1. This section draws on Haslanger 2005.

2. Like Hacking, we use the terms ‘idea’ and ‘concept’ without making precise distinctions between them for the purposes of our discussion. In contrast to concepts, ideas are often propositional, and plausibly more specific to the individual.

3. Though this is not to say that the construction of artifacts is not of interest and without its own puzzles: see the entry on Artifacts.

4. Feminist metaphysics has generally drawn a distinction between sex and gender, with sex being an anatomical distinction based on locally salient sexual/reproductive differences, and gender being a distinction between the social/political positions of those with bodies marked as of different sexes. However, some feminists have challenged the claim that sex and gender can be distinguished in this way, see e.g., Antony 1998; Ásta 2011; Butler 1999; Gatens 1996; Grosz 1994; and Prokhovnik 1999. For a powerful defence of the sex/gender distinction, see Plumwood 1989. The relationship between gender identity and gender in this social sense is also up for debate, with a variety of positions available – for discussion see Jenkins 2016, 2018, 2023; Cosker-Rowland 2023, forthcoming; and Cull 2024.

5. To list just a few examples: Scott 1986; MacKinnon 1989; Alcoff 2006; Witt 2011a,b; Haslanger 2012;Ásta 2018; Appiah 1996; Zack 2002; Warnke 2008 Butler 1990, 1993; Fausto-Sterling 2000; Wittig 1992; and Lugones 2007.

6. We can see a precursor of this sort of argument in some earlier texts of feminist philosophy, not least John Stuart Mill’s “On the Subjection of Women” (Mill 1869/1994) and Harriet Taylor Mill’s “The Enfranchisement of Women” (Taylor Mill 1851/1994).

7. C.f., Val Plumwood:

“it is not essential to the distinction that it treat sex as totally ‘given’, not subject to any change, whereas gender is treated as totally open to change. Rather, both can be treated as subject to some change, and the distinction made in terms of the kinds of change or interventions that are relevant. Changing someone’s sex usually does seem to be a different sort of matter to, and involve quite different kinds of changes, from changing their gender... the facts of biological sex may be easier to change than those of gender.” (Plumwood 1989, 5).

8. Methodologically of course, there’s nothing to stop one using aesthetic, pragmatic, or other values to guide one’s concept design and choice here; Otto Neurath, for instance, seems to have placed a particular emphasis on pragmatic values in concept choice (see Carnap 1963, 51, Cull 2020n11). However, for obvious reasons feminists have tended to focus on moral, political, and epistemic values.

9. Whilst Haslanger’s work led to the re-invigoration of this field in the 21st century, the sorts of things that now get called ‘conceptual engineering’ have a long history. Liam Bright and Rose Novick, for instance, have pointed out the role this methodology played in Confucian philosophy (Bright and Novick 2018). It is also clear that something like this methodology was endorsed by certain members of the Vienna Circle, especially Carnap (see Dutilh Novaes 2020 for a comparison of Carnap and Haslanger). Moreover, Matthew J. Cull has argued that we also see conceptual engineering in the 20th century US Black feminist tradition, especially in the work of Audre Lorde and Patricia Hill Collins (Cull 2021). In the philosophy of disability, Cull and Elizabeth Amber Cantalamessa have likewise argued that we can see the development of the social model of disability as a form of conceptual engineering (Cantalamessa 2019; Cull 2020).

10. One might wonder whether ameliorative inquiry of this type counts as feminist metaphysics. After all, in its concern with modifying our concepts and language, one might suggest that conceptual engineering is better construed as a branch of philosophy of language or feminist philosophy of mind. However, feminist conceptual engineers have been keen to argue that they see their work as not merely interested in modifying our concepts. Rather, they largely see the modification of our concepts as a practical tool in the construction of new social realities (Cull 2024 Ch.s 2–3), or as a way of providing better tools for understanding and critiquing extant social reality (Haslanger 2012). Supposing that one grants that social reality is a topic that falls under the purview of metaphysics (see the section on metametaphysics below) then it looks like we ought to grant that the sorts of ameliorative inquiry undertaken by feminists can count not just exercises in the philosophy of language and mind, but also as metaphysics, at least insofar as it concerns studying and reshaping our concepts of gender, race, sexism, and so forth. See also the entry on Feminist Philosophy of Language.

11.This section draws on Jenkins 2023.

12. Various normative questions are also raised by the idea of injustice, but these will not be explored in this entry.

13. Although Ritchie’s account is primarily situated with regard to general debates in social ontology about the nature of social groups, it is part of the conversation in feminist metaphysics about the nature of social structures, and uses gender categories as a primary example. It thus illustrates well the difficulty of demarcating specifically feminist investigations into social metaphysics from social metaphysics in general, given the reach and influence of feminist interventions in social metaphysics and the broader relevance of many of the concepts that have occupied feminist metaphysicians in relation to sexist injustices.

14. Young’s article exemplifies the feminist opposition to dualisms discussed below. For Young, the phenomenology of pregnant embodiment undermines any putative dualism between within and outside the body.

15.That until recently there was no work in metaphysics on this topic might be construed as male bias in the discipline. After all, the overwhelming majority of those who get pregnant and give birth are women, and not seeing this as an important area for metaphysical investigation is precisely the kind of bias that one might expect from a discipline that systematically fails to engage with the experiences of women. An important feminist aspect of this new field in metaphysics is precisely that it asks us to attend to this overlooked aspect of reality.

16. de Beauvoir also anticipates later developments in the metaphysics of pregnancy when she writes, “She experiences [pregnancy] both as an enrichment and a mutilation; the foetus is part of her body and it is a parasite exploiting her; she possesses it and she is possessed by it” (Beauvoir 1949/2011, 551). Of course there is an ambivalence here: de Beauvoir is hardly making a straightforward endorsement of a Kingma-style parthood model of pregnancy!

17. Another relatively underdeveloped area of research is the metaphysics of birth. Presumably tightly related to the metaphysics of pregnancy, feminists have yet to fully engage with the (putative) shift in metaphysical relations that happens in birth (save occasional pregnant—pun intended—remarks such as those in Nelson 2015). This lacuna is mirrored in the broader literature on personal identity, where even fission cases are not generally explored through the case of pregnancy and birth, the significance of birth is rarely explored beyond as a potential starting point for the individual, and the person who gives birth to this individual is generally absent entirely (see the entry on Personal Identity).

18. By “intrinsic property” we mean, following standard usage, a property that an object has “simply in virtue of itself.” In more picturesque but somewhat misleading terms, it is a property that an object could have if it existed in a world all by itself. Note that intrinsic properties may be accidental, e.g., a person’s current body temperature is an intrinsic property of them, but is not essential.

19. Notably, some analytic feminists have resisted this broadly anti-individualist methodological trend. See e.g., Saul’s (2024) remarks on Louise Anthony (2022).

20. Haslanger has characterised this view as follows: Social/Political Race (SPR): A group G is racialized relative to context C iff_df members of G are (all and only) those,

(i) who are observed or imagined to have certain bodily features presumed in C to be evidence of ancestral links to a certain geographical region
(or regions)—call this “color”;

(ii) whose having (or being imagined to have) these features marks them within the context of the background ideology in C as appropriately occupying certain kinds of social position that are in fact either subordinate or privileged (and so motivates and justifies their occupying such a position); and

(iii) whose satisfying (i) and (ii) plays (or would play) a role in their systematic subordination or privilege in C, that is, who are along some dimension systematically subordinated or privileged when in C, and satisfying (i) and (ii) plays (or would play) a role in that dimension of privilege or subordination. (Haslanger 2019, 25–6).

The debate in the metaphysics of race is a deep and interesting one. See Glasgow et al 2019, the entry on Critical Philosophy of Race, and the entry on Race.

21. An important theme in feminist metaphysics is how to understand women as an analytic category without over-generalizing about all women based on a small sample of women in the dominant group. This is one form of the problem of “essentialism”. See, e.g., hooks 1981; Spelman 1988; Young 1994.

22. Plumwood is keen to insist that not all distinctions and dichotomies are dualisms. Indeed, she thinks that without the ability to make distinctions and draw dichotomies, thought would be impoverished, or perhaps entirely impossible! Instead, she writes that it is precisely the cultural investment of certain distinctions and dichotomies with assumptions to do with unchanging hierarchy and domination that makes them dualisms (Plumwood 1993a, 445–453).

23. Claims to neutrality tend to make feminists suspicious, and for good reason: defenders of patriarchy often attempt to present it as neutral and natural when it is in fact political and constructed (recall the discussion of the debunking project above). Following this habit of suspicion, one might ask whether there is something fishy about these claims of neutrality in metaphysics. Perhaps when metaphysicians characterise themselves as dispassionate and apolitical observers of fundamental reality, this is really self-deception: that much of their work is suffused with white cisheteropatriarchal ideology, disguised as a faux-neutrality. C.f., Anat Matar’s remarks on what gets taken to be common sense or self-evident: “the clear, the self-evident and the trivial are all bulwarks of a ruling ideology. There it stands, clear, self-evident, and trivial: power is held in its hand, and any sceptical questions about its role are ruled out of the discourse” (Matar 2022, 26–27).

24. Whilst we focus on Schaffer, he is not the only metametaphysician vulnerable to the kinds of challenge presented by Mikkola and Barnes. Mikkola also produces challenges for the metametaphysical pictures provided by Louis deRosset and Karen Bennett (Mikkola 2015, deRosset 2013, Bennett 2011) whilst Barnes extends her worries to Ted Sider’s account of metaphysics as limming the fundamental structure of the world and Cian Dorr’s account of so-called ‘ontologese’ (Barnes 2014, 2017, Dorr 2005).

25. A similar retraction from a pure focus on the fundamental occurs in Sider 2017. See also Bennett 2017, 233–234.

26. This gives up on asymmetry, one of the three putative definitional structural features of grounding relations (the others being irreflexivity and transitivity) hence this is quite a radical departure from mainstream accounts of the grounding relation. It is moreover an unusual departure: those rejecting certain aspects of the traditional account of grounding usually object to irreflexivity and transitivity (see Raven 2013, though see e.g., Thompson 2016 for an exploration of symmetric grounding).

27. And a difficult task at that. In one of the first books of metametaphysics published following Mikkola and Barnes’s interventions, and impressed by the sheer variety of phenomena studied by the contemporary metaphysician, Karen Bennett suggests that an imprecise and disjunctive account of metaphysics as a discipline may be the best that we can do (Bennett 2017, 234–235). Meanwhile, Asya Passinsky has argued that Kit Fine’s metametaphysics is well placed to make sense of feminist metaphysics (Passinsky 2021, Fine 2017), and Esa Díaz-León and Matthew J. Cull have argued for feminist uses of deflationary metametaphysics drawing on Amie Thomasson and Rudolf Carnap respectively (Díaz-León n.d.; Cull n.d.). For another recent and explicitly feminist attempt to provide a metametaphysics, see McKitrick 2018.