Transworld Identity of Properties

Many of the questions discussed in the article, concerning the transworld identity of objects, can also be asked of properties. Do properties themselves have essential characteristics, in terms of which properties may be identified across worlds? Is the identity of a property across worlds tied to its causal or nomic role, for example? Or do properties have ‘bare’ identities?

Being an electron confers the role of repelling negatively charged entities on to its bearers (electrons). According to causal essentialism, it does so of necessity. Necessarily, any property which does not confer this causal role isn’t the property of being an electron. Moreover, according to causal essentialism, there is nothing to the identity of a property beyond conferring such powers. So if C is the total causal role in fact conferred by property F, then necessarily, G is the same property as F iff G confers the total causal role C. Shoemaker (1980) defends a thesis along these lines. presents a variant, on which a property’s essence is given by its nomic role, understood in terms of the laws of nature. Yates (2013) argues for another variant, on which ‘essence’ is understood in Finean (Fine 1994) rather than modal terms. In the context of transworld identity, these views correspond to the individual essence account for objects.

Standing against these views is quidditism, the view that properties have bare identities. On this view, there may be two possible worlds, exactly alike with respect to all their causal facts, but which differ on which properties confer which causal roles. Hildebrand (2016), Lewis (2009), and Schaffer (2005) defend versions of this view; Black (2000) argues against. Quidditism stands to transworld property identity as haecceitism stands to transworld individual identity. And, just as some have defended haecceitism without haecceities Lewis (1986), one may also defend quidditism without quiddities Locke (2012). In fact, ‘quidditism’ covers a variety of theories about property identity and property recombination Smith (2016). Curtis (2016) discusses the consequences of Lewisian quidditism.

Wang (2016) gives an overview of the debate between causal essentialists and quidditists and Wang (2019) evaluates this debate in light of what she calls the Essence-Dependence Link: that any x is dependent on whatever features in its essence.

Bibliography

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