairs’’, and his wife reads it, it seems plausible that ‘you’ refers to the butler, not to whoever reads the note.

The simplest way to deal with answering machine cases is to allow improper contexts, where the speaker is not at the place or time of inscribing (see Predelli 1998a, 1998b). Others have proposed changes to Kaplan’s system, in order to allow true instances of ‘I am not here’, while also maintaining some restrictions on contexts. Michaelson (2014) proposed the following solution: indexicals have characters that shift with the medium of communication (‘now’ refers to the time of speaking in a live conversation, but to the time of reading when written). Some shiftiness is clearly required if semantics is to get a grip on these uses. But the medium of communication is too course-grained to do the job: the postcard and the will above point to different referents, though they are both written. One way to generalize Michaelson’s view is to group it with other multiple-rules views, which claim that each indexical comes with a number of rules that speakers need to learn separately, and which possibly change as the means of communication evolve (see also Corazza et al. 2002). One worry for all such views, as presented in O’Madagain (2014), is that intuitively ‘now’ has only one meaning, and increasing the number of rules makes learning this linguistic item overly difficult.

Another family of views claims that the case can only be explained if we talk about deferred utterances (Sidelle 1991, Briciu 2018). The idea here is to ground the semantics of indexicals in utterances, not sentences relative to a context, and then to claim that recording language allows us to perform utterances at a different time or place than when the inscription took place. In the will example, the idea would be that the will author wrote the will, but did not assert anything at that time; instead, the assertion took place when the will was read out. Deferred utterance theories raise important questions about the metaphysics of utterances, whose import for the semantic of indexicals depends on the relation between utterances and semantics (see Romdenh-Romluc 2002, Cohen 2013).

Deferred utterance views face some challenges. The simplest one is that they need to respond to Kaplan’s original arguments against utterance-based theories. Another issue is that it is not in general obvious when and where non-instantaneous actions take place. Radulescu (2025) points out that the question is similar to a classical one about the time and place of a killing (see Davidson (1969 / 2001) and Thomson (1971)): if Jim shoots Tom in a duel in the woods, and Tom dies later at the hospital because of the wound, it is obvious that Jim killed Tom. But it is not obvious when and where Jim killed Tom. The same type of issue can be raised for recorded messages: when and where did the will writer make his assertion? Instead of working out a metaphysics of actions of this type, Radulescu proposes the idea of a detonation condition: the speaker produces (or arranges for the production of) a token of an indexical, and then sets a detonation condition: either at the time of the token creation, or upon reading, or upon reading by a particular person, etc. When or where the token detonates, it picks out the relevant feature of the world.

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Alexandru Radulescu <RadulescuA@missouri.edu>

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