Feminist Philosophy of Law

First published Wed Mar 5, 2025

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Leslie Francis replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous authors.]

Feminist philosophy of law identifies the pervasive influence of sex and gender, gendered norms, sexism, misogyny, and patriarchal structures on theories of law, legal institutions, legal actors, and people affected by law. It addresses how problematic assumptions about sex and gender underlie answers to conceptual questions about the nature of law and legal systems, such as whether law should be understood as the command of the sovereign, as an interconnected system of rules, as convention, or as inextricably linked to morality. It applies feminist lenses to basic values realized through law, such as freedom or equality. Feminists engage with normative theorizing about what law and legal systems should do, such as whether law should be limited to protecting people from harm from others, or extend to enforcing morality or guarding people from self-harm. Feminists take many different positions about whether the Millian “harm principle” should apply to limit interventions by law to situations in which people put others at risk of harm. Feminist legal philosophers also demonstrate the myriad effects of patriarchy on the material conditions of cisgender women and men, people who are nonbinary, and transgender people. Practically, feminists identify and develop legal reforms to correct gender injustice, exploitation, abuse, or repression.

Feminist legal philosophy is inherently interdisciplinary and appears in philosophy journals and monographs, journals in gender studies and feminism, generalist law reviews, and the many specialist law journals devoted to issues of gender and justice. The journal Feminist Legal Studies began publishing in 1993 and is notably international in its reach. The field is also contextual and practical, responding to existing legal structures and legal developments such as the US Supreme Court’s reversal of protection for reproductive choice as a federal constitutional right in 2022 (Dobbs v. Jackson Women’s Health Organization). The discussion in this article is primarily drawn from Anglo-American legal theory; however, continental feminist theorists have made important contributions to the field as well.

Feminism itself does not speak with a single voice. Liberal and neoliberal, pragmatist, relational, cultural, difference, dominance, radical, socialist, Marxist, postcolonial, transnational, postmodern, intersectional, along with other newly developing approaches to feminism provide contrasting contributions to feminist legal philosophy and take different approaches to concrete legal issues such as domestic violence or pornography.

Methodologically, feminist philosophy of law draws from feminist work in other areas of philosophy. Accounts of epistemic injustice (Fricker 2007) and the social nature of knowledge including standpoint theory (Wylie 2003) are especially salient to many questions about and within law. Trials, after all, depend on testimony. Work in relational metaphysics has revealed how legal institutions can and should instantiate connections among people, including care relationships, while rejecting essentialist assumptions about women as caregivers (Herring 2019; Nedelsky 2012; McClain 2006. As practical and contextual, feminist legal theory engages with debates about non-ideal theory (Valentini 2012; Stemplowska 2016).

Feminism’s approaches to law reform have been characterized as coming in historical waves (Dixon 2008; Chamallas 2010; Gruber 2013) although these characterizations are rough at best (Mayeri 2023). They also omit references to important earlier feminist thinkers relevant to law and human rights, such as Mary Wollstonecraft, author of A Vindication of the Rights of Woman; Catherine Cockburn, a theorist of natural law; and Mary Astell, a defender of equal moral worth. Nineteenth and early twentieth century feminism pursued basic political and legal rights, such as rights to vote, own property, and enter into contracts. Liberal feminism of the 1960s and 1970s sought to dismantle legal barriers and implement non-discrimination in social and economic life. In the 1980s, difference feminists pursued further reforms aimed to enable people to remain in the work force despite childbearing, parenting, or caring for elderly parents. During the same period, dominance feminists urged legal action against pornography, sexual harassment, and rape. Later wave voices in the 1990s and after brought intersectional, transnational, queer, and postmodern theories into the analysis of reform, arguing that apparently progressive policies such as mandatory prosecution of alleged domestic violence offenses have failed to benefit women in poverty, women of color, and immigrant women while increasing political support for the carceral state (Dixon 2008; Dempsey 2009; Goodmark 2018; Gruber 2020, 2023a, 2023b). Intersectionality theorizes how locations in multiple socially constructed categories such as gender, race, class, or disability create interlocking axes of privilege or disadvantage (Jones 2014; Crenshaw 2012; Haslanger 2012).

Despite these differences, some themes are common in feminist philosophy of law. Normative assumptions include the equal moral worth of all human beings (and perhaps of some non-human animals as well) and the entitlement to treatment on an equal basis under law. Equal treatment is understood as requiring more than the formalism of “treat like cases alike”. Feminist philosophers of law also share certain basic criticisms of traditional views of the nature of law and legal reasoning, of patriarchy as reflected in structural injustice and in law, and of the problems people have in securing equal justice under law (MacKinnon 1993). They are attuned to the ways in which social power and misogyny have shaped and are shaped by legal systems and how these interactions affect possibilities for reform (Manne 2018; Suk 2023).

This entry begins with a brief overview of fundamental themes of feminist legal theory, followed by discussion of the evolution of views about needed institutional changes in selected substantive areas of law: political equality, marriage, reproduction, pornography and prostitution, domestic violence and rape, and economic and social equality.

1. Fundamental Themes in Feminist Legal Philosophy

1.1 Conceptualizing law

Historically, philosophers of law have debated answers to interrelated questions about the nature of law and legal systems, the meaning of the rule of law, and relationships between law and morality. On one side, natural law theorists hold that law and morality bear conceptual connections to one another: that meeting some kind of moral standard is either necessary or sufficient for a rule or principle being law. For these theorists, laws are normatively imbued, thus presenting reasons for action, perhaps even moral reasons for action. On the other side, legal positivists posit law as social fact such as command or accepted rule. For positivists such as H.L.A. Hart, legal and moral normativity differ; whether a norm is a law and whether it is just or unjust are separate questions. Contemporary forms of the debates between natural law and legal positivism emerged in the aftermath of World War II when defendants at Nuremberg on trial for crimes against humanity invoked the defense that they were following the German law in force at the time. These debates have continued over whether there are legal obligations in unjust societies such as apartheid South Africa, whether war crimes or crimes against humanity can be enforced by international tribunals, and whether the law should reach into domains of personal life such as family formation or reproduction.

For the most part, feminist legal theorists have not engaged directly in the debates between natural law theory and legal positivism about the nature and scope of law. However, developments in feminist metaphysics such as Haslanger’s view (2012) that metaphysical questions should be addressed as projects in ameliorative justice suggest considering how conceptions of law undergird patriarchy and could be corrected. For example, the positivist separation of law from morality might enable clearer identification of when masculinist norms are implicit in interpretations of liberty protected under the due process clause of the US Constitution (Siegel 2023; Francis 2017).

1.2 The Rule of Law

The rule of law is an ideal of political morality under which communities should be governed by norms that are general, clear, public, prospective, stable, and implemented consistently. The rule of law has been identified with the neoliberalism of Friedrich Hayek, the “internal morality of law” of the natural law theorist Lon Fuller, or the interpretivist view of Ronald Dworkin. The coherence of any particular legal system can always be challenged, but on this approach an aspiration of any legal system is coherence. And (at a minimum) the appearance or illusion of coherence is maintained by requirements such as following precedent, treating like cases alike, and maintaining judicial impartiality.

Although the rule of law contrasts favorably with the exercise of unconstrained power by people who are not themselves subject to law (see Dyzenhaus 2016), feminists have been critical of the conservatism inherent in much rule of law theory. Feminist critics point out that conceptualizing the rule of law in terms of coherence and consistency may reinforce and legitimate existing power relationships (Scales 2006; MacKinnon 1989). Indeed, one primary purpose of law as traditionally understood is to promote stability and order by reinforcing adherence to predominant norms, representing them not only as the official values of a society, but even as universal, natural, and objective. From these observations, feminist philosophers of law have concluded that law makes systemic bias invisible, normal, entrenched, and thus difficult to identify and to oppose, not only by legal actors such as judges but also by law’s victims and beneficiaries (Minow 1990; Rhode 1989; MacKinnon 1989).

1.3. Judicial Decision Making and Originalism

As the legal actors charged with interpreting and applying law, judges play a central role in how the rule of law functions. What it means for judges to apply law is deeply contested, reaching back to fundamental metaphysical assumptions about what law is. Legal positivists such as H.L.A. Hart argue both that the law should not enforce morality and that there are hard cases that existing law is insufficient to resolve; when law is thus limited, judges function as legislators making new law. Natural law theorists contend to the contrary that moral principles are part of the law to be called on by judges. Critics point to the unacknowledged incorporation of conservative values into legal interpretation (Hanson 1992).

Originalism is the view that constitutions or laws should be interpreted in terms of their meaning at the time they were enacted. Originalism’s proponents contend that it constrains judges from reading their own values into law (e.g., Baude 2015). Feminist critics argue that originalism continues to entrench patriarchal values (Case 2014). Originalism as found in Dobbs, writes feminist legal theorist Reva Siegel (2023: 1128), “locate[s] constitutional authority in imagined communities of the past—entrenching norms, traditions, and modes of life associated with old status hierarchies”.

1.4 Equality and Difference

Feminists take different approaches to articulating and implementing requirements of equality. For liberal feminists, a primary task is achieving the principle of procedural equality that like cases should be treated alike and different cases differently in proportion to their differences. But procedural equality lacks specification of what makes cases relevantly similar. Here, the difference between biological sex and gender identity has loomed increasingly significant in legal disputes. One area of controversy concerns transition and the role of bodily interventions such as puberty blockers, hormonal treatment, or genital surgeries. In most countries of the European Union, surgery is not required for gender transition to be judged to be complete; a ruling of the Czech constitutional court in May 2024 reached the same conclusion (Reuters 2024) Controversy also attends whether categorizations such as in sports should be based on attributes of biology, themselves disputed, or on gender identity, as well as how the law should respond. In 2021, the International Olympic Committee issued a framework of fairness and inclusion for gender identity and sex variations that left ultimate eligibility judgments based on evidence of disproportionate advantage up to the international bodies governing the various sports (IOC 2021). Caster Semenya, a female athlete diagnosed with the disorder of sex development 5α-Reductase 2 deficiency, challenged a World Athletics requirement that she reduce her testosterone levels in order to continue competing as a female. In 2023, the European Court of Human Rights ruled the requirement had not been sufficiently reviewed by the relevant Swiss court, Semenya v. Switzerland. In November, 2023, the case was referred for review by the ECHR’s Grand Chamber; no decision had been issued as of the start of 2025.

“Difference” feminists (e.g., Minow 1990) argue that equality requires taking physical, historical, social, and other significant differences into account in developing policy. One challenge for these feminists is whether and how to acknowledge differences without entrenching stereotypes, reinforcing detrimental customs, or promoting sexist socialization. Another challenge is that recognition of difference may warrant change that in turn incurs backlash. “Dilemmas of difference” (Minow 1990) occur when taking a difference into account seems to be required for equality—otherwise, women will face disadvantages that men do not—but also seems to critics to instantiate inequality by giving women benefits such as time off for pregnancy and birth that men do not have (or at least do not have under policies that grant parental leave based on status as giving birth). Minow would dissolve the dilemma with the recognition that the appearance of inequality rests on unstated norms about the status quo that disadvantage women, such as the lack of paid family leave. Of note, according to the Organization for Economic Cooperation and Development (OECD) Family Database (OECD 2024), the United States is the only member nation offering no paid family leave. Sophia Moreau (2020) argues that the unequal effects of such norms may constitute indirect discrimination against women.

Historically, feminists contend, differences based on sex were greatly exaggerated, as was their significance and the extent to which they could be attributed to biology rather than being socially constructed. Yet in the view of many feminists, the impact of pregnancy continues to be wrongly set aside, especially in the United States. In a single sentence in Dobbs, for example, Justice Alito dismissed the idea that protecting choices about pregnancy could be required as a matter of equality based on sex, reasoning that the lack of access to abortion would not have a differential impact on women because it would only affect people based on whether they could get pregnant. One US feminist commentator has called this reasoning, along with other decisions of the Court about gun rights and religious liberty, as a “jurisprudence of masculinity” that

evinces a striking solicitude for constitutional rights that are associated with men and masculinity while exhibiting disdain for and disinterest in rights that traditionally have been associated with women. (Murray 2023: 800)

Relatedly, many feminists contend today that debates about legal recognition of gender identity mistakenly essentialize sex. These feminists are critical of how law constructs and maintains gender binaries by using “sex assigned at birth” as “legal sex” in areas from segregated housing in prisons to prohibitions of gender affirming therapy (Bell 2016). Feminists have argued that cis-women-protective laws such as those excluding transwomen from women’s sports or bathrooms reenact gender-protective hierarchies of the nineteenth century (McNamarah 2023). A 2020 decision of the US Supreme Court holding that discrimination because of sex in employment includes discrimination based on sexual orientation or gender identity, Bostock v. Clayton County, has drawn both high praise from feminists for its substance and criticism from conservatives for its alleged departure from originalism. In the European Union, Article 21 of the Charter of Fundamental Rights prohibits discrimination based on sexual orientation and Directive 2000/78/EC directs implementation of this prohibition in the laws of member nations.

1.5 Reasonableness in Law

Legal standards of reasonableness are another area where feminist philosophers excavate male norms at work. From criminal law (would a reasonable person believe that the threat of harm was sufficient to require the use of force in self-defense?) to tort law (did the defendant exercise reasonable care?) to contract law (what are reasonable commercial standards of fair dealing?) to employment discrimination (was she reasonably offended by the conduct of others at work?), reasonableness standards are ubiquitous in law. Traditionally, the overtly gendered standard was that of the average reasonable man.

Today, although the standard is a “reasonable person”, it continues to reflect male norms. Social justice tort theorists, for example, show how damage remedies reinforce material disparities in society that disproportionately affect women such as depressed wages or reduced life expectancies (Chamallas 2021). Other feminist tort theorists widen the lens of harm to include technological and environmental harms (Richardson & Rackley 2012). Contract law scholars demonstrate how models of freedom to bargain infect judgments about deals that are legally enforceable and remedies for breach (Threedy 2010). Feminist critics of supposed divisions between reason and emotion have questioned too-ready willingness to reject emotions in supposedly non-gendered contexts such as rules of evidence and a too-ready acceptance of emotion in contexts where women are stereotyped and disadvantaged.

1.6 Public and Private

Whether distinctions can or should be drawn between the private and the public is another set of themes in feminist philosophy of law. Liberals, including liberal feminists, believe that a domain of private life should be delineated and reserved for individual choice. The line between the public and the private is related to, but not the same as, the line drawn by liberal defenders of the harm principle between actions that affect only individuals themselves and actions that harm others. Liberal theorists may object to intrusions by law into both private life and self-regarding actions; but distinguishing between the private and the self-regarding leaves open the possibility that harm from one person to another may occur within the private sphere.

This “private sphere” can be understood spatially, most likely as the home. Protecting private space from intrusion is judged to be crucial to the development of the person and to the creation and flourishing of intimate relationships. Radical and dominance feminists point out in contrast that the home itself may not be a refuge. Domestic violence can reign invisible and unchecked in the privacy of the home. However, intersectional feminists observe that both liberal and dominance feminists risk making unwarranted generalizations about the impact of intrusions. Far from being protective, police searches or welfare checks are especially threatening for poor women or women of color, who may face investigations for child abuse or police invasions such as resulted in the death of Breonna Taylor or Charleena Lyles (Chang, Cooper, & Rolnick 2021).

Privacy also can be understood as a range of personal choices that should be left to the individual without state intrusion. These choices crucially include family structure, reproduction, or sexuality. Abortion and marriage equality have been flashpoints for discussion of the meaning and importance of privacy.

2. Feminist legal criticism and legal reform

Much feminist legal scholarship is devoted to criticism of existing legal institutions and development of needed reforms. This section highlights some areas of greatest controversy, especially about political and economic circumstances and about liberalism and sexuality. The issues range from assuring political equality, to considering the extent to which neoliberal models should govern choices that entrench patriarchal values, to re-evaluating the role of state coercion in addressing harassment and violence, to reconsidering models of economic equality. These areas continue to be subjects of controversy, especially among liberal feminists, radical feminists, and theorists of intersectionality.

2.1 Human Rights, Citizenship, and Political Equality

International recognition of human rights has been particularly important as a means to achieve equal citizenship and political rights for women across the globe. Adopted by the U.N. General Assembly in 1966, the International Covenant on Civil and Political Rights (ICCPR) commits all states parties to ensure the equal right of men and women to the enjoyment of civil and political rights. Extending rights protection beyond civil and political rights are other international instruments such as the United Nations Convention on the Elimination of All Forms of Discrimination Against Women (CEDAW) which entered into force in 1981. In addition to CEDAW, the Palermo Protocol supplement to the Convention against Transnational Organized Crime directly addresses sex and labor trafficking. The U.N. Convention on the Rights of the Child, entering into force in 1990, directs particular attention to protecting children and families in difficult social conditions. The 1993 Declaration on the Elimination of Violence Against Women was a resolution of the U.N. General Assembly to strengthen implementation of CEDAW by committing states to condemn physical, sexual, and psychological violence against women. These international agreements have been bolstered by the work of international groups, both NGOs and government-sponsored (see, e.g., the links in the other Internet Resources to Center for Reproductive Rights, Futures without Violence, Gendercide Watch, Human Rights Watch, National Network to End Domestic Violence, Wild for Human Rights, and WomenWatch).

The cumulative result of these efforts has been to commit states across the globe to human rights and their realization. Only seven nations, including Iran, Sudan, Somalia, and the United States have not ratified CEDAW. The Convention on the Rights of the Child has been ratified by all nations except Somalia and the United States. The United States has not ratified treaties that protect social or economic rights, although it has committed not to undermine their efficacy; among the treaties listed here, the United States has only ratified the ICCPR.

While feminists hail moves to further equality in international law, critical feminists charge that in many societies commitments to human rights are shallow. Adoption of human rights instruments may mask the continued flourishing of patriarchal domestic laws (Engle 2005; Otto 2005). In some cultures, women are still not equal citizens. Some are unable to vote, hold office, attend school, engage in business, or move about freely. Some do not control their own reproductive lives, access by others to their bodies, their pursuit of education, or the opportunity for any life ambition other than marriage that may have been arranged for them. The return of the Taliban to power in Afghanistan in 2021 served as a stark reminder of the fragile progress made by women in many societies.

The emphasis on rights as a means to address oppression also has been questioned. Scholars point out that human rights tend to emphasize issues in the public sphere, leaving untouched traditional forms of silencing in private life (Crépin 2020). On the other hand, liberals defending the importance of rights to victims of oppression are joined by critical race theorists such as Patricia Williams (1991) who point out the central role of rights in overcoming histories of discrimination and racism.

Moreover, achievement of rights to equal citizenship leaves open whether equality requires more. An initial liberal feminist approach was to challenge overt legal restrictions on women or different treatment of women and men (Taub & Williams 1993; Smith 1993; Bartlett & Kennedy 1991). For example, in the US feminist lawyers following the lead of later-Justice Ruth Bader Ginsburg argued successfully that statutes treating women differently for estate administration or age of majority violated constitutional equal protection, Reed v. Reed (404 US 71 (1971)). US feminists, however, did not succeed in passing the Equal Rights Amendment (ERA) to the Constitution to put sex discrimination on the same legal footing as race discrimination. The ERA foundered on assertions that differences matter to issues as diverse as military service, child support, or bathroom use (Mayeri 2011; Frug 1992). These issues motivated conservative opposition, but feminists emphasizing class differences and labor rights also were concerned that hard-won benefits for women could be jeopardized. Critical race theorists argued that formal equality for women failed to understand the complex intersectionality of discrimination against women of color (Mayeri 2011). Critics of patriarchy insisted that histories of discrimination were central to understanding the functioning of male norms in social institutions from the family to employment to political structures.

Across the globe, there are similar debates about what more is required beyond formal equality of citizenship. CEDAW’s (1979) requirement for the elimination of “all forms” of discrimination against women has been a framework for these debates. These debates are complicated, moreover, by judgments that ways of understanding human rights norms may incorporate so-called western values and are incompatible with legitimate cultural differences. Whether and how theories of rights can accommodate cultural differences has been given considerable attention by feminist political philosophers (Mookherjee 2009; Ackerly 2008) and is centrally relevant to the understanding of international human rights norms and their role in law.

Beyond equal citizenship, feminist jurisprudence also criticizes legal or political structures that would put disproportionate burdens on women or children seeking to live or to become citizens in countries other than their country of origin. Here, feminists demonstrate how asylum or refugee policies may be based on male models of what constitutes persecution, discounting forms of structural injustice that disproportionately affect women (e.g., Parekh 2012; J. Freedman 2008).

2.2 Marriage

Nowhere than in marriage is the legal bias towards the status quo more apparent, yet many jurisdictions across the globe now recognize same sex marriage. Since Denmark first instantiated legal rights for same sex partnerships in 1989 and the Netherlands legalized same-sex marriages in 2001, thirty-six countries have implemented full marriage equality. The United States became a part of this group in 2015, Obergefell v. Hodges, 576 US 644 (2015). The Human Rights Campaign maintains an updated interactive map listing the status of marriage equality around the world. Recognition of marriage equality, however, is not the same as recognition of equality in other respects. In many US jurisdictions, for example, legal protection for marriage equality does not extend to protection against adverse decisions by employers, evictions, or refusals of service by other private actors, 303 Creative LLC v. Elenis, 600 U.S. __ (2023).

Support for marriage equality has been criticized by feminists who argue that marriage itself is a fundamentally inegalitarian institution. Critics urge that marriage itself must be rethought if gendered inequalities are to be overcome (Brake 2012). Valorizing marriage also potentially harms those whose relationships take other, less valued forms, such as asexual relationships, polyamorous relationships, or care networks (Brake 2012). People in these other relationship structures will not have the advantage of legal entitlements such as retirement income or child custody if they are dependent on marriage.

2.3 Reproductive Rights: contraception, abortion, infertility, and the ability to raise children in safe and healthy environments

Access to contraception is critical for people to control their reproductive lives. According to a United Nations report issued in 2020 (United Nations 2020), just under half of women of reproductive age across the globe were using some form of contraception. Yet access varied significantly by region, with only 29% of women in sub-Saharan Africa using some form of contraception. Cultural norms, religious objections, costs, and myths about safety are primary barriers to increased contraceptive use. In countries without universal access to health care, such as the United States, cost may be a barrier to contraceptive use. Feminists point out that the burdens of contraception and contraceptive failure fall primarily on women and that there is need for increased support for male involvement in family planning as well as for the development of effective contraception for men.

According to the Center for Reproductive Rights (CRR Abortion Laws 2025), countries around the globe take very different views about protection for abortion rights. In Mexico, the Supreme Court recognized a constitutional right to abortion in 2021; individual states in that federalist system continue to revise their laws to comply with this ruling. Elsewhere in Latin America, Columbia and Argentina recognize abortion rights, while Honduras and Nicaragua prohibit abortion entirely and Brazil and Chile permit it only to save the mother’s life. In most of Europe (except Poland), Canada, Australia, and South Africa, abortion is widely permitted, whereas in much of the rest of Africa it is not.

In the United States, the Dobbs rejection of constitutional protection for reproductive choice removed legal barriers to patriarchal state interference in private reproductive choices. With Dobbs, the US moved in a direction contrary to the trend in countries as varied as Argentina, Thailand, Mexico, or Colombia that have liberalized abortion laws. As of 2023, the US abortion landscape was changing quickly, with some states enacting strict bans beginning from conception and without significant exceptions, even for pregnancies resulting from rape. These laws stop short of punishing pregnant people for obtaining abortions, perhaps inconsistently if abortion is judged to be murder, but patients reportedly face prosecution for attempting to use medication to self-manage abortions or for conduct during pregnancy characterized as child abuse (Dewan & Frenkel 2022). (The language used here is pronoun-neutral because people who identify their gender as male but who are biologically female may become pregnant.) Other US jurisdictions are responding to Dobbs with protections for providers offering abortions and their patients.

Feminists also point out that reproductive choices may be constrained not only by law but also by patriarchal norms or social circumstances. People may be coerced into having sex, bearing children, or leaving work to care for families. A preference for male over female offspring, including sex selective abortion, may be culturally enforced. Economic instability may dictate the need for abortion by those who would otherwise prefer to carry pregnancies to term.

On the other hand, conservative feminists (e.g., Bachiochi 2021: 259) raise concerns that abortion access may further laissez faire attitudes about sex, leaving the woman to pick up the pieces when sex leads to pregnancy. In a similar vein, Harvard Law professor Mary Ann Glendon (1987) argued that the French and other civil law systems historically expressed respect for persons by limiting abortion subject to important exceptions to protect women.

The abortion issue raises questions about how law should deal with issues of deep moral disagreement within society, such as the status of the fetus and the role of religion in public life. Some societies expressly incorporate religious law into their legal systems or operate dual systems. Others are secular but must work with strong customary elements. In nations with strong religious or customary influences on law, feminists may face difficult issues of how to call on international human rights norms or to interpret religious law into language more favorable to women’s freedom (Quraishi 2011). Some innovative work has been done on these issues, for example, by exploring the distinction between shari’a (eternal) law and fiqh (custom or jurisprudence) in Islam, or by considering the interplay of dual systems (Quraishi 2011; Mir-Hosseini 2006; Reed 2002; Jeffery & Basu 1998).

Feminists of color have brought an intersectional lens to these debates about reproduction. Led by the SisterSong Reproductive Justice Collective, activists of color argue that reproductive justice requires that people be able to have the children they want, to not have children they do not want, and to parent their children in safe and healthy environments (Ross & Solinger 2017). On this view, lack of access to health care, safe housing, food security, clean water, or infertility care, is reproductive injustice that bears most heavily on people of color. These intersectional feminists view some “pro-choice” positions as myopic in their primary focus on abortion.

An understanding of reproductive justice that includes access to care for sexual health and fertility encompasses infertility prevention and treatment. Many issues about infertility care raise controversies among at least some feminists. One disputed area is whether having genetically or gestationally related offspring is sufficiently important to human wellbeing to warrant support for treatment from shared resources. Some argue that adoption should be viewed as an available alternative and that the desire for genetically related children is a hold-over from patriarchal inheritance structures. Others argue that it is unjust to deny treatment to those who cannot reproduce without help because they are single, in a same sex relationship, or are physically unable to conceive or carry a child (for discussion of these issues, see, e.g., Baron 2023). Still other feminists point out the ethical problems of relying on adoption as an alternative to parenting, including problematic shaming of birth parents who relinquish children for adoption (Haslanger 2022).

Another area of controversy among feminists concerns methods of infertility care, particularly gamete provision and surrogacy. Critics contend that language such as gamete “donation” is misleading, for these practices commodify the body. Some neoliberal theorists urge that if paid sex, paid surrogacy, paid gamete donation, and the like can be achieved voluntarily, these are legitimate forms of economic opportunity. To prohibit them is to deprive some people—primarily women—of opportunities that might be of value to them and to deprive the biologically and socially infertile of the ability to form families. Feminists critical of this liberal position argue that commodification mistakenly understands the body as the subject of property—despite the all-too-apparent reality that alternatives to commodification may be worse (Radin 1996). Relatedly, some contend that commodification of the body in practices such as paid surrogacy is inherently exploitative (Dickenson 2007) or degrading (E. Anderson 1990). These and other feminists also criticize apparent technological imperatives apart from the economic incentives that may be driving them. Some contend that practices such as pre-implantation genetic diagnosis, transplants of mitochondrial DNA, or gene editing are far riskier both physiologically and ethically than proponents admit (e.g., De Melo-Martin 2016). These feminists point out that long-term evidence of safety is lacking and that these practices may portend far-reaching changes in our understanding of what it is to be human. Some liberal feminists, on the other hand, argue that individual’s choices about the reproductive risks they are willing to take should be respected, especially when they are striving to avoid disease in their potential offspring.

Across the globe, countries vary in the extent to which they permit surrogacy. France, Germany, Italy, Portugal, Spain, and many other countries prohibit surrogacy. Canada, New Zealand, Brazil, and Australia permit altruistic but not paid surrogacy (Rahim 2024). People who cannot get surrogacy services at home may seek services abroad, but such travel for services is controversial. The conservative Italian government in power in 2024 favors a ban on out of country surrogacy. There is no international regulation of cross-border surrogacy and critics are especially concerned about risks of exploitation of women in poorer countries paid to be surrogates (Rahim 2024).

2.4 Prostitution

Feminists fragment significantly on issues involving commercialization of sex. Prostitution is one such area where feminists have taken different positions. Liberals, whether or not they are also feminists, disagree on whether prostitution should be viewed as just another commercial activity that people should be free to engage in as long as they do so with full consent and without harming others, or whether prostitution is a case in which paternalistic intervention may be justified to protect people from themselves (de Marneffe 2010; Gauthier 2013). Liberals also question whether choices to engage in sex work can be genuinely voluntary or result from coercive economic conditions. Still others argue that legal prohibition of even voluntary prostitution is necessary to protect victims of sex trafficking, as legalized prostitution may mask continued flourishing of trafficking in its shadow (Dempsey 2010). The Netherlands and Germany, countries that have legalized prostitution, have engaged in vigorous debates about whether prostitution is a voluntarily chosen occupation for many, whether legalization has bettered the circumstances for prostitutes, and whether legalization has been sufficiently coupled with enhanced enforcement of laws against sex trafficking or other sex crimes. In contrast, Sweden has banned prostitution altogether, spurred by feminist critique of the practice, but has met criticism that the result has been to drive the practice underground where it has become more dangerous. Some feminists have contended that criminalization may harm sex workers if the threat of law enforcement deters them from getting needed medical treatment or other help if they are raped, exploited, or trafficked (Ahmed 2014). Instead, these critics suggest, criminalization should be directed towards sex trafficking for the harms it causes its victims.

Other feminist thinkers have developed arguments that commercial sex work is wrong even if people would freely choose to engage in it. S. Anderson (2002), for example, argues that restrictions on commercial sex work further sexual autonomy because they prevent economic pressures to be used to alter a person’s sexual choices. For Anderson, sex is not just another use of the body that can be commercialized, like lifting heavy objects. Gauthier (2011) contends that patrons of sex workers demand false sexual self-expression that is discriminatory because sex workers are expected to express attitudes demanded by patrons exercising dominance. Both of these writers, however, also point out that the wrongfulness of prostitution may not be sufficient to support its criminalization if the harms of law enforcement may outweigh the harms of prostitution. Radical feminists (e.g., Overall 1992) take the still stronger position that prostitution institutionalizes sexual subordination and thus is wrong. To the extent that these views have been stated in terms of the patriarchal subordination of women, they would need to be extended to cover cases of cis-male and trans-male prostitution.

2.5 Pornography and Obscenity

Pornography also divides feminists. Divisions begin with the definition itself: is it sexually explicit material, the depiction of sexualized bodies as means for arousal, misogynistic sex, or the sexually explicit subordination of women—or is some other way of defining it more appropriate? (Watson 2010) Conceptual divisions also address whether obscenity is a separate kind of hard-core pornography that lacks social value altogether (Altman & Watson 2019). Debates continue with whether and how pornography should be addressed legally. As with prostitution, some liberals argue that it is unjustifiably paternalistic to interfere with peoples’ ability to read or see what they want if others are not harmed. These liberals may also privilege freedom of expression. Other feminists criticize pornography for the attitudes of consumers that it fosters; for example, Cawston (2019) argues that pornography both reflects sexist attitudes and conceals the recognition of these attitudes as sexist by distancing the consumer from the acts of sex.

Censorship laws vary widely, with communist and religiously conservative countries having the most restrictive laws. Laws addressing child pornography, access by minors to pornography, and exploitation of participants in pornography are common. The European Union regards child pornography as a violation of the fundamental rights of children and directs (Directive 2011/92/EU) member state to undertake action to prevent or prohibit the promotion of the sexual abuse of children. Pornography is legal in the UK, but a 2024 review (UK 2024) seeks evidence of whether efforts to prevent underage access, abuse and human trafficking in the industry are adequate. Pornography is legal in Canada but in 2024 the Canadian legislature considered increasing enforcement of age limits on access to pornography over the Internet. Waltman (2021) offers a comparative analysis of the connections between pornography and sex inequality in the US, Canada, and Sweden, and considers why democracies fail to address the harms of pornography.

The US has been a focal point for debates about pornography, with civil libertarians campaigning against limitations on sex and sexually explicit material (Bracewell 2016). On the other side, dominance feminists argue that pornography is the quintessential example of objectification and oppression. These feminists claim that pornography exploits women, children, other vulnerable adults, or their images in its production. It portrays them in positions of subservience and ravishment. And it encourages postures of dominance, sexual harassment, discrimination, and exploitation on the part of viewers. On these views, pornography both causes harm and is inherently harmful to those who participate in its making, those who consume it, and those who live in societies that are influenced by the attitudes it engenders. In the 1980s, Catharine MacKinnon and Andrea Dworkin drafted a proposed ordinance for cities that characterized pornography as a violation of civil rights. The ordinance as proposed did not criminalize pornography; rather, it provided a civil damages remedy for violations. Its proponents thus argued that it empowered victims rather than relying on the oppressive power of the state (Bracewell 2016: 36). This ordinance was enacted in Indianapolis but struck down by a federal appellate court as impermissibly regulating speech based on its content, American Booksellers Association, Inc. v. Hudnut. That the ordinance’s feminist opposition to female subordination was misconstrued as a moralistic condemnation of certain forms of sex, its proponents contended, illustrated the failure to appreciate the difference between moralism about sex and opposition to masculinist domination in sex. In response to pornography, these feminists suggested developing better models of masculinity (MacKinnon & Siegel 2004; Estrich 2000).

In the wake of Hudnut, some liberal legal theorists such as Cass Sunstein or Elena Kagan (now Justice Kagan) supported laws against speech that was directly linked to public harms (Bracewell 2016: 39). “Hate” crimes enhance punishment when an identified crime also expresses animus towards a disfavored group. In the view of more radical feminist critics, this approach reinvokes the problematic distinction between the public sphere and the private sphere drawn by liberals in the tradition of Mill. Bracewell (2016) observes that this liberal turn towards advocating the criminalization of particular forms of harmful speech may parallel other invocations of the criminal law by feminists in countering sexual harassment, domestic violence, or sex trafficking.

Generative artificial intelligence and robotic technologies that allow highly realistic simulations of degrading or violent sexual acts present additional challenges for critique. These depictions do not require human performance for their production and thus do not directly harm actors. Some argue that creating or viewing these materials nonetheless should be criminalized as wrongful conduct (Danaher 2017). Mistreatment of people involved in their production, however, may be the least of the harms associated with these technologies. Especially concerning is that artificial intelligence allows for the creation of extremely harmful “deep fake” likenesses of individuals. Created without the individuals’ involvement, these may appear as realistic images of their bodies or their activities. They thus may shame, stigmatize, or encourage violence against their targets and come under the harm principle in this way.

2.6 Sexual harassment and the “;#MeToo” movement

In 1979, Catharine MacKinnon published her groundbreaking work identifying the phenomenon of sexual harassment (MacKinnon 1979). Naming the phenomenon helped people to recognize that common forms of behavior—unwelcome touches, comments on appearance, persistent sexual innuendos, pressures to date or have sex—added up to patterns of discrimination, thus correcting hermeneutical injustice (Fricker 2007). Legal recognition of sexual harassment as a form of discrimination based on sex soon followed in the US and in many other jurisdictions. Critics argued that this legal doctrine had become over-expanded into chilling camaraderie and social interchange. In reply, law professor Vicki Schultz (1998, 2003) argued that the law of sexual harassment should not be interpreted as legal moralism enforcing prudish judgments. Instead, sexual harassment should be conceptualized to prohibit conduct that excludes women as unwelcome in masculinized places, including places of work.

The #MeToo movement, originally founded by activist Tarana Burke as support for victims of sexual violence, caught fire in 2017 with actress Alyssa Milano’s invitation on Twitter to respond if you’ve been sexually harassed or abused. #MeToo reports often highlight sexual overtures or pressures by dominant men; Schultz (2018) has reemphasized the need to see these behaviors as part of general patterns of sex-based hostility and structural injustice in male-dominated workplaces. The movement has resulted in prominent entertainment industry magnates such as Harvey Weinstein (Brown 2022) and prominent political figures such as New York governor Andrew Cuomo or Conservative Member of Parliament David Warburton being called to task for their behavior. Epistemic controversies about #MeToo continue, with arguments both for the importance of due process for the accused and for epistemic justice to victims whose stories may be too readily disbelieved (K. Freedman 2020; see generally Hoskins, Woolfrey, & Hoskins [eds] 2021).

2.7 Domestic Violence

A core function of the state and the criminal law is protection of individuals from harm. Until the twentieth century, however, women were largely left unprotected from a frequent source of danger, their intimates. Indeed, for much of history these private threats to the personal security of women were not recognized as harms that it was the business of the state to address. Concomitantly, for liberal theorists among others the realm of the home was private space to be insulated from state incursion. Extensive feminist legal scholarship and efforts at reform reveal, criticize, and change how legal systems fail to protect women, girls, and more recently LGBTQ+ people, from intimate violence. Nonetheless, rates of domestic violence remain disturbingly high worldwide; the World Health Organization estimated in 2021 that nearly one third of women in relationships reported being subjected to some form of physical or sexual violence from their intimate partners (WHO 2021: xvi).

How law should intervene to counter the threat of intimate partner violence is not obvious, however, especially when viewed through an intersectional lens. On the one hand, partners and children may be severely injured both psychologically and physically if violence is allowed to persist. Use of the force of the criminal law against alleged perpetrators seems an obviously justified response. From the 1960s on, feminists organized against domestic violence, seeing it as a manifestation of intentional control by masculine aggressors against the women they battered. These feminists argued that domestic violence should be met with criminalization of offenders and treatment, along with shelters and other services for battered women and children. Feminists also supported policies of mandatory arrest and “no drop” prosecution of alleged offenders, even when victims did not want prosecutions to continue and refused to testify. Feminists continued to press arguments against police inconsistencies and apparent unwillingness to arrest and prosecute (Dempsey 2016).

On the other side, the emphasis on law enforcement can be criticized for risking escalation of the situation, harm to the victim or others, discriminatory treatment of the alleged offender in the criminal justice system, and over-policing of Black men and women. US data indicate that the introduction of mandatory arrest policies may have led to sharp increases in arrest rates of both alleged victims and alleged perpetrators (Goodmark 2023: 11). In response to these concerns, some feminist scholars have argued for re-examining criminalization as an approach to domestic violence. Political scientist Kristin Bumiller (2008) has argued that feminist movements against sexual violence have unwittingly served neoliberal agendas of increasing the reach of the carceral state and the surveillance of vulnerable women. Feminist social work scholar Linda Mills (2003: 13) has contended that in intimate violence the perpetrator is not “the cause and the sum of the violence he inflicts”. Instead, according to Mills, intimate violence occurs in relationships that are both dynamic and set within social contexts. Recognizing the context in which domestic violence occurs, Mills contends, can help to explain both why women stay in relationships and why women are at times not only abused but also abusers. Mills recommends exploring restorative justice models instead of incarceration for domestic violence when incarceration is not needed to prevent continued harm. (See further discussion in the entries on legal punishment and reconciliation.) Also widening the viewpoint, feminist criminal justice scholar Leigh Goodmark (2018) has argued that domestic violence should be seen through many lenses—as economic, public health, community, and human rights issues—and not just as a problem for the criminal law. Goodmark (2023) also explores the complex circumstances of “imperfect victims” who are both victims of domestic violence and are criminally punished for actions against their accusers, or who otherwise fail to meet stereotypes of innocent victimization. Such “imperfect victims” may also be those who have engaged in commercial sex, who have engaged in acts judged criminal while being trafficked, or who do not fit cis-gender norms. “Abolition feminists” (Davis, Dent, Meiners, & Richie 2021) shed light on how criminalization of domestic violence has been disproportionately directed towards Black men. In the view of these authors, feminists should advocate for change that takes multiple, layered steps against racism, sexism, homophobia, transphobia, xenophobia, incarceration for disability—and the prison industrial complex.

Michelle Dempsey (2009) argues that when victims do not support prosecutions of domestic violence, prosecutors should respond as feminists. By this, she means that prosecutors should act on reasons guided by a commitment to reconstitute their communities to lessen the influence of patriarchy in the form of structural inequality that systematically limits women’s lives. In developing her argument, Dempsey draws on her own experience as a prosecutor who had pursued strong pro-prosecution policies and been met with objections from victims, defense lawyers, and judges. In response, she shifted to policies of exercising prosecutorial discretion to pursue primarily cases of wife-battering in which the victim was in a stereotypical relationship of gender power imbalance: staying home and attending to childcare, being denied her own friends and money, being forbidden to travel alone, and being subjected to suffering. Her book is motivated by the effort to understand whether this approach can be justified as feminist prosecutorial reasoning. Dempsey works with an account of practical reason on which the realization of value provides reason to act. For prosecutors, values are not only consequential—the possibility of prevention of harm—but also intrinsic: the attempt to realize good consequences, the expressive function of denunciation of the violence, and the value of responding on behalf of the community to the violence. Dempsey thus provides a feminist account of prosecutorial reasons for action that supports neither mandatory prosecution nor abolitionism.

2.8. Rape

Rape and sexual assault also areas of substantive law where feminist thinkers have achieved substantial reforms. Before reform efforts, rape law was patently patriarchal. Marital partners were excluded from rape prohibitions, on the misogynist assumptions that marriage created an entitlement to sex or signaled consent to fulfillment of the partner’s desires. Estrich (1987) argued forcefully against the view that attacks by strangers were paradigmatic of rape, demonstrating that acquaintance rape could be “real rape”, too, and not consensual sex.

Despite reforms in the law of rape, rules of evidence remained hurdles for victims whose claims were often disbelieved. For example, victim resistance was expected as evidence that a sexual advance was unwanted. Victims who did not actively resist—including those who were terrorized or who feared harm from resistance—were judged to have consented to whatever happened to them, or at least to have reasonably appeared to their attackers as consenting (McGregor 2005). Evidence rules that permitted examination of victims’ past sexual histories to impugn their credibility discouraged victims from pursuing complaints when they did not want to reveal intimate private matters or to be subjected to scrutiny of the morality of their behavior. Victims who delayed reporting alleged rapes, perhaps from shame or fear, were considered not to have made a fresh complaint and thus to be less credible. Many of these rules have been formally overturned but may in practice continue to infect decisions such as whether to prosecute, how to examine witnesses, or how to assess the credibility of witnesses.

Insights from feminist epistemology continue to play a major role in challenging the impact of credibility judgments. Fricker’s groundbreaking work on epistemic injustice (2007) has opened up discussion of testimonial injustice, hermeneutical injustice, and victim silencing. Testimonial injustice occurs when people are discounted as credible because of stereotypes such as those rooted in sex or race; it may also occur when people are assessed as overly credible for similar reasons, likely to the detriment of the credibility accorded others (Medina 2013). For example, a woman’s testimony may be discounted in allegations of rape if she does not fit the stereotype of an innocent victim but the accused fits the stereotype of a respectable citizen. To take another example, claims of asylum seekers about threats they face in their home countries may be disbelieved (Crépin 2020). Hermeneutical injustice occurs when others do not even have the concepts to understand what someone is saying, as when a victim of sex trafficking claims she was coerced but police or immigration authorities can only visualize her as an economic migrant. Black feminists such as Dotson (2011, 2014, 2017) present powerfully detailed accounts of the role of race in these forms of epistemic injustice.

Contemporary discussions of rape continue to explore questions about consent and the wrongfulness of rape. Application of the criminal law requires bright-line judgments of guilt or innocence, with serious consequences for the accused and the victim, yet there may be ambiguities about consent. Some feminists have argued that there is a domain of wrongful sex beyond rape; Cahill (2016, 2001), for example, develops an account of sex as unjust within contexts of structural injustice. Forms of unjust sex may within a gray area about consent; Cahill distinguishes cases in which the woman is less than fully willing, cases in which the woman’s will is clearly overcome, and cases in which the victim cannot fully consent due to incapacity. What distinguishes among these cases, Cahill says, is how the victim’s sexual agency is deployed. Sex is unjust if the woman’s sexual agency is actively sought but undermined, such as when it is difficult for her to express unwillingness. Parties under the influence of drugs or alcohol also may be unable to exercise full agency. Lack of respect for sexual agency has also been used to explain why rape is wrongful even if it (hypothethically) takes place in a manner that does not harm victims either physically or psychologically, as when they are unconscious and never aware of having been sexually assaulted (Heyes 2016). Rape is more than assault; it attacks personhood and shatters identity (Brison 2022).

In the wake of Dobbs, some US states have enacted abortion prohibitions that do not include exceptions for rape. Being forced to carry a pregnancy resulting from the bodily violation of rape is a further suppression of women’s agency. Some states only permit abortions for rape when the occurrence has been reported to law enforcement; these rules express disbelief of victims’ credibility. The most humiliating of all of these provisions is an Idaho law that allows family members of alleged perpetrators of rape to sue physicians for statutory damages of $20,000 for the abortion of the fetus in violation of the state’s abortion ban, ID Code § 18–8807.

2.9 Inequality in Social and Economic Life

Inequality in social and economic life—in schools, public accommodations, employment, housing, insurance, pensions, investment, sports, the environment, and more—has been a widespread target of feminist legal critique. Here, feminist analysis begins with central theoretical questions about the meaning and justification of equality amid difference, including supposed biological differences, histories of discrimination, and entrenched social institutions. Feminist legal responses have evolved from the removal of outright barriers such as male-only public universities; to non-discrimination; to attacking conditions, practices, and structures of injustice.

Progress toward economic equality has been substantial in many parts of the world; all but seven countries (the US, Iran, Sudan, Somalia, Nauru, Palau and Tonga) are parties to CEDAW. Many of these have adopted and implemented accompanying legislation but others have not. Severe setbacks have occurred, including in countries that have committed to CEDAW. In Afghanistan the return of Taliban rule has been devastating for women and girls, who are now barred from most education, employment, and travel. Overall, while women are active participants and leaders in the public sphere in large numbers in many societies, World Bank data (World Bank 2022 [OIR]) indicate that across the globe just over 50% of women of working age are in the labor force compared to 80% of men, and women continue to earn significantly less than men.

In the US from the 1940s on, courts gradually began to enforce the Equal Protection Clause of the 14th Amendment to apply strict scrutiny to state-imposed categorizations based on race. Later on, constitutional law began to address whether race and sex could be analogized or even coupled for purposes of analysis (Mayeri 2011). The Equal Rights Amendment would have applied strict scrutiny to discrimination on the basis of sex, but has not been ratified by a sufficient number of states. Although sex is given heightened constitutional scrutiny, it is not given strict scrutiny; sex discrimination in the US has been addressed primarily through federal and state statutes rather than constitutional adjudication. In 1963, the US Congress passed the Equal Pay Act, amending the Fair Labor Standards Act to prohibit unequal pay on the basis of sex for

equal work on jobs the performance of which requires equal skill, effort, and responsibility, and which are performed under similar working conditions. (29 USC. § 206(d) (2012))

(Congress, in a dispute about comparable worth, left open the interpretive question of whether this statute requires the same pay for the same work or equal pay for substantially equivalent jobs, a comparable worth standard.) The Civil Rights Act of 1964 followed the next year, explicitly establishing rights not to be discriminated against on the basis of race, sex, religion or national origin in employment (Title VII). Prohibition of discrimination on the basis of sex in educational programs receiving federal funding (Title IX of the Civil Rights Act) followed in 1972; in 2010, § 1557 of the Affordable Care Act (ACA) prohibited discrimination on the basis of sex by health care providers receiving federal funding. This ACA provision was the first time discrimination on the basis of sex had been prohibited in US health care.

Sex is but one of the grounds of discrimination addressed in anti-discrimination law. Treating grounds of discrimination as separable phenomena is problematic for establishing causation: if someone was fired because she was black, female, and disabled, she will be unable to establish that any single factor was the “but for” cause of her dismissal. Moreover, intersectionality theorists point out that discrimination based on sex and, say, race, is not simply discrimination based on sex plus discrimination based on race (Mayeri 2011; Matsuda 1987). Some feminists have pointed out as a problem in particular of liberal feminism that much of its focus is directed to sex discrimination as experienced by white, middle class, professional women (J. Williams 2010; Roberts 2002).

Beyond overt intentional discrimination, implicit bias plays continuing roles in differential experiences of men and women in employment and in many other areas of social life. Illustrating the role of implicit bias in evaluation is the famous discovery about symphony orchestras that the number of women musicians selected rose dramatically when applicants auditioned anonymously from behind a screen (Goldin & Rouse 2000). Especially after public condemnation of the deaths of George Floyd and other Black women and men at the hands of police, implicit bias training has been widely implemented. Evidence about the durable efficacy of this training remains mixed at best (Greenwald et al. 2022), indicating the difficulty of relying on regulation to change behavior.

Even without explicit or implicit bias, many longstanding, apparently neutral policies may affect men and women differently. Policies discouraging or prohibiting part time work, when consistently applied to both men and women, may have quite different consequences for parents with primary responsibility for childcare, thus disadvantaging women disproportionately. The US continues to have a workplace structured on the basis of the norms of the 1950s, assuming a breadwinner husband and a wife at home taking care of the children (Williams 2010). Flexible work schedules, predictable shifts, consistent start and stop times, daytime work, or part-time work at hourly rates or with benefits proportionately equivalent to those of full-time workers simply are not available to much of the workforce in the US or elsewhere. Moreover, the US, unlike other advanced industrial societies, has no general statutory requirement for paid family leave; the absence of this leave may prove particularly burdensome in the aftermath of Dobbs. Claudia Goldin’s groundbreaking work on the complex factors involved in sex inequalities in the workplace was awarded the Nobel Prize in economics in 2023. Goldin traces the root of wage inequality for women in the US to “greedy work” that consumes more and more time; she argues that the solution requires restructuring work (Goldin 2021: 3).

Covid-19 further exacerbated these economic differences between women and men, as women struggled to maintain jobs while helping children with education at home during school closures and attending to other care-giving responsibilities. Goldin (2022) has argued that in the US more educated women were stressed by these dual responsibilities, while less educated women in jobs that did not allow them to work from home were disproportionately affected economically. International studies indicate that the availability of reliable and affordable childcare is important to women’s participation in the labor force and that laws promoting these services have a small but positive effect (Anukriti et al. 2023 [Other Internet Resources]).

The economic disadvantages of women at work are reinforced by disadvantages in family law. Divorce and child maintenance settlements disproportionally leave women in poverty (Raday 2019). In some societies the de-valued status of wives and daughters leaves them without inheritance or property rights. In some countries, reforms of inheritance laws have permitted widows to inherit and daughters to inherit on an equal basis with sons. Although these reforms have been slow-moving, evidence suggests that they have generated positive outcomes for women (Giovarelli & Scalise 2020). Despite the efforts of feminists to propose pay scales for care work and reformed family structures (e.g., Fineman 2004), uncompensated care work burdens continue to fall disproportionately on women (Ferrant, Pesando, & Nowacka 2014).

This de-valuation and invisibility contribute to the feminization of poverty, a problem of global proportions. In 2022, United Nations poverty data projected that in the aftermath of COVID just under 400 million women and girls—nearly 5% of the global population—live in extreme poverty, as do just under 375 million men and boys (UN Women 2022 [OIR]). Many programs have been proposed and initiated to alleviate extreme poverty, including opportunities for literacy, support for contraception and other reproductive rights, formation of women’s unions and cooperative associations, and micro-lending. Pioneers of micro-lending Muhammad Yunus and the Grameen Bank received the Nobel Peace Prize in 2006. Both scholars and international organizations continue to see advancement of economic opportunities through legal reforms as a critical aspect of addressing global poverty.

3. Conclusion

Law furthers social stability but may entrench norms of oppression. Law can also be a necessary means for reform. Law can be an anchor to the past or an engine for the future. Feminist legal philosophy examines and reformulates theories of law and legal doctrines to overcome entrenched bias and enforced inequality of the past as it structures institutions for the future.

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As of 2025, this entry is solely authored by Leslie Francis. Earlier versions were maintained and revised by Leslie Francis from an original version written by Patricia Smith.

Copyright © 2025 by
Leslie Francis <francisl@law.utah.edu>

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