Ideology

The uses of the word “ideology” are so divergent as to make it doubtful that there is any conceptual unity to the term. It may refer to a comprehensive worldview, a legitimating discourse, a partisan political doctrine, culture, false beliefs that help support illegitimate power, beliefs that reinforce group identity, or mystification. It is often used pejoratively, but just as often it is a purely descriptive term. When authors criticize ideology, they may be criticizing complicity with injustice, confirmation bias, illusions, self-serving justifications, or dogmatism. When authors identify ideology, they may locate it in forms of consciousness, propositional attitudes, culture, institutions, discourses, social conventions, or material rituals. As a consequence of this multidimensional heterogeneity, debates about ideology shift and move without apparently advancing.

Nonetheless, nearly all current uses pertain to partiality (preference or bias), partisanship (adherence to a faction or cause), or both. Scholarship and debate is driven by divergent intuitions (often unacknowledged or misidentified) over such issues as: whether to emphasize partiality (which is generally unintentional or unconscious, and emerges spontaneously from a person’s local situatedness) or partisanship (which is political or value-laden, and can be a conscious construction); the extent of the phenomenon or of its salience; whether it is primarily cognitive or noncognitive; how to characterize the impartial or nonpartisan condition to which ideology is frequently contrasted; whether and to what extent ideology is avoidable; whether and to what extent ideology is problematic or pathological; and, of course, whether, to what extent, and by what mechanisms ideology is causally responsible for the maintenance of unjust or oppressive social conditions.

The present entry distinguishes the major traditions or schools of thinking about ideology and identifies the underlying epistemological, moral, and political disagreements that motivate divergences in how “ideology” is used. It clarifies the criteria according to which authors impute one or another meaning to “ideology” and maps the field of possible theories of ideology. Finally, it indicates the major issues confronting critical theories of ideology.

• 1. Traditions of Ideology Theory
  • 1.1 Liberal Conceptions of Ideology
  • 1.2 Conservative Conceptions of Ideology
  • 1.3 Marxist Conceptions of Ideology
    • 1.3.1 Ideology in Marx and Engels
    • 1.3.2 Ideology in the Marxist Tradition
• 2. Mapping Ideology
  • 2.1 The Valence of Ideology
  • 2.2 The Location of Ideology
  • 2.3 The Scope of Ideology
• 3. Varieties of Ideology Critique
  • 3.1 Rationally Faulty Ideology
    • 3.1.1 Are the Dominated Especially Prone to Rationally Faulty Ideology?
      • 3.1.1.1 Sociological Mechanisms
      • 3.1.1.2 Psychological Mechanisms
      • 3.1.1.3 Conclusions
    • 3.1.2 Are the Dominant Especially Prone to Rationally Faulty Ideology?
  • 3.2 Morally Faulty Ideology
  • 3.3 Epistemically Faulty Ideology
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Traditions of Ideology Theory

Although ideology has come to be inextricably tied to Marxism and critical theory, liberal and conservative traditions of thinking about ideology predate Marxist theorizations and set the terms on which the term was integrated into Marxist theory.

The term is attested as far back as the seventeenth century, but its coinage is usually attributed to Antoine Louis Claude Destutt, compte de Tracy (1754–1836), one of the scholars affiliated with the Institut de France. Destutt de Tracy used the term to name a science of ideas. Like many other “-ology” terms—biology, pathology, mythology, and methodology are prominent examples—the term’s meaning in common speech has migrated such that it generally names the object of the study of ideas, rather than the study itself. In the case of ideology, this migration was prepared by the reflexive and pedagogical nature of Destutt de Tracy’s science, which had to both account for itself as a set of ideas and enact a process of intervening in the world of ideas so as to reform the ideas of its audience.

This established “ideology” as a term akin to “Enlightenment”, and traditions of theorizing ideology can be distinguished according to the broad schools of response to the political, economic, and pedagogical projects of the Enlightenment. Liberal theorists of ideology have focused on the dangers of passionate or unacknowledged partiality and partisanship on the moral, political, and scientific projects by which Enlightenment might be advanced. Conservative and counter-Enlightenment thinkers, by contrast, have focused on the moral and political risks of rationalism and idealism, and have adopted “ideology” as a pejorative name for purposeful efforts to reform traditions, beliefs, and practices.

Marxism, which has produced the most extensive and varied tradition of ideology theory, has alternated between a debunking approach to Enlightenment projects and a militant embrace of radical versions of them. In the debunking mode, Marxists try to show that Enlightenment projects, and the ideologies in which they are expressed, are merely attractive excuses for or mystifications of social domination and violence. In the radicalizing mode, Marxists argue, instead, that the aims of Enlightenment cannot be achieved by Enlightenment methods, and that projects of economic and political transformation must take precedence over “ideological” projects of changing people’s minds.

Understanding these traditions of thinking about ideology is required to make sense of the contemporary field of study, in which elements of this history are constantly, if inconsistently, mobilized.

1.1 Liberal Conceptions of Ideology

“Ideology” originated as part of the liberal project of social reform via education. Destutt de Tracy’s works on the moral and political sciences, written as part of his activities at the Institut, were published as Elements of Ideology (1801–15). In the Elements, Destutt de Tracy derived from empiricist epistemological premises a canon of probabilistic reasoning, a sentimentalist moral theory, and a liberal political economy. The work summarized programmatically the hopes for a secular and rationalist educational system that Destutt de Tracy—together with Pierre Jean Georges Cabanis (1757–1808) and other allies in the French Senate—tried to realize under the Directory and then the Consulate.

The aim of ideology was “to place the moral and political sciences on their true basis, a knowledge of our intellectual faculties” (Destutt de Tracy 1817 [2011: 10]). Given that every perception is, “taken each separately, and in itself”, true, Destutt de Tracy traced all error to the will, which “denaturalizes” our original perceptions (1817 [2011: 34, 36]). The will or desire, our faculty of preference, leads us into error by inducing us to see what we want to see and to discount what is inconvenient to recognize.

For this reason, ideology can help us by teaching us how “to analyze our sentiments” and to distinguish between those that “direct us well” and those that

form within us a false and blind consciousness [une fausse et aveugle conscience], which always removes us further from the road of reason, the only one leading to happiness. (1817 [2011: 255]; 1815 [2015: 254])

Therefore, despite the later identification of the two terms, Destutt de Tracy conceived ideology as a remedy for false consciousness.

This basic orientation has continued to characterize liberal approaches to ideology. Liberal education in its modern form aims to counteract the human tendencies to defer to authority, to succumb to peer pressure, and to exploit perceived inequalities of status (Nussbaum 2009: 9). It pursues this aim by teaching critical thinking, an appreciation for scientific methods, and a standard of reasonableness. Extremism, moral absolutism, and confirmation bias are thought to be inimical to liberal society, and a broad tradition of social scientific and social theoretical research, as well as political philosophical reflection, has grown up around the study and management of these problems (see, e.g., Putnam 1971).

The continuity between this work and that of the idéologues has been obscured by the fact that “ideology” has come to name the danger to be overcome or managed by liberal education rather than the intellectual project of overcoming or managing that danger. Thus, the end-of-ideology thesis expressed the hope that “civil politics could replace ideological politics” (Bell 1988: 138), but such a civil politics was also the aim of ideology for Destutt de Tracy, Cabanis, and company.

Within the liberal tradition, some have distinguished “ideologies”—understood as inherently unreasonable intellectual visions for ordering human affairs (Arendt 1953; Bell 1960 [1962])—from religious and ethical traditions and worldviews more generally. Others consider all “comprehensive doctrines” together, allowing that there might be reasonable or unreasonable adherents of any given doctrine (Rawls 2005).

Another division among liberal approaches emerges from the practical and political question of how liberal polities and institutions ought to respond to unreasonable ideologies. For public reason liberals, policy must be susceptible to public justification—i.e., justification in terms acceptable to all—in order to be legitimate (Gaus 1996, 2011; Rawls 2005). This might be understood as requiring a language of political justification that is neutral among all comprehensive doctrines or ideologies. In practice, this approach leans in the direction of strong universalism in legislation and a reliance on markets and market-like incentives as the predominant socializing or civilizing mechanisms. However, some liberals believe this is insufficient to protect the political sphere from capture by illiberal forces, and advocate instead a program of civic education and/or “militant” measures like establishing cordons sanitaires to prevent dangerous ideologies and illiberal parties from corrupting the public sphere (Castiglione & McKinnon 2003; Gauthier 1977).

1.2 Conservative Conceptions of Ideology

The conservative tradition of thinking about ideology has not been so affected by the historical transformations in the meaning of the term. The conservative objection to ideology has remained very close to the attacks leveled by Napoleon Bonaparte (1769–1821) against the idéologues after 1801. Bonaparte, for political reasons, appealed to the Catholic faithful by attacking the idéologues for their rationalism and materialism. Ideology, according to Bonaparte—influenced in this regard by the Romanticism of François-René, vicomte de Chateaubriand (1768–1848)—sought to replace Christian tradition and mores with a rational system of belief and legislation, ordering social and political life by means of the human mind (Kennedy 1979: 358–60).

Ideology, on this account, retains its particular connection to the Enlightenment and is understood to encompass any political project of social or political reform guided by a rational or abstract doctrine. Hume’s objection to “parties of principle” is a recognizable precedent (Hume 1777 [1994]). The conservative approach to ideology expresses a skepticism about modern rationalism (understood as encompassing empiricism and scientific methods generally), especially insofar as rationalism is applied to social and political life (Oakeshott 1962 [1991]).

Conservative thinkers tend to identify rationalist or ideological politics with social engineering, or the illegitimate “assimilation of politics to engineering” (Oakeshott 1962 [1991: 9]). Opposition to social engineering (AKA “scientism”, “positivism”, or “high modernism”) also characterizes liberalism and critical theory (Habermas 1981 [1987]; Hayek 1952; Horkheimer 1968 [1982]; Popper 1944–45 [2002]; Scott 1998). However, conservative thinkers often identify any political appeal to scientific or social scientific knowledge—including that of economics—as social engineering, refusing the liberal distinction between “piecemeal” and “utopian” engineering, or between “the practical management of problems” and “the clash of ideologies”. Hence, Oakeshott claimed that Hayek’s Road to Serfdom amounted to “a plan to resist all planning”, thereby converting resistance to rationalism “into an ideology” (Oakeshott 1962 [1991: 26]). Hence, also, many contemporary conservatives focus on “social constructivism” and “gender ideology” as attempts to make over putatively immutable or natural facts, accessible by “common sense”, as mind-dependent matters for human decision.

However, the conservative critique of ideology is not reducible to antirationalism. According to the conservative account, ideologies are themselves abstracts or abridgments of practical experience. While ideologies present themselves as premeditated principles that can guide and evaluate human activity, they actually simplify, schematize, or rationalize previous activity. This can be appropriate. Like digest books, ideologies provide an easily assimilable form of knowledge. This is useful when “new and politically inexperienced social classes … have risen to the exercise of political initiative and authority” (Oakeshott 1962 [1991, 30]). Ideology becomes essentially inimical to good politics, however, when it derives, not from political experience, but from some other realm of human activity—“war, religion, or the conduct of industry, for example” (Oakeshott 1962 [1991: 54]).

This concern with the colonization of the lifeworld of politics by alien vocabularies and logics of belief is not confined to conservatives (Lukács 1923 [1971]; Arendt 1958; Habermas 1981 [1987]), but it is distinctive of the conservative tradition to identify this concern with the critique of ideology.

1.3 Marxist Conceptions of Ideology

The Marxist tradition has always been torn between two approaches to ideology in the original liberal sense. On the one hand, Marxists have been drawn to a radicalizing strategy, which endorses the aims of liberal Enlightenment but disputes the pedagogical, economic, and civil means endorsed by liberals. On the other hand, however, Marxists have also pursued a debunking strategy by which they aim to unmask the ideological project as either a ruse of power or as a form of mystification. Since the meaning of “ideology” has drifted, these critical strategies have drifted as well, proliferating Marxist and post-Marxist critical theoretical accounts of ideology. Because philosophical discussion of ideology very often begins from claims associated with the Marxist tradition, the multitude of Marxist accounts of ideology has been a major source of both diversity and confusion in the philosophical literature on the topic.

1.3.1 Ideology in Marx and Engels

Karl Marx (1818–1883) read and took notes on Destutt de Tracy’s Elements of Ideology, both in 1844 and again in preparation for writing Capital. To a first approximation, the idéologues’ project was always the exemplary case of ideology for Marx, but he also identified the writings of Young Hegelians like Bruno Bauer (1809–1882) and Max Stirner (Johann Kaspar Schmitt, 1806–1856) as instances of a “German ideology”, and generalized the model further to encompass at least significant aspects of political economy, law, politics, religion, philosophy, journalism, and the military (Marx & Engels 1846 [2017: I/5.120]; Marx 1867 [2024: 409]).

What unites this disparate and capacious catalog of ideologies and ideologists, for Marx, is the “unproductive” or “immaterial” nature of their activity (Mills 1992). According to Marx, the development of the social division of labor and the exploitation of the growing productive powers of labor establishes a basis upon which rests “the state and the rest of the idealistic superstructure” (Marx & Engels 1846 [2017: I/5.115]). The people who occupy themselves with the business of this superstructure are, by dint of “their practical position in life, their business, and the division of labor”, prone to the “illusion” that they are independent and directive of society (Marx & Engels 1846 [2017: I/5.66]). This is supposed to be a sociologically materialist explanation of why ideologists like Destutt de Tracy, Bauer, and Stirner try to instruct and direct society according to ideas. “Ideology”, therefore, comes to name, for Marx, both the “sociological idealism” to which superstructural workers are susceptible and the superstructure itself, which explains their susceptibility (Mills 1992).

In his later work—especially in his Ludwig Feuerbach and the End of Classical German Philosophy (1886)—Friedrich Engels (1820–1895) returns to this sociological explanation of ideology, emphasizing Marxism’s opposition to philosophical idealism. According to Engels, ideology entails an “occupation with thoughts as with independent entities, developing independently and subject only to their own laws”. However, it is actually “the material life conditions” of the ideologist that determines, “in the final analysis”, the course of this development of thought (Engels 1886 [2003: 26.394]). The ideologist, as an idealist, is necessarily ignorant of the economic determinants of their thought process. Hence, the ideologist, as Engels put it in a letter, accomplishes a conscious process of thinking with a “false consciousness”, since their consciousness attributes to the immanent development of ideas what is actually a reflection or effect of the development of material life (Engels 1893 [2004: 50.164]).

Because Marx and Engels never developed an explicit theory of ideology, later scholars have attempted to do so by connecting Marx and Engels’s scattered comments about ideology with three other topics in their writings.

Most prominently, their critique of ideology is but one instance in which they seek to give a sociologically materialist explanation of ideas or consciousness, and this has led many to assimilate their account of ideology and their theory of ideas or consciousness (Cohen 1978 [2001: 376]; McCarney 1980; Torrance 1995). On this approach, the question of ideology is the question of the social determination of ideas or of forms of consciousness (Mannheim 1929 [1936]), and, since Marx and Engels identify classes and class struggle as the fundamental social determinant, their theory of ideology is taken to be their account of how forms of consciousness arise out of and/or serve class interests (McCarney 1980: chap. 1).

However, Marx and Engels’s comments about ideology have also been attached to their claim that “the thoughts of the dominant class are in every epoch the dominant thoughts” (Marx & Engels 1846 [2017: I/5.60]). This has given rise to the “dominant ideology thesis”, according to which, in any (stable) class society, the ruling class formulates (perhaps unintentionally or unconsciously) a set of beliefs that reflect and/or serve their own class interest in continued domination and exploitation, ideas which are largely adopted by the subordinate classes, thereby explaining their continued subordination (Abercrombie, Hill, & Turner 1980; Weber 1921/22 [1954: 336]). While this may appear to be a specification of the identification of ideology with partisan class ideas, it cannot be true that ideology refers both to partisan class ideas in general and to the “ruling ideas” in particular (Abercrombie & Turner 1978: 251). The “class ideas” approach gives rise to an evaluatively neutral account of ideologies, while the “ruling ideas” approach inclines towards a pejorative or critical account of ideology as a bulwark of domination and exploitation.

Finally, some have taken Marx’s discussion in Capital of fetishism to be an extension or development of his account of ideology (Eagleton 1991: 84–88; Geras 1971; Louette 2023; Mepham 1972). On this account, capitalist society, because of the market-imposed separation between production and consumption, necessarily appears to its participants as a mysterious entity operating according to occult mechanisms, a socially produced mystification that should properly identified as ideology. It has been noted, however, that Marx never refers to fetishism as ideology, and that the handful of appearances of the word in Capital refer to the activity of superstructural workers in general and political economists in particular (Balibar 1994: 89; Mills 1992; Roberts 2024). Nonetheless, this has been an important strand of ideology theory in the twentieth and twenty-first centuries, and it does reconnect the concept of ideology to the specifically modern and liberal domain from which it originally emerged, insofar as fetishism is proper to commercial modernity.

1.3.2 Ideology in the Marxist Tradition

Because Marxism developed as a party idea among socialists prior to the publication of the manuscripts on “the German ideology” (see Johnson, 2022), Marxist partisans tended to use “ideology”—in keeping with Marx’s mention of the term in the 1859 preface to A Contribution to the Critique of Political Economy—to refer to the “forms in which men become conscious” of the class contradiction in the economic base of society “and fight it out” (Marx & Engels 1859 [1987: 29.263]). Hence, ideology had both a theoretical aspect and a political aspect. Theoretically, it was the form in which socio-economic matters rose to conscious awareness. Politically, it was the set of fighting creeds by which parties justified their tactics and attempted to win supporters.

Because the capitalist economy was taken to be defined by a tendency of the class conflict between the bourgeoisie and the proletariat to sharpen and to increasingly determine everything else, many Marxists followed Lenin in reading all ideologies through their intersection with this fundamental conflict. This led to the simplifying assumption that people face a binary choice, “either bourgeois or socialist ideology” (Lenin 1902 [1973: 37]). Within a highly polarized political context, this assumption led to the conclusion that “to belittle the socialist ideology in any way, to turn aside from it in the slightest degree means to strengthen bourgeois ideology” (Lenin 1902 [1973: 37]). This, in turn, led to the shorthand equation of “socialist ideology”—i.e., the correct party line—with “class consciousness” and of any ideological deviation from the correct line with “false consciousness”.

In the works of Hungarian Marxist philosopher Georg (György) Lukács (1885–1971), the identification of the (long-term) interests of the proletariat with the interests of humanity as such develops this connection between (non-Marxist) ideologies and false consciousness (Lukács 1923 [1971]; Márkus 1981: 131). This conceptual connection was crucial for the Frankfurt School of critical theory, as well as for the broader tradition of Marxist humanism (e.g., Thompson 1957: 107–9). For Lukács, and even more so for members of the Frankfurt School, false consciousness is not opposed to science—which, in the form of positivism, has been part of the increasing dominance of rational calculation and formal rationality characteristic of capitalist modernity—but to a reflexive, normative, and critical theory (Geuss 1981). For this critical theory, negation plays the special role of unmasking the particular interests that animate and are served by any positive project (including, especially, the party line pursued by Leninist organizations) (Cook 2001). In this tradition, the critique of ideology becomes tightly bound up or even identified with the critique of alienation and reification. Alienation is the process whereby the artifacts of human practices—e.g., the products of labor, or the institutions of the labor movement—escape from the control of and turn against their creators (James 2012; Mattick 1969). Reification is the process whereby the relational totality that constitutes society is obscured by its seemingly independent, quantifiable, and non-relational parts (Lukács 1923 [1971]).

It is from this perspective that it makes sense to interpret Marx’s discussion of the fetishism of commodities as an extension and development of the analysis of ideology into the analysis of impersonal forms of social domination (Balibar 1994; Postone 1993). It also makes sense to flesh out the discussion of ideology either by reference to Hegel’s criticisms of the understanding as he opposes this operation of the mind to dialectical reason (Abazari 2019), or by reference to Freud’s analysis of the processes of the unconscious, which allows critical theorists to diagnose ideology as the substitute gratification of real needs (Fromm 1968: 63).

In contrast to this line of development, another Marxist tradition of thinking about ideology is represented by the work of the Italian journalist and philosopher Antonio Gramsci (1891–1937). Gramsci, emphasizing the texture of political conflict, developed the idea of ideology as class consciousness into an account of culture and institutions as the terrain of politics (Gramsci 1971). According to Gramsci, a socialist party, in its efforts to establish leadership of the working classes, articulates Marxist theory with other elements of popular consciousness and popular culture. If this process is successful, the party will advance to the head of a coalition of different class forces (a “historic bloc”) and be positioned to exercise hegemony over society as a whole. This line of thinking leads away from the critique of ideology as false consciousness and towards the descriptive analysis of the (contradictory) elements and tendencies of cultural traditions and institutions.

Although this tradition has been developed primarily in histories of popular culture (Guha 1983; Hobsbawm 1959 [1963]; Thompson 1963 [1968]), and in interdisciplinary cultural studies (Denning 2004; Hall 2016; Hall et al. 1978 [2013]), it has also received significant philosophical elaboration, beginning especially with French philosopher Louis Althusser (1918–1990). Althusser, like the Frankfurt School of critical theory, associated ideology with the reproduction of the social order and sought to use psychoanalytic concepts, including that of the unconscious, to develop the theory of ideology. However, he drew on the structuralist psychoanalysis of Lacan to argue that ideology “interpellates individuals as subjects” (Althusser 1995 [2014: 188]). What Althusser meant by this formula is that ideology constitutes and calls to us as agents, providing the framework and orientation within which we experience ourselves (and one another) as centers of action beholden to normative demands. According to Althusser, ideology can perform this function only because it is always embedded in ritual practices and institutions.

Althusser also affirmed two other theses about ideology that sharply differentiate his approach from that of the Frankfurt School. First, because of its central function in subject-formation, ideology is not a symptom of class struggle or a feature of human society that could ever wither away, even in an ideal communist future, but is instead “a structure essential to the historical life of societies” (Althusser 1965 [1969: 232]). Hence, his approach is not a critique of ideology as such, and “ideology” is not a pejorative term for Althusser. Moreover, rather than opposing ideology to a critical theory that is essentially reflexive and normative, Althusser opposes ideology to science, understood as a subject-less body of concepts that make possible the production of knowledge within a specific domain (Lewis 2009 [2022]).

Althusser’s claim that ideology interpellates individuals as subjects has been the most influential aspect of his theory. The Swedish sociologist Göran Therborn has developed it away from its functionalist tendencies by stressing the irreducible plurality of forms in which agents might “qualified” (both specified as a particular type and authorized to act in that capacity) (Therborn 1980 [1999]). Judith Butler both drew upon Althusser’s understanding of subjectification in their account of the production of gendered subjects and reacted against his account of interpellation—in a manner broadly consonant with critical theory—by emphasizing the ever-recurrent possibility of de-subjectification (Butler 1997). Quill Kukla has argued that Althusser provides an account of how subjects are inducted into the normative “space of reasons” by being misrecognized as already bound by the normative conventions into which they are being recruited, an account that aligns Althusser with Sellars’s account of epistemic authority (Kukla 2000). Sally Haslanger has directly taken up Althusser’s argument for the material existence of ideology in institutions and practices, a theme she has developed in her account of “cultural technēs” (Haslanger 2015, 2017, 2019, 2021).

2. Mapping Ideology

Due to the heterogeneity of the traditions of ideology theory, efforts to mobilize the concept must begin by establishing the sense in which the word is being understood. A first-cut specification is to distinguish between evaluatively-neutral or descriptive conceptions and evaluatively-critical or pejorative conceptions. (For critical conceptions, one may then ask about the target of the criticism. What is wrong with ideology? This question will be the focus of Section 3 below.) A second specification, however, distinguishes the location of ideology—what Shelby calls the “unit of analysis” (2003) and Balkin calls the “object of study” (1998: 101). Does “ideology” pick out a type of consciousness, a set of ideas, the world of culture, a set of expectations, or something else? Finally, there is the question of scope. Does ideology encompass all ideas, for example, or only those ideas with a certain content, a certain social function, a certain etiology, and/or a certain set of effects?

One must establish where a given conception of ideology fits in a classificatory scheme of all possible conceptions in order to know how it relates to any other conception. However, this classification, while necessary, is less interesting than the considerations that lead an author to classify ideology as they do in the first place. Authors are rarely explicit about this, and a fully explanatory theory may not be possible. However, two important variables can be established. First, the valence of ideology tracks attitudes towards partiality and partisanship. Critical conceptions of ideology indicate a commitment to moral and/or epistemic impartiality, while descriptive conceptions indicate greater openness to the moral and/or epistemic virtues of partisanship. Meanwhile, intuitions about the location of ideology track theories of agency. Adherents of the standard theory of agency as rational-intentional action are drawn to cognitivism regarding ideology (Elster 1983; Shelby 2003; Stanley 2015), while those who downplay the role of representational mental states in agency, such as enactment or embodiment theorists, will tend to locate ideology in habitual schemas of meaning, cultural technēs, affects, or bodily practices (Althusser 1995 [2014]; Hall 2016; Haslanger 2015; 2019; Hennessy 1993; Jaeggi 2009; Therborn 1980 [1999]).

2.1 The Valence of Ideology

The most obvious divide in uses of “ideology” is between uses with a pejorative or critical sense and uses with a neutral or descriptive sense (Geuss 1981; Haslanger 2021; Shelby 2003). While a positive or laudatory sense is also logically possible, only in the case of the idéologues could ideology in general be positively valorized. As soon as the word became a common rather than a proper noun—as soon as there were many ideologies rather than only one—any attempt to positively valorize ideology used the term in a descriptive sense while distinguishing between good and bad instances on independent moral, political, or epistemic grounds (contra Geuss 1981: 22–26).

Although it is common to associate the Marxist tradition with the critical conception (e.g., Shelby 2003: 156–57), critical and descriptive conceptions are equally at home both within and outside of Marxism. Marx and Engels deployed “ideology” critically, but only because they found the strategy of the ideologists ridiculous; their conception is descriptive, even if their use of the term takes on pejorative color. Lenin, Gramsci, and Althusser all developed descriptive concepts. Conservatives, liberals, and non-Marxist socialists are similarly divided.

Rather than broad political traditions, it is helpful to associate the division between critical and descriptive valences with differing commitments to epistemic and/or moral impartiality or universalism. The tradition of Frankfurt School critical theory, which is closely connected to the project of Ideologiekritik, is strongly committed to both moral universalism and to a Hegel-influenced epistemological claim that, at least for social phenomena, knowledge can only be achieved from the perspective of the totality (Jay 1984). From within this tradition, therefore, ideology appears essentially as false (because partial) consciousness, which must be transcended through criticism. For anyone committed, on the other hand, to the notion that knowledge and/or right action can or must emerge from some particular perspective or worldview, ideology appears as a necessary medium. Intermediate positions are possible, too. For instance, “ideology” may be reserved as a pejorative term for an excess of partiality or partisanship, say, a “closed-system” worldview that insulates the adherent against novel or disconfirming experiences.

2.2 The Location of Ideology

A second variable in the study of ideology is where theorists look for instances. Broadly speaking, theories of ideology are divided between cognitivist and culturalist approaches. Cognitivist accounts locate ideology among ideas, beliefs, “forms of consciousness”, mental representations, or propositional attitudes (Elster 1983: chap. IV; 1985: 459–65; Habermas 1981 [1987]; Mills 2005; Shelby 2003; Stanley 2018). Culturalist accounts locate ideology among “forms of life”, habits, practico-symbolic schemas, or “cultural technēs” (Balkin 1998; Haslanger 2015, 2019, 2021; Jaeggi 2009, 2014 [2018]; Therborn 1980 [1999]).

Among cognitivist accounts, some restrict ideology to “beliefs and values consciously entertained by some individual or individuals” (Elster 1985, 462). More commonly, however, it is recognized that an ideology “may be only implicit in the behavioral dispositions, utterances, conduct, and practices of social actors”, and that ideological beliefs “are quite frequently confused and may be expressed only in the form of stereotypes, clichés, and fragmented narratives” (Shelby 2003: 161). Cutting across this distinction between explicit and implicit beliefs (Plamenatz 1970: 17) is the distinction between beliefs and values—between beliefs “about the world as it is” and beliefs “about the world as it ought to be” (Elster 1985: 466)—as well as the further distinction between beliefs about how something can be done and beliefs about how something ought to be done (Stanley 2015). These distinctions are often submerged in a more generic cognitivist claim that, e.g., ideology consists of “the descriptive vocabulary” or “language of consciousness” appropriate to everyday social life (Fields 1990), or that “ideology” names “partisan group ideas” (Mills 1992).

Culturalist accounts of ideology are motivated by some of the same observations that incline many cognitivists to include implicit beliefs in the field of ideology. They go further, however, by foregrounding “‘non-discursive’ elements,’” such as “characteristic gestures, rituals, attitudes, forms of artistic activity, etc.” (Geuss 1981: 6); or else, they find ideology in “manifestations of a particular being-in-the-world of conscious actors” (Therborn 1980 [1999: 2]); or, alternatively, they identify ideology as a species of “cultural technē”, the “network of social meanings, tools, scripts, schemas, heuristics, principles, and the like which we draw on in action, and which gives shape to our practices” (Haslanger 2017: 155). Regardless of the language used, the intent is to locate ideology in the pre-reflective and habitual dimensions of human agency and social life.

Althusser might represent a third option, neither cognitivist nor culturalist, since he seems to locate ideology in practices, rituals, and “apparatuses” (or institutions), which are, according to him, the material existence of ideas (Althusser 1995 [2014: 260–61]). Some would include Foucault (1975 [1995]) and Butler (1997) in this lineage (Montag 2013; Lepold 2018). However, cognitivists and culturalists are at pains to demonstrate that their accounts of ideology are also both material and practical (e.g., Stanley 2018: 508–9; Haslanger 2018, 2022). More work would have to be done to demonstrate that the Althusserian approach is genuinely distinct in this regard.

Whether a theorist is drawn to a cognitivist or a culturalist account of ideology seems to depend on whether they adhere more closely to the standard conception of agency as rational-intentional action or incline more towards alternative conceptions of agency that emphasize pre-reflective and embodied aspects of human action.

This suggests a significant consensus underlying the more obvious disagreements. Ideology shares basic features with human agency, and to conceive of anything—a text, an idea, a convention, or a cultural form—as ideology is to bring it into focus as either a condition of or burden on human agency. When this regularity is combined with the regularity noted above—that ideology denotes partiality, “in one of the two senses of that term, expressed in French by ‘partiel’ and ‘partial’” (Elster 1983: 145–46)—the disorder of ideology theory as a field of study becomes intelligible as expressing the diversity of theorists’ intuitions about the roles that partiality and partisanship play (or should play) in human action.

2.3 The Scope of Ideology

Regardless of disagreements over the valence and location of ideology, most accounts agree that certain scope restrictions must be placed on ideas or cultural elements in order for them to be rightly classed as ideological. Ideology pertains to social life, in one manner or another. Four types of social pertinence, in particular, are commonly indicated. Most universally, ideology is held (1) to have social causes and (2) to have social effects. These stipulations are only scope restrictions for cognitivists, since all culture, by definition, has social causes and effects.

That ideology is “explained by social facts” (Elster 1985: 459) is uncontroversial, with disputation reserved for the questions of which facts count as social facts and which social facts are explanatory (Haslanger 2022). Not all cognitivists accept that ideology has social effects, however. This is one reading of Marx and Engels’s original criticism of ideology: ideology is an effect of the ideologists’ placement in the social division of labor, but this placement also condemns ideology to inconsequence, since ideologists have no access to or ability to affect the mode of material production.

More controversially, ideology is often thought (3) to have social content, or to be about society. It is doubtful that culture, as the culturalist ideology theorists intend it, has content or about-ness in this sense. If it does, then it seems that culture reduces to “a network” of beliefs and values (Shelby 2003: 159), with the consequences that (a) the culturalist approach to ideology reduces to the cognitivist approach and (b) all culture is “about” society, since it regulates and makes sense of social practices. Therefore, this social content proviso is a scope restriction that applies only to cognitivist accounts. However, again, not all cognitivists accept this scope restriction. Theological and metaphysical beliefs are classic objects of ideology critique, despite lacking (explicit) social content (Forster 2015).

Finally, ideology is frequently thought (4) to have a social function. (This is usually the rationale for classing theology and metaphysics as species of ideology.) What this function might be varies. For many Marxists, “part of what makes a form of social consciousness ideological is the role it plays in establishing or reinforcing relations of oppression” (Shelby 2003: 173; compare to Forster 2015: 817; Freeland 2000: 368; King 1991). For Althusser, however, ideology has no special connection to oppression or exploitation; instead, “all ideology has the function (which defines it) of ‘constituting’ concrete individuals as subjects” (Althusser 1995 [2014: 262]). The attribution of functions is controversial, since it goes beyond the identification of predictable social effects to claim that an ideology exists or has the characteristics it has because of its predictable social effects. To escape backwards causation, any function attribution must, to be complete, identify a causal feedback or selection mechanism, either intentional or systematic but unintentional, whereby ideologies that successfully fulfill their social function come into being, propagate, and are resilient, while those that do not are never produced, are winnowed out, or fade away. The debate on the appropriateness of functional explanation in social theory, and in the theory of ideology especially, is long-standing and complex (important entries in the debate include: Carling 2002; Cohen 1978 [2001]; Elster 1985, 1986; Pettit 1996b; Rosen 1996; Wood 1986). Nonetheless, using a social function to restrict the scope of ideational or cultural phenomena to be captured by the theory of ideology remains common (Haslanger 2019; Shelby 2003).

3. Varieties of Ideology Critique

Ideology can be criticized along three lines. It might be criticized for exhibiting or leading to faults of rationality, or for being interest-undermining. It might also be criticized for exhibiting or leading to faults of morality, or for being justice-undermining. Finally, it might be criticized for exhibiting or leading to epistemic faults, or for being knowledge-undermining. Each of these criticisms might be either unconditional or conditional. For example, one ideology critic might dismiss all ideology as interest-undermining partisanship, while another might differentiate between interest-serving and interest-undermining partisanship, criticizing only the latter but referring to both as “ideology”.

Regardless of the fault, the criticism of faulty ideology is not concerned with individual cases of irrationality, immorality, or ignorance, except as these are, at least, indicative or typical of wide-spread irrationality, immorality, or ignorance with a social etiology. Ideology critique is a form of social criticism, and it can only proceed by showing that a certain form of rational, moral, or epistemic failure is both widespread within a society or a group and traceable to the common social situation of its sufferers. Two types of social groups attract the special focus of ideology critics: the “negatively privileged” or “subordinate” (henceforth, “the dominated”) and the “positively privileged” or “ruling class” (henceforth, “the dominant”).

3.1 Rationally Faulty Ideology

When ideology is criticized for exhibiting or leading to faults of rationality, the substance of the criticism is that an agent or group of agents is in the grip of (a faulty) ideology just to the extent that, due to certain social facts, they are partial to or partisans of a state of affairs or course of action that is contrary to their own interests.

The conceptual connection between rationality and interests is tight; an interest can be defined as “the most rational course of action in a predefined game, that is, a situation in which gain and loss have already been defined” (Therborn 1980 [1999: 10]). However, the connection between interests and partiality or partisanship seems equally tight; interests are rational strategies, and therefore seem to be inherently instrumental (“partisan”) and perspectival (“partial”). This suggests that criticisms of interest-undermining ideology will necessarily be conditional criticisms based on a descriptive conception of ideology. An interested being is by definition partial to their interests, and so it seems to follow that any interested being will have ideological beliefs, and only a subset of those ideological beliefs—the ones that somehow do not fulfill their function of supporting the being’s pursuit of their interests—pose a problem.

In fact, however, this does not obtain. Instead, the literature displays a strongly bimodal distribution of criticisms of interest-undermining ideology. A fully substantive conception of rationality identifies rational strategies with the end to be achieved (with well-being or human flourishing or the like). On this account, rationality just is rational autonomy or rational self-determination (Ng 2015). Therefore, critics of interest-undermining ideology go one of two ways: either they embrace a formal or instrumental conception of rationality and a descriptive conception of ideology, or else they embrace a substantive conception of rational autonomy and a pejorative conception of ideology.

That partisanship or partiality can lead us into irrational beliefs and behaviors is not seriously in doubt. For instance, a suburban car commuter may vote for a mayoral candidate who praises the suburbs and car culture and promises to slash funding for public transit and expand downtown parking, even though the voter’s interest as a commuter—in being able to drive quickly and efficiently to work—would be better served by decreasing demand for roadspace. Being publicly affirmed in one’s choices and one’s identity can override or derail a rational assessment of the available options.

Two types of criticism should be excluded from this category of ideology critique, however. First, prioritizing short-term over long-term interests is not a fault of rationality, per se, and cannot furnish the basis for a critique of interest-undermining ideology, even if it may be an incident of that critique. Strategizing for long-term interests is beset by higher uncertainty in a way that cannot be eliminated. Second, prioritizing individual interests over group or collective interests is not itself a fault of rationality, since it concerns a divergence between two different games. It is one thing to say that the individualist cannot achieve their own ends by their individualist strategy; it is another to say they should be pursuing other, solidaristic ends (Gaventa 1980: 90). Criticism of individualist strategies is better conceptualized, therefore, as aimed at justice-undermining ideology rather than at interest-undermining ideology. (A practical difficulty for the proponents of a fully substantive conception of rationality is that this distinction is, on principle, not available to them.)

3.1.1 Are the Dominated Especially Prone to Rationally Faulty Ideology?

Here a special case must be considered. The belief that the dominated are partial to or partisans of their own subordination, contrary to their own interests, is widespread in the literature on ideology. It is often taken for granted that there is a

tendency of the oppressed and exploited classes in a society to believe in the justice or at least the necessity of the social order that oppresses them. (Elster 1983: 146; compare Heath 2000: 363)

In this context, the theory of ideology is supposed to answer the question:

why do the victims of oppression not rise up against their oppressors (and sometimes not even seem to show any inclination to do so)? (Finlayson 2015: 135; compare Lafont 2023: 391)

It is supposed to answer this question by reference to the possession, by the victims of oppression, of an ideological false consciousness, “a distorted view of social practices and institutions” (Lafont 2023: 391).

Since this answer only pushes the question back one step (Cudd 2006: 55), the puzzle become: why do the dominated have a false consciousness, or “why do oppressed groups accept the ideology of their own inferiority?” (Stanley 2015: 222). This perspective attributes to the members of dominated groups a belief (or set of beliefs) about themselves and/or their situation the possession of which is contrary to their own interests (Geuss 1981: 45). While there is nothing odd about claiming that an individual may be mistaken about a matter that affects their own best interests, it seems puzzling that a significant group or class of people would commonly accept a false belief that undermines their interests, since this implies a general, unidirectional, and stubborn failure of rationality. Hence, Dotson (2018) has dubbed it the “Not-Very-Bright Thesis”.

Numerous mechanisms for resolving this puzzle have been proposed in the literature, but substantial doubts have also been raised about each of them.

3.1.1.1 Sociological Mechanisms

By far the most commonly proposed mechanism is pedagogical indoctrination or coercive socialization (Althusser 1995 [2014: 142–47]; Bartky 1990; Berger & Luckmann 1966: 121–25; Gaventa 1980: 22; Guha 1997: 165–69; Stanley 2015: 234–37). This is the basis of the dominant ideology thesis in its classic form: the dominant group, monopolizing the means of mental production, ensures that members of the dominated group internalize the dominant belief system, which includes as a component the (false) idea that members of the dominated group are incapable of self-rule or freedom and are better off in their current, dominated position.

Another commonly proposed mechanism is elite control of the media and of expert authority. For example, it is claimed that, in any stable society, “the central moral, political and economic ideas that dominate discussion in the mass media and in the corridors of power” will generally “promote the interests of the ruling class of that society” (Leiter 2004 [2005: 159]). Similarly, Stanley claims that, since belief is not under our direct voluntary control, dominant group control of the authoritative narratives and sources of testimonial evidence will result in dominated groups being insulated from any alternative ideology, and therefore believing the dominant account of their inferiority (2015: chap. 6).

The effectiveness of these sociological mechanisms has been doubted, however, on multiple grounds. First, since the socioeconomically disadvantaged tend to be less exposed to elite media, have lower educational attainment (and hence less exposure to elite expert discourse), and exhibit lower levels of trust in conventional expert opinion, it is unclear why these mechanisms would not be primarily effective at securing coordination and cohesion among the dominant (Scott 1990: chap. 3). Moreover, the legitimating discourses of the dominant consists, at least in part, of the rules, promises, and normative ideals that the present order is said to instantiate, realize, or pursue, and these can be used to make demands of the dominant (Gramsci 1971: 161; Piven & Cloward 1977; Scott 1990: chap. 4; Willis 1977). This has given rise to an adage for radical organizers, “Make the enemy live up to their own book of rules” (Alinsky 1971: 128). Third, as feminist standpoint epistemologists have argued, the dominated can often draw upon the direct evidence of their lives and the lives of those similarly positioned in order to contest the guidance of dominant experts (Hartsock 1983; McKinnon 2018). Finally, the dominant belief system is very easily contradicted in two ways, with mental resources that would seem to be universally available. A belief about a normative social hierarchy might be contradicted either by reversal (e.g., “the last shall be first, and the first last”) or by negation (e.g., “There is neither Jew nor Greek, there is neither slave nor free, there is neither male nor female”). Such reversals and negations of dominant moral frameworks are widely attested among subordinate groups historically, and this seems to call into question the thesis that the dominated are, as a rule, susceptible to internalizing interest-undermining ideological beliefs (Scott 1977a, 1977b, 1985: chap. 8).

3.1.1.2 Psychological Mechanisms

Interest-undermining false consciousness might arise, instead, from the operation of various psychological mechanisms within the social context of subordination (Cudd 2006).

Elster suggests, for example, an optical illusion or unwarranted generalization, whereby the dominated attribute to the whole of society a pattern or logic that obtains only locally, in the neighborhood of society with which they are most familiar (1983: 145–46). For instance, a serf may recognize that they depend for their well-being and protection on the local lord, and generalize from this to the conclusion that a society of peasants without lords would be intolerably miserable and violence-prone. However, Elster only gives examples of academics either making this sort of error themselves or stipulating that subaltern populations “had to believe” something like this (1983: 146, including n. 12).

Another proposed mechanism is “stereotype threat”, a widely-studied phenomenon in social psychology. In a condition of stereotype threat, members of a group subject to a negative social stereotype are more likely to act in ways that seem to confirm the stereotype. It has been suggested that this type of self-fulfilling prophecy might underpin the adoption by subordinate groups of ideological beliefs regarding their own abilities (Stanley 2015: 239–40; compare Cudd 2006: chap. 6). However, anxiety about confirming a negative stereotype can affect performance without any supposition that negative beliefs about oneself have been internalized. Disidentification with dominant modes of achievement—the hypothesized route by which negative stereotypes become self-fulfilling prophecies—implies a mode of evaluation contrary to the dominant mode, which is the opposite of what the theory of ideological incorporation predicts.

A third psychological mechanism that features widely in the literature is preference adaptation, the spontaneous alteration of desires so as to minimize cognitive dissonance or frustration (Elster 1983). In its weaker form, this entails resignation, believing that the absence of some previously desired social state of affairs is necessary, even if regrettable. In its stronger form, it entails the belief that the absence of some previously desired social state of affairs is just or good. This psychological process is often referred to, generically, as “naturalization” or “reification”, and the stronger version is sometimes picked out as “legitimation”.

Whether preference adaptation is a significant phenomenon, or a case of interest-undermining false consciousness, may be doubted, however. In the first place, genuine instances of adaptive preferences would have to be sorted out from cases of preference falsification, the misrepresentation of one’s desires in the face of perceived pressure or opposition from others (Kuran 1995). The dominated have good reason to falsify their preferences in most circumstances (Jacobs 1861 [2015]; Scott 1985, 1990). Even if genuine cases of adaptive preferences can be identified, it is not clear that they are cases of irrationality. If a desired social state of affairs really is out of reach, changing one’s beliefs about its desirability may be the rational thing to do. Again, one must ask whether the adaptive preference would adapt again if an avenue to the previously desired outcome opens up. If it would—if, in the terms of the fable of the fox and the sour grapes, the fox would decide that the grapes were sweet after all were a means of attaining them presented—then the adaptive preference is not a significant phenomenon.

3.1.1.3 Conclusions

Too much of the literature on interest-undermining ideology among the dominated simply assumes what would have to be demonstrated, that widespread ideological false consciousness leads the dominated “to believe that their place is deserved” (Cudd 2006: 180). The “massive fact of history that the values and the beliefs of the subjects tend to support the rule of the dominant group” (Elster 1983: 166) is not so much a fact as an illusion: the only evidence for it is that the subjects are not generally in open revolt, but this is what ideological false consciousness is supposed to explain, so it cannot count as evidence that the beliefs of the subjects are, in fact, partial to their subordination.

As Finlayson points out, if we accept that people are

imperfectly rational, imperfectly informed and somewhat confused, often fearful, subject to more or less reasonable forms of hope, prone to a condition sometimes termed learned helplessness, motivated to a considerable extent to pursue what we would think of as their own interests, but also motivated in ways that cannot plausibly be reduced to this, for example, by aesthetic, altruistic, experimental or self-destructive urges,

then it is not really

a mystery that such beings, having been born into a social order that oppresses them, often do not rise up and overthrow it. (2015: 138)

No appeal to widespread false consciousness or ideological incorporation is necessary to explain the persistence of oppressive social systems.

It might also be argued that the entire dispute about “the dominant ideology thesis” was a red herring to begin with. Those who proposed that ideology was a crucial factor in the persistence and stability of systems of domination and exploitation were, in the first instance, revolutionaries and radical reformers. What they meant, arguably, was not that the dominated and exploited are partisans of the system that dominates and exploits them, but that they are not yet partisans of revolutionary or radical projects that aim to abolish that system (Lenin 1902: chap. 2 [1973]).

From this perspective, the diagnosis of “false consciousness” among the dominated means only that the patient is not an adherent of the best or correct political program or practices, as identified by the diagnostician. In this sense, ideology critique is endemic to popular, contestatory politics, which consists in advocating one ideology (partisan view) against rivals and trying to win over the uncommitted (Freeden 1996), in part by arguing that adherents of rival ideologies are deluded or mistaken about the rationality of their own partisan views.

3.1.2 Are the Dominant Especially Prone to Rationally Faulty Ideology?

If the ideology-critical argument that the dominated are prone to accepting interest-undermining ideology is questionable, however, there appears to be better evidence for the converse theory: that the dominant are, due to certain social facts, prone to accepting interest-undermining false beliefs or myths, at least in certain instances. (That the dominant might also adhere to interest-promoting ideological beliefs is no surprise; any criticism of these beliefs will base itself on moral or epistemic grounds.)

It is an ancient complaint about tyrants and princes that they surround themselves with flatterers and sycophants, but the prevalence of the complaint suggests a structural cause: flattery is a strategy among the dependent, since it may help them retain their office, status, or even their life (Kapust 2018). The result is that the dominant may find themselves surrounded by unreliable narrators, whose testimony about states of affairs is regularly distorted by their expectations about what the dominant want to hear. This is a politically salient instance of preference falsification, since it may lead the dominant to seriously underestimate opposition to their rule (Kuran 1995: chap. 15). By this mechanism, then, the dominant may be prone to accepting false beliefs about their own security, their own virtue, and their own popularity, false beliefs that undermine their rationality.

The same factors may lead to the dominant being insulated from rational arguments, such that they are less able to be rational themselves. This, at least, was Frederick Douglass’s claim about slaveholders: because they never encourage frank conversation with the slaves and other dependents who surround them, and because their every whim is law, “reason is imprisoned” on a plantation, and the slaveholder never learns how to control their own passions or to pursue a reasoned policy (Douglass 1855 [2003: 61–62]).

3.2 Morally Faulty Ideology

When ideology is criticized for exhibiting or leading to moral faults, the substance of the criticism is that an agent or group of agents is in the grip of (a faulty) ideology just to the extent that, due to certain social facts, they are partial to or partisans of a state of affairs or course of action that is unjust.

If, however, an agent is partial to or a partisan of an unjust social system because that system seems to them to operate in their interest—to deliver or secure for them important material and/or social goods—then this situation is not generally considered to call for ideology critique. A conflict between personal interests and the demands of justice is too widely taken for granted to call forth critical social theory in most cases. There are exceptions to this rule. Theorists who claim that we have moral or ethical interests—a rational interest in doing the right thing or in acting according to our duty (e.g., Stanley 2015: 266)—may assimilate the criticism of self-interested support for injustice to ideology critique. Similarly, theorists who identify instrumental rationality as an inappropriate governor of social interaction may conclude that “a state of society in which humans treat themselves and others as if they were things, not people” is a reified state of society, and is the proper object of ideology critique (Geuss 2008: 123). Note, however, that reification, even if it has bad moral consequences, is subject to ideology critique for the epistemic fault of mistaking a socially contingent circumstance for something necessary (Geuss 1981; Habermas 1981 [1987]; Honneth 2008).

The critique of justice-undermining ideology focuses on cases in which, because of how they are socially situated, and perhaps contrary to their own wishes and even efforts to the contrary, agents are complicit in injustice.

Accounts of structural injustice and findings from social psychology (Young 2011; Jost 2020), have been mobilized in efforts to explain why people often accept an unjust social and political status quo. The question of ideological complicity is not, as in the critique of interest-undermining ideology, directed at one group in society—“Why do you support a system that exploits you?”—but is addressed to everyone in general—“Why do you accept and help to reproduce an unjust social system?” The issue animating much of the recent writing on ideology is, thus, “how we all become agents of injustice” (Haslanger 2015: 12, n. 4).

In this general form, however, the question admits of only one answer: it depends. The causes and effects of unjust social practices are often obscure or controversial. There is often great uncertainty or disagreement about what practices would be genuinely disruptive of structural injustices, even where there is agreement about the existence of such injustices. Bucking established norms and practices is likely a costly course of action, and when these costs are compounded by the uncertainty that one’s actions will contribute to effective improvements, inaction (or minimal, conciliatory forms of protest) may seem the most prudent course (Finlayson 2015; Heath 2000; Sankaran 2020).

However, this combination of ignorance, uncertainty, disagreement, and costliness does not make a significant appearance in the most prominent recent critical accounts of ideology (by way of contrast, see Dworkin 1983). In general, the literature on the formal features of social norms and the literature on ideology have parted ways (Sankaran 2020). This does not mean there are no possibilities for fruitful engagement, however. Ideology critique might be understood as an effort to assist agents stuck in a suboptimal equilibrium, either by redescribing the action-relevant characteristics of the options they face so as to induce a change in preferences, or by highlighting discounted possibilities for action, thereby expanding the set of feasible options (Barrett 2022). The former would be appropriate where agents are complicit because they do not know that or how their actions contribute to injustice. The latter would be appropriate where agents are complicit because they do not know how they can act so as not to contribute to injustice. Both forms of ameliorative ideology critique depend upon social theory (Haslanger 2019, 2022); they require that the ideology critic possess knowledge of alternative social norms or forms of action that are not—or not as significantly—complicit in injustice.

3.3 Epistemically Faulty Ideology

When ideology is criticized for exhibiting or leading to epistemic faults, the substance of the criticism is that an agent or group of agents is in the grip of (a faulty) ideology just to the extent that, due to certain social facts, they are partial to or partisans of untruths or other epistemically dubious beliefs. This is the most diverse category of ideology critique. Generally speaking, an ideology is criticized for exhibiting or leading to either (1) faults of scope, (2) faults of modality, or (3) faults of reflective endorsement.

Partisanship or partiality leads to a fault of scope when an agent, because of their social position, background, or interests, mistakes something particular or local for something universal or general, or vice versa. It is commonly asserted, for instance, that ideology represents a particular interest as a universal interest (e.g., Celikates 2006: 33; Eagleton 1991: 56–58; Geuss 1981: 14; Žižek 1994: 10). This is very similar to the ideology critique that Charles Mills directs at the social contract tradition. The figure of the social contract is exemplary of the problem diagnosed by the epigraph to The Racial Contract: “When white people say ‘justice,’ they mean ‘just us’” (Mills 1997). A fault of scope critique is also exemplified by Elster’s analysis of cases in which members of social classes exhibit a “proneness to unwarranted generalization” that leads to making “errors about social causality” specific to the class’s position in the economic structure of society (1983: 144–49). The same could be said of some of the epistemic errors encoded in the formation and use of stereotypes, insofar as these give a universal and/or normative scope to select, privileged observations (Cudd 2006: chap. 3; Haslanger 2014).

Partisanship and partiality can also lead to the opposite epistemic problem, however: taking general or universal aspects of human social life to be the special property of one’s own social group, or acting as if they were. This may appear in political life as a variety of what Bertrand Russell called “emotive conjugation” (as stated by Griffin 1999), as, for example, “we pursue justice, you fetishize procedures, they are fanatics”. In a case of ideological bias, we may attribute to our own group or form of life an exclusive or privileged exercise of certain generically human capacities or virtues, simply because we experience and understand our culture and customs from within.

A different strand of epistemic ideology critique focuses, instead, on faults of modality. Partisanship or partiality leads to a fault of modality when an agent, because of their social position, background, or interests, believes something contingent to be something necessary, or vice versa. The most widely-encountered instance of this type of epistemic ideology critique is the critique of reification or naturalization, in which institutions, conventions, and other “social constructions” are taken to be or treated as if they were natural, eternal, inevitable, or otherwise not amenable to human alteration or control (Berger & Luckmann 1966: 88–92; Habermas 1981 [1987]; Honneth 2008; Lukács 1923 [1971]; Shelby 2003: 177; Thompson 1957). This is also called, by Geuss, “an ‘objectification’ mistake” (1981: 14). Critiques of ideological reification or naturalization tend to be quite sweeping, but they are akin to a critical strategy that is used more locally and on a smaller scale: the diagnosis of self-fulfilling prophecies or self-confirming beliefs. In these cases, believing something (or acting on a certain belief) generates evidence for the belief. If the police believe that Black motorists are more likely to possess illegal drugs, and act on that belief by implementing a form of racial profiling, this will generate a disproportionate number of drug arrests among Black motorists, a fact that may then be cited as evidence for the belief that Black motorists are more likely to possess illegal drugs.

Again, ideology can also be criticized for the opposite modal error: the necessary can appear to be contingent. Scapegoating and casting blame can be a way of attributing to individual agents’ contingent choices what would better be understood as a necessary outcome of background social facts and institutional dynamics. A feature of large-scale social interaction is that incentive structures may make it inevitable or nigh inevitable that some agents will engage in a particular behavior, even if it is impossible to say which individual agents will engage in that behavior. To use an example from Philip Pettit, that an increase in unemployment might explain a subsequent increase in crime illustrates a form of structural explanation in the social sciences that neither violates the commitment to intentional psychology nor runs afoul of scientific norms of explanation in other domains (Pettit 1996a: pt. II; building on Jackson and Pettit 1990, 1992; see also: Haslanger 2016). Therefore, a political campaign against crime that vilifies individual figures might be criticized as knowledge-undermining ideology on the grounds that it makes what is necessary (given the state of the economic system) appear to be contingent on an identified set of agents (Hall et al. 1978 [2013]).

Partisanship or partiality leads to a fault of reflective endorsement when an agent, because of their social position, background, or interests, believes x only because of some social facts, where these social facts (a) are not reasons for believing x, and (b) are such that, awareness of these facts would undermine the agent’s belief in x. This is the sort of fault that Engels intended with his claim that ideology is a process accomplished with a false consciousness: the economic facts and motives that actually cause the ideologist to believe certain things cannot be acknowledged by the ideologist without undermining the beliefs they gave rise to. Another prominent example of this form of ideology critique is the critique of legitimation. Habermas and other critical theorists argue that, if a belief in the legitimacy of a form of domination could not be arrived at or sustained under conditions of free and open deliberation, then the belief suffers a fault of reflective endorsement. The belief is only sustained by a background condition of coercion or fraud, the acknowledgment of which is incompatible with maintaining the belief (Habermas 1981 [1987]; see also: Geuss 1981: 26–44). Others have drawn on Susan Stebbing’s discussion of “cherished beliefs”, beliefs that are “pleasant to hold” (Stebbing 1939: 40), to characterize ideological beliefs as beliefs that are difficult to rationally revise in the light of new evidence because they encode identity-related expectations about the payout of social interactions (Stanley 2015: chap. 6). While Stanley’s account of ideology is descriptive, it bears comparison with critical concerns about group polarization and “echo chamber” effects, in which in-group signaling overrides normal processes of belief revision.

Many epistemic critiques of ideology combine these modes of fault-finding. For instance, Aytac and Rossi have argued that ideas that are not readily challenged tend to be epistemically inferior, and the self-justificatory discourses of the powerful tend to be shielded from contestation by the very power they justify (2023). Therefore, these ideologies suffer from a fault of reflective endorsement—being adhered to only because they are shielded from criticism—but they will also typically exhibit faults of both modality and scope. Similarly, if being subject to uncontrolled power incentivizes strategies of dissimulation and feigned ignorance, then the dominant will tend to form, on this basis, naturalized stereotypes about the untrustworthiness and foolishness of the dominated, beliefs which will shape the expectations of the dominant in hard-to-revise ways (Roberts 2022). These epistemic faults will likely have negative consequences for both the interest-seeking activity of the dominant and for the justice of the society in question, but the basis of the critique in both of these cases is the identification of epistemically faulty partisanship or partiality.

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Acknowledgments

For helpful conversations and feedback, the author owes a debt of gratitude to Hasana Sharp, Yves Winter, Jacob T. Levy, Paul Bowman, Alex Gourevitch, Cordelia Belton, the Research Group on Constitutional Studies, the Social Systems Reading Group, and, especially, the students in two seminars on ideology theory and critique, offered at McGill University in the Winter 2022 and Winter 2024 terms. For valuable research assistance, thanks are also due to Madison Albert, Petro Analytis, and Luc Moulaison.