1. The word “suggests” is used here because the interpretation of Maxwell’s remarks is controversial. For example, shortly after remarking that we have no reason to regard the potential as denoting a physical state, he describes a procedure for measuring changes in the value of the potential. Surplus interpreters such as Lange (2002: 44) usually focus on the former remarks.

2. R. Anderson (1991) and Cao (2019) examine this history in more detail.

3. For notational uniformity and simplicity, this entry will use the notation of contemporary quantum field theory throughout. This notation is explained in further detail in textbooks on quantum field theory, such as Peskin & Schroeder (1995), Schwartz (2014), and Weinberg (1996).

4. In this entry, Greek indices take values 0 through 3, and are raised and lowered with the Minkowski metric of signature \((+---)\). Equations are written using the Einstein summation convention, in which repeated indices are summed over after being raised or lowered to have different heights.

5. For more detailed examination of this history, see Martin (2003), McCoy (2022), Ryckman (2003), Scholz, (2004, 2005), and the entry on Hermann Weyl, especially §§4.1.3 and 4.5.3.

6. This observation was also made by Fock (1926) and London (1927).

7. The term was first used by Pais and Treiman (1975) to refer to the electroweak theory with four quarks (Glashow 1959; Salam & Ward 1959; Weinberg 1967). Today it includes two more quarks, six leptons, the Higgs particle, and quantum chromodynamics (Fritzsch et al. 1973).

8. Phase factors of this kind generalize in various ways. Healey (2007: §3.1.2) discusses different generalizations to Yang–Mills theory, in which a group element or complex number is assigned to each loop. A significantly different generalization considers assignments of phase factors to all spacetime curves, not just loops. These open curve phase factors are known as “Wilson lines”, and were introduced by Wilson (1974) in his study of quark confinement on the lattice.

9. See the entry on holism and nonseparability in physics for further discussion of and variations on this definition.

10. As Myrvold (2011) notes, this failure of separability is controlled, and as such it’s not obvious that it is a threat to metaphysical pictures that rely on separability.

11. For the sake of simplicity, this entry focuses on path integral quantization rather than canonical or constrained hamiltonian quantization. Rivat (forthcoming) discusses the status of gauge potentials in the former. Philosophers have especially focused on the latter in the comparison of gauge theories to general relativity (Castellani 2004; Earman 2002, 2003; Pitts 2014).

12. There remains after gauge fixing a so-called BRST symmetry, named for Becchi et al. (1976) and Tyutin (1975). Catren (2008), Dougherty (2021), Fine and Fine (1997), Guay (2008), Redhead (2002), Rickles (2008), and Weingard (1988) discuss the quantization of gauge theories in more detail.

13. This is an oversimplification (Earman 1986: Ch. IV). Nevertheless, the blatant failure of determinism in Maxwell electrodynamics is of a quantitatively different sort than the subtleties involved in the determinism of the Heaviside–Hertz theory.

14. The gauge argument is cited approvingly by Auyang (1995: Ch. 6) and criticized by H. Brown (1999), Healey (2007: §6.3), Lyre (2001), Martin (2002, 2003), and Teller (1997, 2000). Gomes et al. (2022) and Hetzroni (2021) attempt more defensible arguments in the neighborhood.

15. This section focuses on Noether’s first theorem. The relevance of Noether’s second theorem for gauge theories is discussed by Brading (2002), Brading and Brown (2003), and Gomes et al. (2022).

16. The ban on gauge anomalies also plays an important role in the derivation of the Einstein field equation in string theory (Huggett & Vistarini 2015).

17. This section focuses on spontaneous symmetry breaking in quantum field theories; for discussion of spontaneous symmetry breaking in general, see the entry on symmetry and symmetry breaking. Fraser (2012), Fraser and Koberinski (2016), Kosso (2000), and Morrison (2003) discuss the relation of the Higgs mechanism to spontaneous symmetry breaking in general.

18. The Higgs mechanism is named after Higgs (1964), and the name of the mechanism is often expanded to include reference to some combination of Englert and Brout (1964), Guralnik et al. (1964), and P. W. Anderson (1963). Brown and Cao (1991), Cao (2019), and Karaca (2013, 2014) examine the historical and philosophical context of the Higgs mechanism in more detail.