Proof of the Lemma for Hume's Principle

[Note: We use \(\epsilon F\) to denote the extension of the concept \(F\).]

Let \(P,Q\) be arbitrarily chosen concepts. We want to show:

\(\epsilon Q \in \#P \equiv Q\approx P\)

So, by definition of \(\#P\), we have to show:

\(\epsilon Q \in \epsilon P^{\approx} \equiv Q\approx P\),

where \(P^{\approx}\) was previously defined as \([\lambda x \, \exists H(x\eqclose \epsilon H \amp H\apprxclose F)]\).

We prove this by appealing to the following instance of the Law of Extensions:

Fact: \(\epsilon Q\in\epsilon P^{\approx}\equiv P^{\approx}(\epsilon Q)\)

\((\rightarrow)\) Assume \(\epsilon Q\in \epsilon P^{\approx}\) (to show: \(Q \approx P\)). Then, by the above Fact, we know \(P^{\approx}(\epsilon Q)\). So by the definition of \(P^{\approx}\):

\([\lambda x \,\exists H(x\eqclose \epsilon H\amp H\approx P)](\epsilon Q)\)

By \(\lambda\)-conversion, this implies:

\(\exists H(\epsilon Q =\epsilon H\amp H\approx P)\)

Suppose \(R\) is an arbitrary such concept:

Then by Basic Law V, the first conjunct implies \(\forall x(Qx\equiv Rx)\). Since the material equivalence of two concepts implies their equinumerosity (Fact 1, subsection on Equinumerosity, in the main part of the entry), it follows that \(Q\approx R\). So from this result and the second conjunct of (1), it follows that \(Q\approx P\), by the transitivity of equinumerosity (Fact 4 in the subsection on Equinumerosity).

\((\leftarrow)\) Assume \(Q\approx P\) (to show \(\epsilon Q\in \epsilon P^{\approx}\)). Then, by identity introduction, we know: \(\epsilon Q =\epsilon Q\amp Q\approx P\). So, by existential generalization:

\(\exists H(\epsilon Q\eqclose \epsilon H \amp H\approx P)\)

And by \(\lambda\)-Conversion:

\([\lambda x \, \exists H(x\eqclose \epsilon H \amp H\approx P)](\epsilon Q)\)

Hence, by definition, \(P^{\approx}(\epsilon Q)\). So, by the above Fact, \(\epsilon Q\in \epsilon P^{\approx}\).