1. Freeland cites the following texts: Politics 1, 13, 1260a23; Physics 1, 9, 192a22–3; Historia Animalium 2, 3, 501b19-21; De Generatione Animalium 4, 1, 765b9-10 and 4, 6, 775a15; Poetics 15, 1454a21, 23-4..

2. Kant’s derogatory remarks about women are in his pre-critical work Observations on the Feeling of the Beautiful and Sublime (Kant 1764 [1960: 111]). Robin Schott presents a critical, feminist reading of Kant’s conceptual framework in Schott 1988 and 1997.

3. Feminists use the idea of a gendered notion to mean different things. In this article I draw a distinction between holding that a notion is intrinsically gendered, and holding that it is extrinsically gendered. Other feminists, however, use the idea of a gendered notion in ways that do not map easily onto my distinction. For example, as I discuss below, Genevieve Lloyd argues for the symbolic gendering of philosophical notions, and it may be that her interpretation does not map onto the intrinsic/extrinsic distinction. And Sally Haslanger argues that objectivity is a gendered notion in the philosophy of Catharine MacKinnon in a way that is neither extrinsic nor intrinsic.

4. Tuana 1992 also provides a feminist reading of the history of philosophy.

5. E. F. Keller 1985 is a classic source for feminist criticism of the rise of modern science.

6. For a discussion of Irigaray’s contribution to feminist scholarship on the history of philosophy see Deutscher 1997.

7. Bordo and G. Lloyd differ in other important respects as well. Bordo is interested in providing a social and psychological explanation for the masculinization of philosophy by Descartes. Why did Descartes conceive of reason and objectivity in a masculine guise? The social answer is that during his life European culture was undergoing a gynophobic spasm. The psychological answer depends upon object relations theory, and the development of that theory along gender lines by Chodorow and others. Lloyd is not interested primarily in the causal question addressed by Bordo. Moreover, she thinks that the maleness of reason in the philosophical tradition is primarily symbolic or metaphorical rather than social or psychological. Ultimately, then Bordo and Lloyd differ as to what is meant by the maleness of reason.

8. For a discussion of the omission of Simone de Beauvoir from the philosophical canon see the introduction to Simons 1995.

9. Historians Winthrop Jordan and John C. Miller and literary scholar Henry Louis Gates, Jr. provide helpful ways to contextualize Jefferson’s dismissal of Wheatley (Jordan 1968: 283–285; Miller 1977 [1991: 75–76]; Gates 2003: 5–90).

10. According to literary scholar Marilyn Richardson, Maria Stewart’s maiden name was Miller; however, her husband James W. Stewart asked her to take his middle initial as her own (Richardson 1987b: 3–4). Given her and his identification with Black revolutionary David Walker, her identification of herself as “Maria W. Stewart” may well have been a radical move, especially in light of her encouragement of Black women to “possess the spirit of independence … the spirit of men” (Richardson 1987b; Stewart 1831 [1987: 38]). Hence, the “W.” in her married name may well be equivalent to the maiden-married name convention used by or to identify the other three women.

11. This observation, which I make about Harper elsewhere (M. C. Robinson 2025), coordinates with similar observations or comments made by literary scholar Marilyn Richardson (1987b: 5–27), media historian Jane Rhodes (1998: 181–182); religion scholar Vincent Lloyd (2016: x–xii, 35–38); and especially philosophers Bernard Boxill and William Uzgalis, who address the complexities in and the radical implications of Locke’s thought in the context of slavery (Boxill 1998: 29–48; Uzgalis 1998: 49–77).

12. The works by Jefferson and Locke referenced here include the first and last editions of Locke’s Two Treatises of Government, both of which Jefferson probably owned, among other works by Locke, given his high regard for the British philosopher (Jefferson 1811 [1970: 163]; Arneil 1996: 187). Locke’s Essays on the Law of Nature is featured here, though, because, as philosopher Stephen Darwall clearly explains, its idea of natural law grounds Locke’s Two Treatises and Essay Concerning Human Understanding, something retired philosopher and Locke biographer Roger Woolhouse notes earlier, as he both acknowledges Locke’s influence on America’s founders and lays out, like philosopher David Wootton, the proper context for understanding Locke’s political thought, particularly Locke’s Two Treatises (Darwall 2023: 90–100; Woolhouse 2007: 2, 275–276, 339; Wootton 1993: 5–89).

13. The series of references from Jefferson to Miller and from Locke to Woolhouse showcase Jefferson’s and Locke’s opposition to slavery in the context of their actual and more complicated relations to it (slavery) and to persons of African descent. The references to Moore and Robinson at the end of the series point to arguments against slavery as part of colonial expansion and with it, a questioning of Jefferson’s “pursuit of happiness,” which, as Miller and Moore contend, meant more than a simple reference to property (Miller 1977 [1991: 14–18]; Moore 2023: 11).

14. The ideas in this paragraph and the following paragraph on Harper, along with much of the argument undergirding this entire segment on Black women philosophers, not only comes out of the essay noted here, but also out of a larger research project on Harper well underway.

15. Atherton 1993. Celia Amorós has retrieved the arguments in support of the equality of the sexes made by the seventeenth century Cartesian philosopher Francois Poullain de la Barre (1647–1723). See Amorós 1994.