The Period Between Begriffsschrift and Grundgesetze

Between the 1879 publication of Begriffsschrift and the 1893 publication of the first volume of Grundgesetze, Frege published a series of articles that showcase the evolution of his views on logic. The early essays during this period, including “Boole’s Logical Calculus and the Concept Script” (Frege 1880/1881), “Boole’s Logical Formula Language and my Concept-script” (Frege 1881), “On the Scientific Justification of a Conceptual Notation” (Frege 1882a), and “On the Aim of the ‘Conceptual Notation’” (Frege 1882b), focus in great part on comparisons between Frege’s logic and the competing systems proposed by George Boole (1815–1864) and his followers, but nevertheless contain a number of insights that are relevant (see the early sections of the entry on the algebra of logic tradition for more details on Boole’s program). In addition, Die Grundlagen der Arithmetik (The Foundations of Arithmetic), while more philosophical than technical, also includes hints at Frege’s changing views on logic. Notable among these is the third of his “Fundamental Principles” which is phrased in terms of the concept/object distinction, rather than in terms of the earlier function/argument distinction:

Never to lose sight of the distinction between concept and object. (Frege 1884: Introduction)

Nevertheless, there are three articles produced later in this period that display profound changes in the way in which Frege understood his logic, and on the way that he further developed it.

This supplemental essay is not the place to attempt full explications or analyses of these essays, which are important and interesting in their own right. Instead, we will merely highlight those aspects of the works in question that are of critical importance for understanding the differences between the logic of Begriffsschrift and the logic of Grundgesetze.

The first of these essays is “Funktion und Begriff”, or “Function and Concept” (Frege 1891). Although this essay has not received the attention that “On Sense and Reference” has, it is for the purpose of understanding the changes made to the logic between Begriffsschrift and Grundgesetze by far the most important of Frege’s writings (other than Begriffsschrift and Grundgesetze themselves). Frege introduces the essay as follows;

Rather a long time ago I had the honour of addressing this Society about the symbolic system that I entitled Begriffsschrift. Today I should like to throw light upon the subject from another side, and tell you about some supplementations and new conceptions, whose necessity has occurred to me since then. There can here be no question of setting forth my Begriffsschrift in its entirety, but only of elucidating some fundamental ideas. (Frege 1891: 130–131)

The list of supplementations and new conceptions addressed in “Function and Concept” include:

• The distinction between sense and reference (Sinn and Bedeutung).
• The claim that sentences refer to truth values (and hence truth values are objects in the domain).
• The idea that functions differ from objects in being unsaturated, and hence in need of completion by appropriate arguments.
• The sharp type distinctions between object, first-level function (taking objects as argument), second-level function (taking first-level function as argument), and third-level functions (taking second-level functions as argument).
• The argument for the claim that functions must be defined on all arguments (of the appropriate type).
• The claim that functions can only be saturated by a single type of argument (i.e., if a unary function can take objects as argument, then it cannot also take functions—of any level—as argument).
• The analysis of concepts as unary functions whose range is the True and the False, and of relations as binary functions whose range is the True and the False.
• The characterization of the horizontal, the negation stroke, and the concavity as concepts (i.e., unary functions from arguments to truth-values), and of the conditional stroke as a binary relation (i.e., a binary function from objects to truth values).
• The first appearance of the notorious Basic Law V.

Each of these innovations plays a significant role in the new and improved logic presented in Grundgesetze.

The sense/reference distinction is more fully developed and explored in the second essay,“Über Sinn und Bedeutung”, or “On Sense and Reference”, (Frege 1892a). Although the discussion is extremely wide-ranging, there are two aspects of this essay that are particularly important with respect to understanding Frege’s logic. The first is that the sense/reference distinction allows Frege to solve the puzzle that led to his rather idiosynchratic account of identity in Begriffsschrift. Once Frege has replaced the notion of conceptual content with the paired notions of sense and reference, he is free to treat identity claims (now represented in the logic using “=”) as indicating sameness of reference, while explaining the difference in content between “\(a = a\)” and “\(a = b\)” in terms of the different senses of the claims in question. Second, this essay contains Frege’s argument for the claim that sentences refer to truth values (a claim which was made, but not really argued for, in “Function and Concept”). As a final historical note, it is worth observing that the sense/reference distinction was not novel to Frege. A similar distinction was proposed by Constance Jones (1890; for more details on Jones, see the entry on Emily Elizabeth Constance Jones).

Finally, in “Über Begriff und Gegenstand”, or “Concept and Object” (Frege 1892b), Frege further develops the distinction between function (and hence concept) and object given in “Function and Concept”, and defends the view from objections due to Bruno Kerry. The most controversial aspect of this essay is Frege’s argument that expressions of the form “the …” always refer to objects. Hence, the phrase “the concept Horse” must refer, not to the concept itself (which, being unsaturated, cannot be an object), but rather to some object-level surrogate for that concept (most commentators have concluded that these surrogates are the value-ranges introduced by Basic Law V). This aspect of Frege’s thought is important for understanding the way in which he formulates definitions within Grundgesetze, where, when one might expect him to formulate a definition in terms of, for example, a second-level concept holding of first-level concepts, he instead defines a first-level concept holding of the value-ranges of the concepts in question.