Feminist History of Philosophy

First published Fri Nov 3, 2000; substantive revision Fri Sep 12, 2025

The past decades have seen an explosion of feminist writing on the philosophical canon, a development that has clear parallels in other disciplines like literature and art history. Since most of the writing is, in one way or another, critical of the tradition, a natural question to ask is: Why does the history of philosophy have importance for feminist philosophers? This entry answers the question by exploring the different ways that feminist philosophers are interacting with the European philosophical canon. While this entry focuses on feminist engagement with European philosophy, recent research has highlighted, for instance, the construction of womanhood in Chinese Philosophy (R. Wang 2010) and seventeenth century Korean women writing in the Confucian tradition (Ivanhoe & H. Y. Wang, 2021, 2023); Waithe and Boos Dykeman (2023) provide a resource for recovering the women philosophers in non-European traditions. We cannot cover this broad a range of scholarship in this one article, but we are optimistic that the framework applied to European philosophy here can be helpful in feminist research in the history of philosophy of other traditions.

Feminist philosophers engaged in a project of re-reading and re-forming the philosophical canon have noticed two significant areas of concern. The first is the problem of historical exclusion. Feminist philosophers are faced with a tradition that believes that there are no women philosophers and, if there are any, they are unimportant. Of course, women are not entirely absent from the history of philosophy, and that brings us to the second challenge we face. Canonical philosophers have had plenty to say about women and what we are like. In general terms, we often find that philosophical norms like reason and objectivity are defined in contrast to matter, the irrational or whatever a given philosopher associates with women and the feminine (Rooney 1991, 1994). The European tradition tells us, either implicitly through images and metaphors, or explicitly in so many words, that philosophy itself, and its norms of reason and objectivity, exclude everything that is feminine or associated with women. In response, feminist philosophers have criticized both the historical exclusion of women from the philosophical tradition, and the negative characterization of women or the feminine in it.

The following entry contains 3 major sections. Section 1 (“Feminist Criticisms of the Canon as Misogynist”) describes feminist readings of the philosophical canon that challenge its derogatory characterizations of women. These are of three kinds: (a) readings that record the explicit misogyny of great philosophers (like Aristotle’s description of a female as, as it were, a deformed male); (b) readings that argue for gendered interpretations of theoretical concepts (like matter and form in Aristotle); (c) synoptic interpretations of the canon (like the view that, historically, reason and objectivity are gendered male). Section 2 (“Feminist Revisions of the History of Philosophy”) discusses the response of feminist historians to the twin myths that there have been no women philosophers and, in any case, no important ones. One response has been the retrieval of women philosophers for the historical record. A related development is the elevation to the canon of important women philosophers like Mary Wollstonecraft, Hannah Arendt, and Simone de Beauvoir. Finally, feminist revisions to the history of philosophy and the canon raise important and pressing questions concerning how to weave women philosophers securely into the story of philosophy so that they begin to appear in the philosophical curriculum. Section 3 (“Feminist Appropriation of Canonical Philosophers”) examines the way that feminist philosophers have been engaged in rereading the canon looking for antecedents to feminist philosophy in the work of those philosophers (e.g., Hume) and those theories (e.g., Aristotle’s virtue ethics) that are most congenial to current trends in feminism or which provide most fuel for feminist thought. This is to use the canon as other movements have done—as a resource, and as confirmation that a feminist perspective or problem is securely rooted in our philosophical culture. Feminists who are critical of traditional methods of reading the history of philosophy have proposed several alternative reading strategies that they argue are better suited to feminist purposes than traditional methods. These writers are particularly skeptical of the appropriation project outlined in section 3 and their skepticism provokes interesting questions about what it is we do when we do the history of philosophy. (Freeland 2000; Le Doeuff 1989). Is there any principle of unity common to the four distinct projects described in this entry? Feminist historians of philosophy who work on, work with, and work against the history of philosophy as traditionally conceived are challenging the philosophical community to recognize new figures as philosophers, new genres as philosophical, new uses of canonical texts as legitimate, and new critical perspectives on them as legitimate. One way to unify the various strands of feminist work on the history of philosophy is to think of it as a recognition project (Witt 2020). Using the concept of recognition as the thread that weaves through and unifies feminist engagements with the history of philosophy allows us to appreciate this important work as both an epistemic and a political achievement.

1. Feminist Criticisms of the Canon as Misogynist

Women are capable of education, but they are not made for activities which demand a universal faculty such as the more advanced sciences, philosophy and certain forms of artistic production. … Women regulate their actions not by the demands of universality, but by arbitrary inclinations and opinions. —Hegel (1820 §166 [1973]: 263)

The idea that the gender of philosophers is important or even relevant to their work is a thought that runs counter to the self-image of philosophy. So, it is interesting to explore how and why feminist philosophers came to the realization that gender is a useful analytic category to apply to the history of philosophy. (Witt 2006) We can distinguish two aspects to this process although, in many cases, the two aspects merge into a single project. The first stage of realizing the importance of gender consisted of the cataloging of the explicit misogyny of most of the canon. The second stage consisted of probing the theories of canonical philosophers in order to uncover the gender bias lurking in their supposedly universal theories. The second stage, the discovery that a philosopher’s supposedly universal and objective theories were gender specific, raised the further question of whether or not the theoretical gender bias was intrinsic to the theory or extrinsic to it. Let me illustrate these points with Aristotle.

1.1 Explicit Statements of Misogyny in Philosophical Texts

There is no doubt that Aristotle’s texts contains statement that are sexist, perhaps even misogynist; he thought that women were inferior to men, and he said so explicitly. For example, to cite Cynthia Freeland’s catalog:

Aristotle says that the courage of a man lies in commanding, a woman’s lies in obeying; that “matter yearns for form, as the female for the male and the ugly for the beautiful”; that women have fewer teeth than men; that a female is an incomplete male or “as it were, a deformity”: which contributes only matter and not form to the generation of offspring; that in general “a woman is perhaps an inferior being”; that female characters in a tragedy will be inappropriate if they are too brave or too clever. (Freeland 1994: 145–46)[1]

However dispiriting or annoying this litany is, and whatever problems it presents to a woman studying or teaching Aristotle, it can be argued that Aristotle simply held a mistaken view about women and their capacities (as did most Athenians of his time). But, if this is so, then Aristotle’s theories, or most of them, are not tarnished by his statements about women, and we can ignore them, since they are false.

Here Aristotle is the chosen example, but similar feminist critiques are available chronicling the explicit misogyny of other canonical figures like Plato (Tuana 1994) and Kant. (Schott 1997) Feminist criticisms of Plato’s theories stress dialogues (like the Timaeus and Laws) that characterize women as inferior to men rather than the more egalitarian Republic. Kant’s writings, like Aristotle’s, provide the ideal target for feminist criticism because they contain both overt statements of sexism and racism, and a theoretical framework that can be interpreted along gender lines.[2]

1.2 Gendered Interpretations of Philosophical Concepts

As an example of a gendered interpretation of a philosophical concept let’s consider Aristotle’s theory of hylomorphism where we find a connection between form and being male, and matter and being female. That is, we find that matter and form are gendered notions in Aristotle (Witt 1998). By a gendered notion we mean a notion that is connected either overtly or covertly, either explicitly or metaphorically with gender or sexual difference.[3] Furthermore, matter and form are not equal partners in Aristotle’s metaphysics; form is better than matter. And since hylomorphism is the conceptual framework that underlies much Aristotelian theory from metaphysics and philosophy of mind to biology and literary theory, it looks as if his supposedly universal and objective theories are gendered in a way that tarnishes his philosophical theories (Freeland 2000).

Are Aristotle’s theories intrinsically gendered and sexist, so that gender cannot be removed without altering the theories themselves? Several feminist philosophers have developed this thesis. For example, in “Woman Is Not a Rational Animal”, Lynda Lange argues that Aristotle’s theory of sex difference is implicated in every piece of Aristotle’s metaphysical jargon, and she concludes that “it is not at all clear that it [Aristotle’s theory of sex difference] can simply be cut away without any reflection on the status of the rest of the philosophy” (Lange 1983: 2). Elizabeth Spelman has argued that Aristotle’s politicized metaphysics is reflected in his theory of soul, which, in turn, is used to justify the subordination of women in the Politics (Spelman 1983). And, finally, Susan Okin has argued that Aristotle’s functionalist theory of form was devised by Aristotle in order to legitimate the political status quo in Athens, including slavery and the inequality of women (Okin 1979: ch. 4). More recently Emanuela Bianchi (2014) argues for an interpretation of Aristotle’s texts that centers the concepts of sex and gender, and thereby establishes Aristotle’s structural commitment to gender hierarchy. And, Adriel Trott (2019) both makes the case for an enriched and nuanced interpretation of the relationship between matter and form in Aristotle’s metaphysics and biology, and—nonetheless—retains the view that matter and form are intrinsically gendered notions in Aristotle. Finally, Mercer (2018)argues that Aristotle’s sexism follows directly from his teleological worldview and normative view of nature.

Important recent work on sexism in Aristotle’s philosophy focuses on his theory of animal reproduction in the biological writings. To what extent and in what ways is Aristotle’s theory of animal generation sexist? (Henry 2007; Nielsen 2008) Sophia Connell (2016) interprets Aristotle’s theory of animal reproduction as recognizing different potentials coming from both male and female parents, and as not intrinsically sexist because the theory does not require that one source be better than the other. A related issue concerns how (or whether) Aristotle’s view of sexual difference in the biology is connected to his ideas about gender hierarchy in the Politics (Deslauriers 2009, 2022). Some argue that the biology of female animals lays the foundation for, and perhaps even explains, the unequal and subordinate political status attributed by Aristotle to women citizens in the polis (Mercer 2018; Deslauriers 2022).

1.3 Synoptic Interpretations of the Philosophical Canon

Feminist critics working on the history of philosophy have urged that the canon’s central philosophical norms and values, like reason and objectivity, are themselves gendered notions. The synoptic approach considers the European philosophical tradition as a whole and argues that its core concepts are gendered male or are sexist, or both. But, if this is so, then the European philosophical tradition as a whole and the central concepts that we have inherited from it requires critical scrutiny by feminists. Moreover, philosophy’s self-image as universal and objective, rather than particular and biased, is mistaken.

Feminist synoptic interpretations of the canon take several forms (Lloyd 2002). The first, exemplified by Genevieve Lloyd’s Man of Reason, argues that reason and objectivity in the history of philosophy are gendered male.[4] The way that reason and objectivity are gendered male varies as philosophical theory and historical period varies, but the fact that they are gendered is a constant. From Aristotle to Hume, from Plato to Sartre, reason is associated with maleness. Therefore, the notion of reason that we have inherited, whether we are empiricists or existentialists, requires critical scrutiny. For Lloyd the maleness of reason is symbolic and metaphorical rather than cultural or psychological. Lloyd does not intend the maleness of reason to refer to either a socially constituted gender category or a psychological orientation shared by males.

A second form of synoptic interpretation, exemplified by Susan Bordo’s The Flight to Objectivity, argues that the modern period in philosophy, and, in particular, the philosophy of Descartes, is the source of our ideals of reason and objectivity that are gendered male. In other words, this story chronicles a turn in philosophy coincident with the rise of modern science, which generated ideals of reason and objectivity that are deeply antagonistic to women and feminism.[5] Cartesian rationalism and the norms of modern science mark a decisive break with a philosophical and cultural tradition that was more accommodating of female characteristics and powers.

Finally, Luce Irigaray takes a radical stance towards the history of philosophy by trying to indicate what is suppressed and hidden in the tradition rather than cataloging its evident “maleness”. Her work, like Bordo’s, makes use of psychoanalytic theory in interpreting texts and, like Genevieve Lloyd’s, it explores the symbolic associations of philosophical images and concepts. However, unlike Bordo and Lloyd, Irigaray uses highly unconventional methods of interpreting canonical philosophical texts in order to uncover the ways in which the feminine or sexual difference is repressed in them. For example, Irigaray uses humor and parody rather than straightforward exegesis, and she points to instabilities (contradictions) in philosophical texts as symptoms of patriarchal thinking. According to Irigaray, patriarchal thinking attempts to achieve universality by repressing sexual difference. But, the presence of contradictions or instabilities in a philosophical text is symptomatic of the failure of patriarchal thinking to contain sexual difference. For example, Irigaray might look at the argument we described above for considering gender associations with form and matter in Aristotle to be extrinsic, rather than intrinsic, to those concepts, and argue that the fact that Aristotle’s hylomorphism as a universal theory is incompatible with gender associations is a symptom of patriarchal thinking rather than evidence that the proposed interpretation is mistaken.[6]

Despite their different historical stories, and the different ways that they understand the maleness of reason, each of these panoramic visions of the history of philosophy deliver the same moral, which is that the central norms that inform our philosophical culture today are gendered male.[7] Hence, these synoptic narratives of the philosophical tradition provide historical justifications for feminist philosophers who are critical of our central philosophical norms of reason and objectivity. Does the feminist synoptic critical reading of the history of philosophy justify either the conclusion that traditional conceptions of reason ought to be flat-out rejected by feminists or the conclusion that traditional conceptions of reason ought to be subjected to critical scrutiny?

Even if feminist historical arguments are successful in showing that philosophical norms like reason and objectivity are gendered male, this conclusion does not justify a flat-out rejection of either traditional philosophy or its norms of reason and objectivity (Witt 1993). Recall the distinction introduced above between intrinsically and extrinsically gendered notions. An intrinsically gendered notion is one that necessarily carries implications regarding gender, i.e., if one were to cancel all implications concerning gender, one would be left with a different notion than the original. In contrast, an extrinsically gendered notion typically does carry implications concerning gender, but not necessarily so. If the maleness of reason is extrinsic to the traditional concept of reason, then the historical fact that it was a gendered notion does not justify or require its rejection by feminists. If on the other hand, it can be shown that the maleness of reason is intrinsic to it, it still does not follow that reason ought to be rejected by feminists. For, the idea the reason is intrinsically male-biased would justify a rejection of it only if it ought to be other than it is. So, what needs to be argued is that reason and objectivity would be different, and better, if they were not gendered male, but were gender-neutral, gender-inclusive or female. But, if feminist philosophers develop this argument, which they need to buttress the historical argument, then they are reconceptualizing traditional notions of reason and objectivity rather than rejecting them.

2. Feminist Revisions of the History of Philosophy

These women are not women on the fringes of philosophy, but philosophers on the fringes of history. —Mary Ellen Waithe (1989: xxxviii)

Feminist canon revision is most distinctive, and, arguably, most radical, in its retrieval of women philosophers for the historical record, and in its elevation of women philosophers to the canon. It is a distinctive project because other contemporary philosophical movements tend to select from an already established list of male philosophers. It is a radical project because by uncovering a history of women philosophers, it has destroyed the alienating myth that philosophy was, and by implication is or ought to be, a male preserve.

In A History of Women Philosophers Mary Ellen Waithe has documented at least 16 women philosophers in the classical world, 17 women philosophers from 500–1600, and over 30 from 1600–1900. A recent work edited with Therese Boos Dyckman Women Philosophers from Non-Western Traditions: the First Four Thousand Years the authors document 22 women from traditions centered in what are contemporary India, China, Japan, Korea, Tibet, Nigeria, the Philippines, as well as the Sufi tradition and indigenous traditions in Australia and North America.

And, in the feminist series Re-reading the Canon seven of the thirty-five canonical philosophers are women: including Mary Wollstonecraft (Falco 1996), Hannah Arendt (Honig 1995), and Simone de Beauvoir (Simons 1995). What is crucial to understand is that none of the three is canonical—if by that you mean included in the history of philosophy as it is told in philosophy department curricula, in histories of philosophy, and in scholarly writing. Still, there has been progress.

Consider that The Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Edwards 1967), published in 1967, which contains articles on over 900 philosophers, did not include an entry for Wollstonecraft, Arendt or de Beauvoir. Moreover, if the index is to be believed, de Beauvoir and Wollstonecraft are not mentioned at all in any article, and Hannah Arendt merits a single mention in an article on “Authority”. Far from being canonical, these women philosophers were scarcely even marginal, warranting perhaps a passing reference in a survey of existentialism or political philosophy, but little more.[8] By 1998, however, The Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Craig 1998) had entries for all three, and also many other important women philosophers.

The project of retrieving women philosophers has a paradoxical relationship with contemporary feminist theory, however. On the one hand, it is clearly a feminist project; its originators were interested in establishing that women have been philosophers throughout the history of the discipline despite their routine omission from standard histories and encyclopedias of philosophy. However, the newly-recovered women philosophers suggest that there is little overlap among three groups: women philosophers, feminine philosophers, and feminist philosophers. For many of the newly discovered women philosophers were not feminist thinkers nor did they write philosophy in a feminine voice, different from their male counterparts. Indeed, their breadth of philosophical interests is comparable to that of male philosophers although their domain of application sometimes differs. In her introduction to A History of Women Philosophers Mary Ellen Waithe comments

If we except the Pythagorean women, we find little differences in the ways men and women did philosophy. Both have been concerned with ethics, metaphysics, cosmology, epistemology and other areas of philosophic inquiry. (Waithe 1987: xxi)

And another editor, Mary Warnock, comments “In the end, I have not found any clear ‘voice’ shared by women philosophers” (Warnock 1996: xlvii). The women philosophers restored to the tradition by feminist hands are not all proto-feminists nor do they speak in a uniform, and different, voice from their male peers.

Similarly, women philosophers who are candidates for initiation into the philosophical canon—like Mary Wollstonecraft, Hannah Arendt and Simone de Beauvoir—are a diverse crew. According to Elizabeth Young-Bruehl “That Hannah Arendt should have become a provocative subject for feminists is startling” (blurb for Honig 1995) presumably because of Arendt’s explicit criticism of feminism. And while Wollstonecraft and de Beauvoir were both feminists, they share neither a common philosophical voice nor common philosophical principles. In The Vindication of the Rights of Women (1792) Wollstonecraft argued for the education of women using Enlightenment principles, while Beauvoir’s The Second Sex (1949) reflects her Marxist and existentialist roots.

The diversity of women philosophers raises the question why their recovery or re-valuation is an important project for contemporary feminist theory. What the retrieval of women philosophers, and their inclusion in the philosophical canon has done is to challenge the myth that there are no women in the history of philosophy and the fallback position that if there are any women philosophers, they are unimportant. Lovers of wisdom that we all are, we all benefit from the correction of these mistaken beliefs. Moreover, as feminists, we are interested in correcting the effects of discrimination against women philosophers, who were written out of history, unfairly, because of their gender not their philosophical ideas.

However, what is really at issue is not philosophy’s past, but its present; its self-image as male. That self-image is created and maintained in part by a tacit historical justification. It is a damaging self-image for women philosophers today, and for women who aspire to be philosophers. The real significance of uncovering the presence of women in our history, and in placing women in our canon is the effect that has on the way we think about the “us” of philosophy.

The rediscovery of women philosophers raises the following question: How can women philosophers be re-woven into the history of philosophy so that they are an integral part of that history? Lisa Shapiro, considering the case of women philosophers in the early modern period, argues that it is not enough to simply add a woman philosopher or two to the reading list (Shapiro 2004). Rather, according to Shapiro, we need to provide internal reasons for the inclusion of women philosophers rather than relying upon a feminist motivation on the part of the teacher or editor. The history of philosophy is a story and we need to find a plot line that includes new, female characters.

One way to do this is to show how certain women philosophers made significant contributions to the work of male philosophers on central philosophical issues. We could call this the “Best Supporting Actress” approach in that the central cast remains male and the story line of philosophy is undisturbed. It is a good strategy for several reasons: it is relatively easy to accomplish, and it provides an internal anchor for women philosophers. On the other hand, it reinforces the secondary status of women thinkers and if this were the only way of integrating women philosophers, that would be an unfortunate result. The wholly inadequate interpretation of Beauvoir’s philosophical thought as a mere application of Jean-Paul Sartre’s is a good example of the limitations of this strategy. Not only does is reinforce a secondary, handmaiden role for Beauvoir, but it also promotes a distorted understanding and appreciation of her thought (Simons 1995).

Alternatively, we could find in the work of women philosophers issues that they have developed in a sequential fashion. Shapiro suggests that there are certain philosophical issues concerning women’s rationality, nature, and education that women philosophers of the seventeenth century discuss extensively in a sequential, interactive fashion. The thread extends into the following century in the work of Jean-Jacques Rousseau, Catharine Macaulay, and Wollstonecraft. Since philosophers become canonical as part of a story anchored at one end by contemporary philosophical questions that are thought to be central, the task would be to make these questions ones that we turn to the tradition for help in answering. And, of course, these are precisely the central questions posed and discussed extensively by contemporary feminism. Thus, the idea is that as we pose new kinds of questions to the history of philosophy we will find in women philosophers an important, sequential discussion that we can securely thread into our curricula and textbooks.

Scholars of early modern European philosophy have made the most headway in retrieving the philosophical works of women, inaugurating strategies for research, and providing resources for curriculum and canon revision. For this reason the discussion that follows starts with this period. Scholars of other historical periods in the European tradition, in particular of Medieval philosophy and nineteenth and early twentieth century philosophy, have now started to follow this lead to undertake the recovery of women philosophers in those periods. While it may seem odd to present the periods out of chronological order, at this stage of the development of the field we think it important to record the actual history and development of the retrieval of women philosophers. Contemporary scholars concerned to re-integrate these women into the philosophical canon have tended to adopt a strategy that does not assume that standard philosophical concepts or the canon itself are gender biased. Rather scholars aim (1) to recover and make accessible again long out-of-print texts; (2) to develop interpretations of these texts that (a) bring out their philosophical content and (b) demonstrate the involvement of these women in the philosophical debates of the period. The re-introduction of women across the history of philosophy provides occasion to examine basic methodology in the history of philosophy. The bibliographical appendix to this entry can direct readers to some recent editions of writings by historical women authors as well as secondary literature on those authors and many others beyond that cited in the article itself.

2.1 Women in Early Modern European Philosophy

From about the mid-1990s, there has been a concerted effort by scholars both to rehabilitate the works of early modern women European philosophers and to integrate at least some of these women into the philosophical canon, which has been focused on European intellectual history. These efforts illustrate how a range of different feminist approaches to the history of philosophy can be integrated together.

While many contemporary philosophers have little knowledge of the women philosophers of the early modern period, there are in fact good historical records of these women and their works. This fact has made the doxographic task of retrieving these women thinkers a relatively straightforward one, even if labor intensive. O’Neill (1998) catalogs a long list these women, and her doxographical work has provided a starting point for both expanding the list and interpreting the philosophical works of these women.

The recovery of philosophical work by women is an enormous task, and it requires both returning to archival methods that undergirded the development of philosophical canons in the nineteenth century and to leverage new digital methods to make texts accessible and determine lines of influence. Archival methods are necessary not only to recover texts that are long out of print, but also to recover materials such as pamphlets and correspondence by these women authors that provide further context (Broad 2020a, Broad 2020b, Green 2020). Digital methods can also be used to help transform entrenched practices. Resources like the The New Narratives Bibliography of Works by Women Philosophers of the Past lays bare publication history and can help in tracking intellectual networks. Resources like Project Vox provide contentful resources and curricular support. Both are being extended to other historical periods and to regions outside of the European context. In addition, digital editions of texts and manuscript materials, like the resources on the pro-woman arguments of the debate on women at Querelle and the St. Petersburg manuscripts of Emilie du Châtelet, help open research questions.

One of the central canonical themes of early modern philosophy is the reconceptualization of causation. Scholastic philosophy largely understood causation on an Aristotelian model, on which all change was to be explained by a constellation of four causes: final, formal, material, and efficient causes. Early modern thinking about causation began with a rejection of final and formal causes. Determining final causes involved a speculation that outstripped human understanding, while formal causes were dismissed as occult qualities, simple assertions that things worked without an intelligible explanation of how they did so. Several canonical figures in early modern philosophy—Descartes, Spinoza, Locke, Hume, and Kant—are often situated with respect to one another through their views on causation. In recent years, Malebranche, with his account of occasionalist causation (a view on which neither bodies nor minds have causal power in themselves, and God is the only efficient cause) has been worked into the story. What Malebranche highlights is that understanding the nature of causation was a live philosophical problem: while there was agreement about dismissing final and formal causation, there was much disagreement about what should replace it, and in particular about the nature of efficient causation. Some early modern women thinkers were very much involved in this debate, and they are just as easily incorporated into the philosophical story as Malebranche. For instance, Princess Elisabeth of Bohemia, in her 1643 correspondence with him, questions Descartes about the nature of causation between mind and body (2007: 61–73). She can be read as insisting that an adequate account of causation must be applicable in all causal contexts. Margaret Cavendish, in her Observations on the Experimental Philosophy (1666b), develops a vitalist account of causation wherein motion is not transferred from one body to another, but rather one body comes to be in motion through a self-patterning in harmony with another body around it. (The entry on Margaret Cavendish provides a more detailed summary of Cavendish’s account of causation, along with guidance for further reading.) While Cavendish’s account of causation did not carry the day, vitalism of one form or another was a dominant strand of thought in the seventeenth and eighteenth centuries. It is worth noting that vitalism is also a position within contemporary philosophy of biology.

A similar strategy for incorporating other women into the philosophical canon can be deployed with respect to one or another central topics such as the Principle of Sufficient Reason (Emilie du Châtelet 1740, 2009), or cosmology (Cavendish 1666a [1992], 1666b, Anne Conway (1690 [1996], Damaris Masham 1696, 2004, du Châtelet 1740, 2009; see Lascano 2019). Lascano (2023) develops a comparative account of the metaphysical systems of Cavendish and Conway, discussing their views on substance, monism, self-motion, individuation, and identity over time, as well as causation, perception, and freedom. The entry on du Châtelet includes a helpful discussion on her position on the Principle of Sufficient Reason, as well as an array of secondary sources. The entries on Cavendish, Masham and du Châtelet provide some detail as to their positions on particular philosophical topics.

A number of recent edited volumes have instead focused on a particular canonical philosophical theme and collected interpretations of a range of women philosophers focused on that particular topic. Thomas (2018) collects essays on women’s contributions to early modern metaphysics, with essays on metaphysics of science, ontology, metaphysics of mind and self, and the metaphysics of morality, as well as on the conception of metaphysics itself, covering such philosophers as Damaris Masham, Cavendish, Emilie du Châtelet, Bathsua Makin and Anna Maria van Schurman, Anne Conway, Princess Elisabeth of Bohemia, Mary Astell, Catherine Trotter Cockburn. Broad and Detlefsen (2017) focuses on women’s writings on liberty and freedom in the early modern period, and includes essays on Cavendish, Masham, Gabrielle Suchon, Cockburn, du Châtelet, Catherine Macaulay, Sophie de Grouchy, Mary Wollstonecraft. O’Neill and Lascano (2019) collects essays on women’s contributions across three broad thematic categories: metaphysics, epistemology and natural philosophy; moral philosophy, moral psychology and philosophy of mind; and social and political philosophy. (Note that while the majority of essays in O’Neill and Lascano’s volume concern early modern women thinkers, it is also includes women philosophers from other historical periods.) These edited collections bring home that no matter which canonical philosophical questions one finds interesting, women philosophers made substantive contributions.

One can also move to incorporate women into our philosophical history by rethinking the questions through which that history is structured. How the questions are framed influences who is taken to have interesting answers on offer. Within the early modern period, questions in epistemology are often about the nature of reason and rationality, and the limits of the human understanding. While women of the period sometimes address these questions theoretically, more often they are concerned with implications of such answers for training the human mind. For instance, many women are concerned with matters of education, and they directly relate positions on education to positions on the nature of human understanding and rationality, and incorporate the passions into accounts of human understanding. Already mentioned are the works of Anna Maria van Schurman (Schurman 1641, 1998) and Mary Astell (Astell 1694/1697 [2002]), but others including Madeleine de Scudéry (Scudéry 1644, 2003, 2004), and Gabrielle Suchon (Suchon 1693, 1700, 2010) also wrote on education (Shapiro 2018). As part of their efforts to understand how we human beings learn to reason, these philosophers also recognize that reasoning is intimately connected with our emotional life: part of reasoning well is feeling appropriately. Their discussions in which learning to reason incorporates moral education resonate not only with Spinoza Ethics (Parts 3–5) (1677) but also with Antoine Arnauld and Pierre Nicole’s Logic, or Art of Thinking (1662) and Conway’s account of metaphysical truth in her Principles (1690). In these accounts, a philosophical question emerges about how efforts to enable the exercise of human freedom in rationality also rely on the very same customs and habits that interfere with that freedom (Shapiro 2021). It would be interesting to situate British sentimentalists such as Shaftesbury and Hume with respect to these discussions. Catharine Macaulay, in her Letters on Education (1790), argues that an education that cultivates the sentiment of sympathy is essential to adults properly grasping moral truths and being motivated to act on them (see Gordon 2025).

While education is not today typically taken to be central to philosophy, a little reflection on the history of philosophy can destabilize this contemporary outlook. Descartes’s Discourse on Method for Rightly Conducting Reason (1637) is arguably a work about education; John Locke wrote Some Thoughts Concerning Education (1693) and On the Conduct of the Understanding (1706); and Rousseau’s Emile (1762) also concerns education. Equally, education is a central concern of philosophers predating the early modern period (consider Plato in Republic) and after it (consider John Dewey (Dewey 1916)). Reconsidering education as a central question of philosophy can not only facilitate seeing women thinkers as contributing centrally to philosophical projects but also bring to the fore philosophical questions more recently fallen out of fashion but which have long been compelling.

Finally, there are philosophical discussions that quite simply were central in the period, but which until recently have been largely ignored. Arguments for the equality of the two sexes emerged in the late sixteenth and early seventeenth centuries. While the so-called querelle des femmes, or debate on women, had been going on for centuries, the seventeenth century marked a turning point in the debate over the status of women as better or worse than men in virtue of their form or soul (see Kelly 1984, Deslauriers 2017). Both women and men thinkers of the period advanced egalitarian arguments. So, for instance, Marie De Gournay, in her “On the Equality of Men and Women”, (1622 and 2002) deployed a skeptical method to argue for the equality of men and women (De Gournay 2002); Anna Maria van Schurman deployed syllogistic argumentation to argue for women’s education both by demonstration and as evidence in her Dissertatio (1638) (van Schurman 1998); in her Serious Proposal to the Ladies for the Advancement of their True and Greatest Interest (1694, 1697) Mary Astell applied Descartes’s sex-neutral account of the mind (insofar as mind is really distinct from body, rationality is not tied to sex) to argue for women’s education (Astell 1694/1697 [2002]); François Poulain de la Barre in On the Equality of the Two Sexes (1673) also drew on Cartesian principles to argue for the social equality of men and women (Poulain de la Barre 2002). (Clarke 2013 collects de Gournay, van Schurman and Poulain de la Barre together.)

These discussions are interesting for a number of reasons. First, they highlight that philosophical questions of equality, and in a form of particular interest to contemporary feminists, have a history. Though anachronistic, it seems appropriate to characterize at least some of these women, along with some of their male contemporaries, as engaged in a feminist project, and conversely, that feminist arguments have a history that long predates the late nineteenth century arguments for women’s suffrage. They thus highlight a new thematic thread for the history of philosophy. Second, while the methods deployed by these thinkers are different, they all appropriate on philosophical methods—skepticism, basic rules of inference, a new metaphysics—different from what was then the dominant Aristotelian paradigm to counter misogynist claims. It is worth considering the context in which these women were writing and what it suggests about their feminist methodology in the history of philosophy. Many of these thinkers were self-consciously countering a recognized misogyny in philosophy, but insofar as they deployed philosophical methods they would seem to reject the view that the problem was intrinsic to the discipline of philosophy itself.

At the same time as these strategies in retrieving the philosophy of early modern women are proving successful, scholarship on the women philosophers of other historical periods is emerging and gaining momentum.

2.2 Women in Medieval Philosophy

Scholars of medieval philosophy have finally achieved widespread consensus that philosophy between the fourth and sixteenth centuries can be found in any number of places that aren’t simply texts written by Christian men in the so-called ‘Latin West’. Contemporary studies of European medieval philosophy thus increasingly address Greek, Jewish, and Islamic texts in addition to the Latin Christian ‘canon’ (see Marenbon 2007; Hyman, Walsh, & Williams 2010; and Adamson 2019). Yet, on the whole, philosophical scholarship continues to ignore female-authored texts from the Middle Ages. The reason for this is simple, if pernicious: traditional conceptions of medieval philosophy as taking place in monasteries, religious schools, and university settings rule out the possibility of women-authored texts because women were excluded from participating in those settings in the Christian (both Latin and Greek), Islamic, and Jewish worlds. (See Allen 2006 for a careful study of primary texts justifying this exclusion as well as medieval responses to those texts.)

In the past decade, however, there has been increasing recognition that the vast corpus of mystical and contemplative texts written by women throughout Europe in the thirteenth to the fifteenth centuries contains much of philosophical interest. Here we provide three brief examples of how medieval women engaged in central philosophical debates of their time. In order to appreciate their contributions, it is most helpful to take a topical rather than figure-based approach. Given that scholastic authors cite only figures widely recognized as authorities, women’s names do not appear in their texts; since women were excluded from university posts, we don’t have the sorts of records that allow us to trace the exchange of ideas and views between specific university masters. If we take a topic-based approach, however, we can place women’s writings into the general collage of developing views and important concepts. Our three examples concern the following topics: Self-knowledge and self-formation; reason’s role in human life; and the will’s role in human life

The importance of self-knowledge and self-formation for achieving the ultimate end of human life was widely acknowledged in medieval scholastic and contemplative/mystical discussions (see Cory 2014; Van Dyke 2023). Whereas in scholastic texts discussions of self-knowledge tend to focus on the possibility and mechanics of knowledge of self, contemplative texts emphasize the ethical and spiritual motivations for and results of such knowledge, with special attention paid to the virtues that both arise from and facilitate it. Christine de Pizan [d. 1430], for instance, literally builds her City of Ladies on self-knowledge, as the personification of Reason (who holds the mirror of self-knowledge in lieu of a scepter) helps her lay the foundations for the city—a city which then continues construction by Rectitude and finally Justice (see particularly Part One, c. 1405 [1998]). A particularly important virtue for attaining self-knowledge is humility, as Hadewijch [d. after 1250], Mechthild of Magdeburg [d. 1282], Marguerite Porete [d. 1310], and Catherine of Siena [d. 1380] make clear (see Roberts 2009; Van Dyke 2018). Knowledge of self is also frequently paralleled with knowledge of God, as when Julian of Norwich [d. c. 1416] notes in her Showings that knowing oneself is a pre-condition for knowing God, while at the same time knowing God is necessary for full knowledge of oneself (Showings, Long Text Chapter 56). Ultimately, medieval contemplatives agree that self-knowledge forms the base for all future moral and spiritual growth.

The faculty of reason is crucial for acquiring self-knowledge, but what role of reason should play in attaining our ultimate end was hotly contested outside of as well as inside university settings. In her early thirteenth century Mirror of Simple Souls, for instance, Marguerite Porete advocates for the need to abandon human rationality altogether in the later stages of our moral and spiritual development (see Porete 1993, Chapter 87, where personified Reason actually dies). At the same time, Hadewijch and Catherine of Siena emphasize the importance of reason working together with will towards our ultimate goal (see, e.g., Hadewijch 1980, Letters 10 and 18; Catherine of Siena 1378 [1980], Dialogue Chapter 85). Julian of Norwich portrays human rationality as sanctified via Christ’s incarnation, describing faith as coming from “the natural love of the soul, the clear light of reason, and the steadfast remembrance God instilled in us when we were created” (Showings, Chapter 55). Finally, Hildegard of Bingen [d. 1179], Angela of Foligno [d. 1309] and Margaret Ebner [d. 1351] go so far as to claim that union with God has enhanced their natural rational capacities, allowing them to comment with authority on Scripture and engage as equals in discussions with learned men (see Hildegard of Bingen, Scivias Preface; Angela di Foligno 2013 Memoriale IX; Ebner Revelations 1993: 100).

Debates about the primacy of the will and love in union with God are also central to medieval contemplative/mystical as well as scholastic texts, particularly in the late thirteenth-fifteenth centuries. The will is one of the two faculties that human beings were said to share with God (the other being intellect), and directing our wills towards their proper object (God) was seen as the highest form of love. For Marguerite Porete, the final stages of spiritual growth culminated in such complete surrender of will that the self itself became annihilated and only God remained (see J. M. Robinson 2001; King 2018.) Hadewijch, Mechthild of Magdeburg, Angela of Foligno, Catherine of Siena, and Julian of Norwich also depict love as the most important component of the moral and spiritual life, maintaining that love increases knowledge in an upward spiral that negates the need for formal university training. (The most famous expression of this view is Thomas à Kempis’s fifteenth century Imitation of Christ, which is indebted to these earlier discussions.) Whether our ultimate goal as human beings is to transcend our embodied existence to merge selflessly with God—however that might achieve—or whether our ultimate end is the fulfillment of human nature in its individuality—and what this might entail—remains controversial throughout the Middle Ages. Julian of Norwich is, perhaps, the best example of someone who celebrates the fulfillment of intellect and will in union with God without seeing that union as erasing the individuality of human nature (see Showings, Long Text).

2.3 Women in Late Eighteenth and Nineteenth century Philosophy

Significant new work is underway to unearth the rich history of women’s philosophizing in both the German-speaking and English-speaking worlds of the late eighteenth, nineteenth, and early twentieth centuries. Recent work has shown that German women were intentionally excluded from German histories of philosophy (Ebbersmeyer 2020), and so despite these women thinkers having written in the relatively recent past, they have already gone missing. Scholars are now deploying the strategies that have been used successfully in recovering the philosophical work of women in the early modern period to identify women intellectuals whose work is philosophical; recover their writings and make them accessible through re-editions and translations; develop interpretations of their work that takes care to highlight central philosophical themes they address and situate these women with respect to canonical figures and philosophical movements.

Dyck 2021 provides a set of ground-breaking essays that highlight women in eighteenth century and early nineteenth century German philosophy. Essays document women’s involvement in Leibnizian-Wolffian philosophy (Sophie of Hanover and Johanna Charlotte Unzer), their contributions to the philosophy of education (Dorothea Christiane Erxleben and Amalia Holst), their engagement with Enlightenment debates (Wilhelmine of Bayreuth and Elise Reimarus) and Kantianism (Maria von Herbert and Theodor von Hippel on the status of women in Germany) as well as the legacy of German philosophy in the nineteenth century, especially through the writings of French-Swiss author Germaine de Staël and American abolitionist Lydia Maria Child. In his introduction to the volume, Corey Dyck distinguishes among discussing women philosophers, women in philosophy, and women and philosophy, drawing attention to questions about what counts as philosophy and who counts as a philosopher both within a particular historical context and contemporary conceptions of philosophy.

Kristin Gjesdal and Dalia Nassar have recently co-edited both a volume of primary text translations by German women philosophers of the nineteenth century, as well as an Oxford Handbook of Nineteenth-Century Philosophers in the German Tradition, which includes the first efforts of interpretive scholarship on many of these figures. Women philosophers discussed in detail include Dorothea von Schlegel, Rahel Varnhagen, Bettina von Arnim, Rosa Luxemburg, Edith Landmann-Kalischer, and Edith Stein. The volume highlights women’s contributions to the philosophy of nature, philosophy of science, philosophy of language, moral philosophy and aesthetics, as well as Spinozism, pessimism, and empiricism. It details women’s participation in philosophical movements including Idealism, Romanticism, Neo-Kantianism, and Phenomenology.

Lydia Moland and Alison Stone have also recently co-edited a companion Oxford Handbook of American and British Women Philosophers in the Nineteenth Century. Individual women philosophers discussed include Mary Shepherd on metaphysics, Ednah Dow Cheney on aesthetics, Marietta Kies on moral philosophy, Mary Shelley on philosophizing through literature, and E.E.C. Jones on the philosophy of language. In the nineteenth century in the United States, Black women philosophers such as Sojourner Truth, Anna Julia Cooper, Frances Watkins Harper, and Maria Stewart also contributed substantially to philosophical discussions. Women philosophers of the period in the English-speaking world contributed not only to intellectual movements from socialism to pragmatism to transcendentalism, but also directly to the philosophical foundations of social movements, including those for suffrage, abolition, pacifism, and the philosophy of education.

Addressing the contributions of nineteenth-century African American women to philosophy, though, not only entails identifying what traditional philosophical topics or issues they engaged, but also how they engaged them. Political and moral philosophy, and more particularly natural law theory and its relation to theology and Christian ethics, tend to constitute the traditional forms of philosophy that they engaged, while embodied forms of rationality, particularly in terms of race and gender as discussed by philosophers Emmanuel Chukwudi Eze and Linda Martín Alcoff, constitute how they engaged these topics (Eze 2008; Alcoff 2006). Race, however, played a major role in both. Historian Joan Bryant recently argued that race was a complicated phenomenon in nineteenth-century America that went well beyond biological references, particularly for nineteenth-century African-American male social reformers and thinkers (Bryant 2024). As a set of “disparate ideas and…assorted practices” that “structured human difference, hierarchy, sameness, and consciousness” for these “reluctant race men”, as she dubs them, race’s complexity included a slippage in meaning due to its many “configurations” and “functions” (Bryant 2024: 327). As partners of these men, nineteenth-century African-American female social reformers and thinkers philosophized within the context of this complicated phenomenon of race as well. However, the historical, social, and political context in which these Black women philosophized still meant dealing with the biological assumptions that Euro-Americans held about them and their people, since these assumptions were first and foremost about power and control.

The prevalence of slavery and anti-Black racism in the United States made the idea of a thinking, creative, and expressive Black woman—much less one that could philosophize—foreign to most Whites. Early attempts by anti-slavery advocates to demonstrate that Blacks could be equal to Whites in reasoning and cultural accomplishments were met with incredulity, even outright rejection. Thomas Jefferson’s dismissal of Phillis Wheatley, an African slave girl whose poetry was celebrated on both sides of the Atlantic in the late eighteenth century, is exemplary of such incredulity and rejection (Jefferson 1787 [1995: 665]).[9] As philosopher Devonya Havis recently argued, though,

there was more at stake than a repudiation of her skill[;]… the primary issue was that Wheatley represented a quintessential disruption in the ideological restriction of the humanness of Blackness. (2023: 78)

Black people were simply not human, or at least not in the same way as Whites.

Like Wheatley, then, nineteenth-century African-American women social reformers and thinkers—such as Maria W. Stewart, Mary Ann Shadd Cary, Frances Ellen Watkins Harper, and Anna Julia Hayward Cooper[10]—had first to defend themselves and their people as human beings with all the abilities, feelings, and rights of Whites before they could defend themselves as women. To this end, and “from the standpoint of their own experiences”, to use philosopher Julie K. Ward’s apt phrasing, they demonstrated their abilities to philosophize by “synthesizing anew” the discourses of freedom available to them (Ward 1998: 80). This included the universal humanism in British philosopher John Locke’s natural law theory, which informed the nation’s founding documents, and the equality of all people in the Hebraic and Christian scriptures, whose moral authority Locke used to support his articulation of natural law.[11] In other words, as Emmanuel Eze might put it, Stewart, Cary, Harper, and Cooper “reasoned vernacularly” by re-constructing philosophical and theological discourses on human being through their experiences so that they might elicit shared moral judgments about human being and human relations from their White audiences (Eze 2008: xvi–xviii, 84–98, 125–129).

The idea of human being that Stewart, Cary, Harper, and Cooper engaged in the political philosophy grounding and informing the Declaration of Independence and the Constitution was the enlightened idea that Locke had formulated in his Essays on the Law of Nature from the 1660s and elaborated in his Two Treatises of Government from 1689 and his Essay Concerning Human Understanding from 1690 (Jefferson 1776 [1995: 448–449]; Locke c.1660–1664 [1988]; Locke 1689 [2003: 261–387]; Locke 1764 [1952]; Locke 1706 [2004: 77–78, 83, 316–321]).[12] Locke maintained that an enlightened or liberal society, based on a practical or empirical understanding of human being, as opposed to an essential or metaphysical one, could be oriented around self-interest, that is, as concern for one’s material well-being, ongoing betterment, and contentment, and as such, sanctioned by divine or natural law and protected by government (Darwall 2023: 90–100; Woolhouse 2007: 38, 339; Locke c. 1660–1664 [1988, 93–215]; Locke 1689 [2003: 261–309]; Locke 1764 [1952: 3–54). In 1776, a century after Locke published his Essays on the Law of Nature, nearly a century after he published his Two Treatises of Government, and nearly a century after many English colonists had not only become familiar with Locke’s Treatises, but had also begun to appropriate his ideas of human being and property in order to promote colonial expansion and individual betterment (Arneil 1996: 168–187), Jefferson presented this cluster of ideas in Locke’s theory (along with several others) in the soon-to-be famous lines of the Declaration of Independence:

We hold these truths to be self-evident, that all Men are created equal, that they are endowed by their Creator with certain unalienable Rights, that among these are Life, Liberty, and the Pursuit of Happiness—That to secure these Rights, Governments are instituted among Men, deriving their just Powers from the Consent of the Governed…. (Jefferson 1776)

Jefferson made Locke’s practical idea of human being—a rational being only motivated by self-interest—and Locke’s ethics based upon that idea—a divine command to function in this way—the centerpiece of a new republic focused on human rights, with a government focused on the protection of those rights and of property (Darwall 2023: 90–100; Miller 1977 [1991: 14–18]; Arneil 1996: 187–194). As the “pursuit of happiness” or the ability to create one’s own empirical or material well-being, ongoing betterment, and contentment included property in African slaves for many of the founders—Jefferson included, in spite of his promotion of liberty and denouncements of slavery, and in spite of Locke’s ultimate distancing of himself from slavery—a parallel stream of anti-slavery arguments challenged Locke’s and especially Jefferson’s positions, particularly on religious and moral grounds (Jefferson 1776 [1995: 449]; Jefferson 1785 [1970: 91]; Jefferson 1786 [1970: 91–92]; Miller 1977 [1991: 38–45]; Locke c. 1670 [2003: 230]; Locke 1689 [2003: 272–274]; Locke 1764 [1952: 15–17]; Wootton 1993: 117; Arneil 1996: 127; Uzgalis 1998: 49–77; Woolhouse 2007: 111, 187; Moore 2023: 11, 146–165; M. C. Robinson 2025).[13]

British thinkers such as the writer Samuel Johnson and Anglican divine John Wesley critiqued Great Britain for the immorality and abuses that slavery produced as part of the nation’s unchecked expansionism or pursuit of economic aspirations through colonizing ventures, particularly as they negatively affected both persons of African descent and Indigenous peoples (Moore 2023: 153–165; M. C. Robinson 2025). It was social-reform and civic-minded Quakers, though, who provided some of the most powerful and relentless challenges to slavery and to Jefferson’s adoption of Locke’s philosophy (Jordan 1968: 193–198, 271–294). In doing so, they provided basic arguments that gave women like Stewart, Cary, Harper, and Cooper an important entry into this conversation, particularly through a close family member, friend, or formal education (Jordan 1968: 194–195, 272–276, 289–294; M. C. Robinson 2025). Following George Fox, the founder of Quakerism (Fox 1694 [1984: 57–125]), leading eighteenth-century Quakers such as John Woolman, Anthony Benezet, and David Cooper acted on religious conviction when they pointed out the violation of divine and natural law, particularly in the glaring contradiction of championing freedom, while robbing others of theirs (Jordan 1968: 194–198, 274–276, 289–292). In doing so, though, they were not so much against self-interest per se, that is, as the pursuit of one’s material well-being and betterment, as they were against the selfish self-centeredness that an excessive and unchecked self-interest could foster (Jordan 1968: 274–276, 289–292).

Maria W. Stewart, whom literary scholar Marilyn Richardson dubs “America’s first Black woman political writer” (Richardson 1987a: iii), inherited and re-synthesized these arguments in the context of her own and her people’s experiences and in light of her and her deceased husband’s work with Black revolutionary David Walker (Richardson 1987b: 5–21) by using the revolutionary discourse of the founding documents and the same passages from the book of Genesis that Locke had used to identify, dignify, and validate White individuals, particularly White men (Stewart 1831 [1987: 29–41]), as property producers. In the process, she not only critiqued Whites like Locke and Jefferson for “keep[ing] Blacks ‘down’, ‘while’ they ‘sit up yonder’, acting as though they are ’better than’ Blacks, all so that they might justify exploiting ‘the blood of our fathers … and the tears of our brethren that have enriched [their] soils’” (Stewart 1831 [1987: 29, 40]; cf. Arneil 1996: 125–127; Locke c. 1670 [2003: 230]). But she also encouraged, indeed, called, Black women and men to “CLAIM [THEIR] RIGHTS”, even though they had long been denied them (Stewart 1831 [1987: 40]). Ratcheting up the revolutionary rhetoric, she even said to Black women, not just Black men, to “possess the spirit of men, bold and enterprising, fearless and undaunted” so that they might “sue for their rights and privileges”, or at least “know the reason [they] cannot attain them” so that they might be willing “to die” to attain them (Stewart 1831 [1987: 38]).

All of this rested upon Stewart’s bold claim against conventions of the time that Black men and women were endowed with the same “glorious image” of God, presented in Genesis 1:26–27, as everyone else:

Many think, because your skins are … sable … that you are an inferior race …, but God does not consider you as such. He hath formed and fashioned you in his own glorious image, and hath bestowed upon you reason and strong powers of intellect. He hath made you to have dominion over the beasts of the field, the fowls of the air, and the fish of the sea … and according to the Constitution of these United States, he hath made all men free and equal … It is not the color of the skin[, then,] that makes the man, but … the principles formed within the soul. (Stewart 1831 [1987: 29])

In other words, she not only claimed Locke’s idea of human being for Black people, but she also expanded upon it in Christian ethical terms by saying that the person who possesses this image must be a person of integrity, someone who will acknowledge, not abuse the image of God in others, as they pursue their own material well-being and contentment.

Mary Ann Shadd Cary, whom media historian Jane Rhodes identifies as the first Black woman newspaper editor and the second Black woman lawyer, possessed the same radical spirit as Stewart (Rhodes 1998: xi). Indeed, during her abolitionist career, when she focused on enslaved Black women, Cary appealed to New Testament ethics, particularly Jesus’s summary of the commandments as “love of God and love of neighbor” (Matthew 22:37–40; Deuteronomy 6:5; Leviticus 19:18). Doing so, allowed her to identify slavery as an “evil” and a “sin”—a common abolitionist theme—that had particularly onerous effects on Black women (Shadd Cary 1858 [2024: 65–69]). Like Stewart, Cary also appreciated and appealed to the Lockean natural law theory in the nation’s founding documents. Indeed, her 1849 letter to abolitionist Frederick Douglass, then the editor of the North Star, confirms this, where she speaks of blacks becoming farmers so that they could be “producers … not merely … consumers” (Shadd Cary 1849 [2024: 25–26]). In her 1858 sermon, though, Cary was concerned to illuminate the selfishness that could easily be validated in Locke’s natural law theory, especially as Jefferson and others had practiced it. Hence, following the Quakers, she distinguished between natural law and what she took to be “the higher law” of God—the aforementioned love of God and neighbor (Shadd Cary 1858 [2024: 65–68]; Matthew 22:37–40). On her view, the improper implementation of natural law in the actual laws of the United States had led to the sin of slavery and with it the failure to acknowledge and respect the image of God in Black people, especially Black women (Shadd Cary 1858 [2024: 66–68]). In the duty to love, “God’s law”—“the higher law”—challenges this (Shadd Cary 1858 [2024, 68]).

We cannot successfully evade duty because the suffering fellow … be only a woman She too is a neighbor … I speak plainly because [we share] … a common origin and because were it not for the monster slavery we could have a common destiny here—in the land of our birth. (Shadd Cary 1858 [2024: 66, 67–68])

Cary concluded, then, that “the voice of woman” must be heard above all others since she is “the greatest sufferer from chattel slavery or political proscription” (Shadd Cary 1858 [2024: 68]).

In making these claims, Cary, like Stewart and the Quakers, was not rejecting Jefferson’s Lockean idea of divinely sanctioned self-interest per se. She did not think that interest in one’s own material well-being, ongoing betterment, and contentment was inherently selfish. She simply recognized that the founders’ implementation of Locke’s theory had expressed such selfishness and led to the abuse and the exclusion of Black people, particularly Black women. As a result, she viewed the divine commands to love God and neighbor as a clear check on such selfishness. It defined the integrity of which Stewart spoke that would make it impossible for Whites who claimed to be Christians to ignore the image of God in Black people, especially Black women. Like Stewart, then, Cary did not merely reclaim Lockean natural law theory, but she made it clear that it had to be informed and accompanied in practice by Christian ethics so that it would not become ideological “idolatry” in the hands of the powerful (V. Lloyd 2016: x–xi). If White men like Locke and Jefferson were going to appeal to the Bible, they needed to be ready to abide by its New Testament ethics.

Abolitionist poet, educator, and all-around social reformer Frances Ellen Watkins Harper agreed. Like Cary and Stewart, she too fought for the rights of Blacks by focusing on Black women. And like Cary and Stewart, she did so out of religious conviction. But, as intellectual historian Marcia Robinson explains, Harper took a slightly different approach to the natural law theory in the nation’s founding documents and Christianity’s relationship to it (M. C. Robinson 2024).[14] Harper did not simply use religious and moral ideals to check the abuses of Jefferson’s Lockean self-interest as Cary and Stewart did (Harper 1893 [1988: 216–225]). But she also took issue with the very idea that the creation myths in Genesis 1–3 could be used, as Locke had used them, to interpret human beings almost exclusively as self-interested property producers. That is, Harper took issue with the way that Jefferson and the other founders had deliberately excluded slavery from the Declaration of Independence, thereby failing to address and to denounce it precisely where they, following Locke, drew upon the Bible (Harper 1859a [1990: 47–48]; Harper 1893 [1988: 218, 224–225])—namely, where Jefferson re-presents Locke’s “unalienable rights” of “life, liberty, and property” as “life, liberty, and the pursuit of happiness”, as historian John Chester Miller and political scientist Barbara Arneil reveal (Jefferson 1776 [1995: 449]; Miller 1977 [1991: 12–18]; Arneil 1996: 191). As a result, Harper faulted them for saddling the new republic with a host of injustices, abuses, and social problems from the start, including the ongoing theft of Indigenous lands and the exploitation and abuse of Black women (Harper 1859a [1990: 47–48]; Harper 1893 [1988: 61–72, 134, 146–147, 216–236]). Her primary concern, then, was not simply to challenge the excesses and abuses of Whites’ self-interest so that Black people could gain access to the same rights and privileges of American citizenship as Whites, even though she too was concerned about this (Harper 1859b [1990: 103–104]). Rather, Harper’s fundamental concern was the kind of human relations and human society that the nation’s ideals, based on human being in the image of God and elaborated by Jesus’s love ethic, portended. Those relations, she maintained, should not only define and facilitate a multi-racial democracy in the United States, but they should also influence the actions of the nation’s people at all times and in every sphere—economic, political, social, cultural, and especially religious (Harper 1859b [1990: 103–104]).

In taking this position, Harper recognized that even before slavery had been abolished, free Black people like herself, who were aspiring to be part of the nation’s middle class, were also inclined to adopt the position of the property producer in America’s slaveholding, overly commercialized society. They believed, she maintained, that “money” was “a symbol of power” that could “gain for” them “the rights” that “power and prejudice” had “denied” them (Harper 1859b [1990: 103]). She immediately saw the error in this belief. “It is no honor”, she reminded her fellow Black men and women seeking wealth, “to shake hands politically with” wealthy White men and women “who whip” Black “women and steal” Black “babies” (Harper 1859b [1990: 104]). In other words, she basically told them that they could earn all the money they wanted, but that would not earn them the respect that they sought nor improve the lot of their enslaved people. “The important lesson we should learn”, she proclaimed,

is how to make every gift, whether … fortune or genius, subserve the cause of crushed humanity and carry out the greatest idea of the present age, the glorious idea of human brotherhood. (Harper 1859b [1990: 104])

In other words, for Harper, the true idea of America, as implied by those “unalienable rights” based on the image of God, was the potential of and the call to right human relations. Material well-being and contentment were secondary. The government’s task, however, was to protect both.

Educator and activist Anna Julia Cooper expanded, indeed, went well beyond Harper’s, Cary’s, and Stewart’s positions, as scholars Louise Daniel Hutchinson, Leona C. Gabel, Frances Richardson Keller; Vivian M. May, and Vincent W. Lloyd all reveal in their respective interpretations of Cooper (Hutchinson 1981; Gabel 1982; F. R. Keller 2006; May 2007 [2012]; V. Lloyd 2016). To start, Cooper received a formal education that allowed her to earn both a bachelor’s degree and a doctorate (Cooper 1892 [1988: 76–78]; Hutchinson 1981: 3–43, 131–143; Gabel 1982: 12–24, 60–69). As part of qualifying for the latter, Cooper wrote a dissertation at the Sorbonne that took France’s leading figures to task for failing to recognize the humanity of Black slaves in Saint-Domingue (present-day Haiti), even as they championed the republican ideals of freedom, brotherhood, and equality (liberté, fraternité, egalité)—another expression of the natural law tradition, indeed one directly connected to the American natural law tradition (Cooper 1925 [2006]). As feminist scholar Vivian May maintains, Cooper used both critical analysis to interrogate French political and economic history and dialectical and intersectional reasoning to point out the way in which wealthy French men’s “pursuits of happiness”, to use Jefferson’s phrase (Jefferson 1776 [1995: 449]), ultimately became not only a rejection of the humanity of Black people in France’s former colony (May 2007 [2012]: 110–139 [ch. 4]), but also a means for her to develop what would ultimately become “the key terms of today’s dependency theory of global political economy” (May 2007 [2012]: 110 [ch. 4]).

Cooper also expanded, refined, and deepened the way that Black women could think about human being, particularly in terms of what might best constitute “the pursuit of happiness”, which made her both akin to and different from Jefferson or Benjamin Franklin, as historian Peter Moore elaborates this idea (Cooper 1892 [1988: 12]; Jefferson 1776 [1995: 449]; Moore 2023: 11). Key to her thinking was French feminist Germaine de Staël and her romantic idea of the self, which accords with Cooper’s own dialectical idea of the American experiment (Cooper 1892 [1988: 12, 149–174]; Bergès 2025). Following de Staël, Cooper maintained that

happiness…consists not in perfections attained, but in a sense of progress, the result of our own endeavor under conspiring circumstances toward a goal which continually advances and broadens and deepens till it is swallowed up in the Infinite. (Cooper 1892 [1988: 12])

“Happiness”, for her, was not in the attainment of any particular “endeavor”, but rather in the sense of betterment that comes with striving itself, that is, with striving towards something unbounded or eternal that defines the human subject as human and so is able ultimately to fulfill it. Hence, unlike most of the nation’s founders, not to mention most Americans, Cooper did not reduce “happiness” to the pursuit of material gain and pleasure. Rather, she grounded it in the potential fulfillment of the human subject’s active spiritual, moral, and creative power in a state of being that has no bounds. This makes Cooper’s idea of the self akin not only to de Staël’s endlessly developing self, but also to other eighteenth- and nineteenth-century philosophical ideas of the self—and a long Platonic tradition in Christianity—something Jefferson may well have appreciated in his more generous moments.

For Cooper, as well as for Harper, Cary, and Stewart, then, the idea of America was the idea of human potential itself—morally, spiritually, creatively, politically, and/or economically conceived—for each of them participated in an ongoing national conversation about this potential, typically framed in terms of the meaning of America and taking place in a variety of public venues. Being part of such a wide-ranging conversation was not merely an academic affair. Their own and their people’s future rested upon its viability.

2.4 Historiographical Questions

These efforts to recover the women philosophers of the past and their works raise a number of historiographical questions. First, and foremost, it challenges us to think about how we arrived at the historical philosophical canon that we have, in ways that move beyond the discussion in the contributions to (Rorty, Schneewind, and Skinner 1984). Recent work by Sabrina Ebbersmeyer (2020) and by Delphine Antoine-Mahut (2020) shows how political agendas have figured in the telling of philosophical history in Germany and France. In these histories, certain philosophical topics rose to the fore, while others were discounted. But in discounting the value of a set of philosophical themes, these canonical histories of philosophy have also shaped the dynamics of contemporary philosophical discussions, privileging some topics rather than others, just as much they privilege some figures. This recovery work asks us to cast a critical lens on the philosophical topics we take to be central (Shapiro 2016). Second, recovering the philosophical work of women requires an openness to the genres of writing proper to philosophy. Work in medieval philosophy shows that women used genres of spiritual writing to advance their philosophical ideas. In early modern period, women used polemics, poetry, novels, plays, school curricula, as well as treatises, to articulate their philosophy, and this use of a range of genres, as well as publicly circulated forms of expression such as pamphlets, newspapers and journals to engage in philosophical discussion. Attending the variety of genres of philosophical writing raises questions about the boundaries of philosophy as a discipline. Questions about how to demarcate philosophical work also arise in noticing that many women’s philosophical work aims to directly influence public opinion, for instance, about the equality of men and women, and indeed of all human beings, and about the social and political implications of that equality, including the need for and structure of educational institutions, the immorality of slavery, and the right to political representation through voting. What is the relation between the philosophical work done in formal academic environments and that done in the public sphere? Much of the work of recovering the philosophical work of women of the past has been focused squarely on the European and Anglophone philosophical traditions. This focus invites questions about how the exclusion of women from the history of philosophy intersects with the exclusion of others, and in particular Africana philosophers, and other philosophical traditions from the history of European philosophy.

3. Feminist Appropriation of Canonical Philosophers

Feminist philosophers are also changing the history of philosophy by appropriating its ideas for feminist purposes. From the perspective of negative canon formation, the history of philosophy is a resource only in so far as it describes the theories and thinkers that were most deeply in error. Other feminist historians of philosophy have found important resources for feminism in canonical philosophers. Indeed, they have found valuable concepts even in the worst offenders of the negative canon, like Aristotle and Descartes.

For example, in The Fragility of Goodness Martha Nussbaum has described the virtues of an Aristotelian ethics with its emphasis on the importance of concrete context, emotion, and care for others in an ethical life (Nussbaum 1986). And Marcia Homiak has argued that Aristotle’s rational ideal, far from being antithetical to feminists, actually captures some of feminism’s deepest ethical insights (Homiak 1993). With regard to Descartes, Margaret Atherton has argued that his concept of reason was interpreted in egalitarian rather than masculinist terms by several women philosophers of the eighteenth century, and was used in their arguments for equal education for women.[15]

Other feminists have urged the reconsideration of the views of canonical figures, like Hume and Dewey, who have played only a minor role in the negative feminist canon. For example, Annette Baier has argued at length for the value of a Humean perspective in both epistemology and in ethics for feminist theory (Baier 1987, 1993). And, in Pragmatism and Feminism Charlene Seigfried argues for the value of pragmatism for feminism; a position also taken by Richard Rorty (Seigfried 1996; Rorty 1991). Feminists have used the strategy of appropriation with a wide range of philosophers including Hegel (Mills 1996), Foucault (Hekman 1996), Kierkegaard ((Léon and Walsh 1997), and Derrida (Holland 1997).

It is interesting to note that some of the very same philosophers who were cast as the villains of the negative canon are also mined by feminist theorists for useful ideas. Indeed, it is likely that every philosopher, from Plato to Nietzsche, who has been condemned to the negative canon also appears in some feminist’s positive canon. This is perplexing. After all, if feminists evaluate canonical texts so differently, it raises questions about the coherence of feminist interpretations of texts. Is Aristotle a feminist hero or villain? Are Descartes’ ideas dangerous for feminists or useful to them? If feminists have argued both positions, we begin to suspect that there is no such thing as a feminist interpretation of a philosopher. And this might lead us to wonder about the coherence and unity of the project of feminist canon revision.

Why is it that feminist philosophers have reached different, and even sometimes incompatible interpretations of the history of philosophy? One answer is that the multiple and contrary readings of the philosophical canon by feminists reflects the contested nature of the “us” of contemporary feminism. The fact that feminist interpretations of canonical figures is diverse reflects, and is a part of, on-going debates within feminism over its identity and self-image. Disagreements among feminist historians of philosophy over the value of canonical philosophers, and the appropriate categories to use to interpret them, are, in the final analysis, the result of debate within feminist philosophy over what feminism is, and what is theoretical commitments should be, and what its core values are.

Bibliography

Comprehensive Bibliography

Supplementary Document:

Bibliography of Feminist Philosophers Writing about the History of Philosophy
[by Abigail Gosselin, Rosalind Chaplin, and Emily Hodges]

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Acknowledgments

The authors note that Sections 2.2 and 2.4 of the 2021 update was written by the new coauthor, Lisa Shapiro, who also contributed some new listings in the Bibliography. Section 2.1 was written by Christina Van Dyke, who also contributed to the listings in the Bibliography, and Section 2.3 was written by Lydia Moland and Marcia C. Robinson, who also contributed new listings in the Bibliography. The first author, Charlotte Witt, is grateful to Lisa, Christina, Lydia and Marcia both for their contributions, but also for writing the new material in a way that could be easily incorporated into the existing text.

Copyright © 2025 by
Charlotte Witt <cewitt@cisunix.unh.edu>
Lisa Shapiro <lisa.shapiro@mcgill.ca>
Christina Van Dyke <cvdyke@calvin.edu>
Lydia L. Moland <lydia.moland@colby.edu>
Marcia Robinson <mrobin03@syr.edu>

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