Pregnancy, Birth, and Medicine

First published Thu Feb 17, 2011; substantive revision Fri May 17, 2024

Pregnancy and birth can be approached from many philosophical angles, including philosophy of law, philosophy of biology, and mereology. Some authors have focused on ethical issues surrounding abortion and assisted reproduction, others have discussed pregnancy in phenomenological terms, and others have used pregnancy and/or birth as a springboard for more theoretical reflections on the nature of selfhood, care, embodiment, and personal identity (see entries on feminist perspectives on reproduction and the family, parenthood and procreation, and the grounds of moral status for discussions of these and related issues). In this article, however, we will focus on pregnancy and birth insofar as they are treated as medical processes and situated within a medical context. This includes not only problems during pregnancy that require medical care and intervention, but also normal pregnancy and birth, which are highly ‘medicalized’ in most developed countries. (The boundary around this topic is necessarily imperfect, since medical, legal, metaphysical, experiential, and other contexts intersect. For instance, one cannot responsibly examine the ethics of treating the fetus as a medical patient without at least considering the legal ramifications of doing so.)

We will begin with a general discussion of pregnancy and childbirth as medicalized processes. We will then move on to three categories of ethical issues: (1) issues arising in the course of obstetrical care for women who are taken to be competent and capable of autonomous decision-making; (2) issues that arise when women are decisionally incompetent or when their right to decisional autonomy is in question; (3) issues concerning the management and communication of reproductive risk.

1. Medicalization

Pregnancy and childbirth have become increasingly medicalized in most parts of the world since the early twentieth century. That is, they are increasingly processes that—in fact and as a social ideal—are managed and overseen by medical professionals, typically involve a high degree of technological medical intervention and contact with clinics and hospitals, and are assessed by medical experts who are the authorities on their progress. Amy Mullin explains that medicalized pregnancy “involves interpreting pregnancy itself as a disruption to health that necessarily requires expert medical intervention, and thinking of pregnancy as primarily about health and illness” (Mullin 2005, 54). The concept of medicalization is helpful in making clear how this sort of insertion into a medical context is not (or not simply) a response to fixed biological facts, but rather a contingent social and institutional process. In general, medicalization comes with both benefits and burdens, and the medicalization of pregnancy and birth is no exception: while medical interventions have lessened many risks (e.g. death from placenta previa and ectopic pregnancy), other medical interventions have become routine despite having no proven benefit and some proven added risks for patients (e.g. routine fetal monitoring, normalization of the lithotomy position for childbirth, and episiotomies). Recent years have seen increasing reference to, and criticism of, the over-medicalization of pregnancy and childbirth, and opposing narratives of pregnancy and birth continue to grow in visibility and support. These narratives may aim to de-medicalize the notion of normalcy in pregnancy and birth, or centralize the knowledge and competence of midwifery (e.g., Lyerly 2012; Shaw 2013). Others have drawn attention to the relationship between over-medicalization and misogyny in obstetric care, highlighting widespread failures to respect normal standards of patient autonomy and informed consent in childbirth, “too much too soon” medical intervention, and obstetric violence (e.g., Flanigan 2016; Shabot and Korem 2018; Kingma 2021).

Both inside and outside the clinic, pregnancy is treated as a medical event requiring intense risk management, monitoring, and appeals to expert medical knowledge. Pregnant women are expected—per social norms and as part of responsible motherhood—to regulate and monitor their eating, drinking, fetal kicks, weight gain, sleeping position, exercise, and many other aspects of their lives according to standards established by medical professionals (Kukla 2005; Seigel 2014). Prior to birth, most pregnancies will involve medical interventions such as genetic testing, ultrasound screening, and prescriptions to control various symptoms and risks. In some countries, there has been a vigorous mandate to involve medical professionals in helping women regulate their bodies in accordance with medical standards for minimizing reproductive risk even prior to conception (Kuehn 2006). Technological intervention in birth in developed countries regularly includes labor-inducing drugs, spinal epidurals, and fetal monitoring. Surgical birth (caesarean section) has been increasing in frequency in many countries, despite growing concerns about its overuse (e.g., Ghosh and James 2010; Betrán et al. 2021). Some critics have voiced concerns around the normative influence of such trends. Rebecca Brione suggests, for example, that “reliance on medical technology in labour creates the sense that use of such expertise is required for a safe birth: it is seem as a guarantor of results, removing responsibility from the mother” (2015, 75). Importantly, however, the rate and intensity with which such interventions are offered or imposed is far from uniform; statistical analyses continue to demonstrate a striking disparity of benefits enjoyed as a result of medicalization, for pregnant patients and their babies alike, even in high- and upper-middle-income countries (Roberts, 2009). Both neonatal death and stillbirth are twice as common in babies born to Black women than to White women, whilst babies born to Hispanic-identified women had a threefold higher rate of neonatal death than those born to White women (Sheikh et al. 2022). In the UK, Black women are four times more likely than White women to die during pregnancy and childbirth; in Asian women, this risk is twice as high as in White women, and “women living in the most deprived areas of the UK are almost three times more likely to die than those in the most affluent areas” (Limb 2021).

The widespread medicalization of pregnancy and birth has had several ethically noteworthy effects. First, medicalization has encouraged us to imagine pregnancy and birth as inherently high-risk, pathological processes that it is irresponsible to undertake without large amounts of expert help and surveillance (see e.g. Lupton 1998; Brione 2015). Second, when medical professionals become the primary managers of reproduction, pregnant women’s epistemic privilege is undermined and they are arguably reduced to playing passive roles in their own pregnancies and births (e.g., Freeman 2015). Professional advice tends to focus exclusively on the behaviour (diet, exercise, sleep, and so on) of pregnant patients and not on the behaviour of partners or employers, or on the effects of environments such as offices or public transports; further this advice is also often framed in terms of avoiding harm to the fetus. As a consequence, “while pregnant women are rarely seen as actively contributing to the work of nurturing the fetus, any ‘inappropriate’ behaviour (including failure to adhere to all recommendations, such as taking particular vitamins) may be seen as detracting from the development process. There is therefore a perceived need for medical professionals to monitor and ‘manage’ pregnant women to ensure their compliance with medical advice” (Baron 2019, 497). Third, some have argued that medicalization has rendered pregnancy in general, and labor and birth in particular, more alienating and stressful for women, burdening them with constant and complicated responsibilities for elaborate risk management and bodily and behavioral surveillance (for review see, e.g., Mykitiuk and Scott 2011; Savell 2012).

Among the voices pushing back against the medicalization of reproduction are those insisting that pregnancy is a ‘natural’ process that generally needs no technological assistance, and advocate ‘natural’ childbirth, free of labor-inducing and pain medications and attended by midwives rather than doctors (see section 2.2. for more detailed discussion). There are reasons for philosophers to be as wary of the ‘natural’ birth movement as of uncritical, unchecked medicalization (Kukla 2005, Lyerly 2006 and 2012, Purdy 2001). Typically, its advocates do not specify a clear concept of the ‘natural’—for example, they have no account of why prescription pain medications are ‘unnatural’ while acupuncture or pain-relieving herbs are ‘natural’. Nor do they explain why the ‘natural’ is prima facie better or more ethical. More broadly, this account of pregnancy and birth involves comparable pressures on pregnant women to conform to rigid standards of attitudes and behaviours, and, like the medicalized account, is in danger of de-politicizing and essentializing the experience and management of pregnant women (Beckett 2005, Malacrida and Boulton 2014). An important point put forward by Frank Chervenak and Laurence McCullough (2006) is that the alternative to medicalized pregnancy is not necessarily ‘natural’ pregnancy. Rather, medicine is one institution among many that vies for control over the cultural use and significance of obstetric technology; pregnancy is likely to continue to be technologically intensive no matter how this struggle plays out.

2. Ethical Issues in Obstetrical Care

In this section, we examine ethical issues that can arise in the course of obstetrical care for women whose decisional autonomy and competence are not in question.

2.1 Prenatal Diagnosis and Screening

It is becoming increasingly routine to test fetuses for a variety of genetic and other anomalies. Ultrasound screening for various morphological anomalies and the Maternal Serum Alpha-Fetoprotein Test (MSAFP) that screens for trisomy chromosomal disorders (such as Down syndrome) are routine parts of prenatal care. Other tests such as amniocentesis and genetic testing for Tay-Sachs disease are common. It seems clear that the range of conditions and traits for which prenatal testing (PT) is possible will continue to grow rapidly, allowing parents and society at large new forms of control over what sorts of children are born, and enhancing the level of medicalization and surveillance during pregnancy. These tests raise a variety of ethical issues.

2.1.1 Issues for Pregnant Women

Some authors (e.g. Robertson 1996) have argued that PT straightforwardly enhances women’s reproductive autonomy, on the grounds that all PT is, strictly speaking, voluntary (even if routinization and social pressures together may guide women towards choosing it), and such tests give prospective parents a form of increased control over their reproductive lives. However, there are reasons to doubt that increased access to PT translates directly into an increase in women’s autonomy. Prenatal screening and diagnosis does not, at the very least, obviously or in principle operate to enhance free choices for women; further, it contributes to cultural forces portraying pregnancy as an inherently risky and perilous process (Duden 1993). Virtually all women undergo routine ultrasound testing and accept measurement of maternal serum alphafetoprotein (MSAFP) testing when it is offered to them. Nancy Press and Carole Browner (1995) have used qualitative evidence to argue that women tend to see the choice to accept MSAFP tests as the “responsible” choice that “protects the health” of their babies, even though the only intervention available in the case of a positive test (indicating a neural tube defect) is abortion. Several authors have pointed out that increased routine medical surveillance during pregnancy has put new pressure on women to shoulder the responsibility for producing socially acceptable, productive citizens, and for disciplining their own bodies and laying them open to medical intervention and surveillance in accordance with this goal (Tremain 2006, Kukla 2005, Roberts 2009). The availability and routinization of PT may thus compromise women’s autonomy in some ways while increasing it in others. As testing and abortion for fetal anomalies becomes more common, women who choose not to test, or who choose to carry an impaired fetus to term, may face diminished support and increased blame for their choice (Lawson 2003). PT can create unrealistic pressures on women to emotionally bond with or disengage from their fetuses on cue (Kukla 2005a, Kukla 2008, Mitchell 2001), and to keep their relationship to the pregnancy ‘tentative’ until tests come back negative (Katz-Rothman 1993).

2.1.2 Issues for Future Children

A variety of ethical concerns have been raised with respect to how PT may impact future children. Some authors worry that PT helps to inculcate an inappropriate stance towards parenting: perhaps parents will come to desire or expect that children will match an advance set of idealized expectations, translating into an overly controlling attitude towards their children later in life; perhaps when carrying pregnancy to term becomes conditional upon the fetus having certain traits, our love for our children once they are born may become similarly conditional (Rothschild 2005; Asch and Wasserman 2005). At the moment, almost all PT screens or diagnoses well-defined medical disorders such as Down syndrome and Tay-Sachs disease. Ethical concerns will likely become yet more acute as the technology develops, particularly if it extends to testing for traits that are not clearly pathological, such as homosexuality, aggression, or a propensity to obesity.

It is often argued that it is wrong to bring a child with a disability into the world if we can avoid doing so (i.e. Savulescu 2001, 2007; Davis 2001). However, this claim is sometimes considered in tension with the much discussed “nonidentity problem”, introduced by Derek Parfit (1976, 1984) and adapted to the reproductive ethics context by many authors (e.g., Steinbock 2009, Wasserman 2005, Brock 1995) (see the entry on the nonidentity problem). In short, the problem is that you cannot harm a non-existent person by bringing them into existence, unless the person’s life is so dreadful that nonexistence is preferable. Some philosophers take an antinatalist stance, arguing that human life in general is prima facie worse than non-existence (e.g., Benatar 2006), but it is far more widely held that bringing a child into existence does not typically count as harming that child. That life with a disability or chronic illness is predictably worse than non-existence is not plausible for most of the genetic mutations for which we test—notably including Down syndrome, which is the most common target for testing and abortion.

Appeal to the nonidentity problem in reproductive ethics leads quickly to results that many find philosophically puzzling or implausible. For example, if a woman is carrying twins and requires a selective abortion, and one of the fetuses is known to have a serious anomaly while the other does not, many people feel it would be wrong to choose to keep the fetus with the anomaly. And yet, the fetus with the anomaly does not itself have the option of becoming an anomaly-free child; it will either become a child with a disability or not exist at all. We can be doing this child no harm by choosing it over its healthy twin, and its twin, if it counts as a being that can be harmed at all by being aborted, is not harmed in any extra way in virtue of having a twin who will live with an anomaly. Another problem, raised by Glover (1977): imagine that a woman is taking a medication that will cause substantial fetal deformities if she conceives while taking it, and need only wait until she finishes her course of medication to conceive a child without this risk. Most of us feel that it would be callous and unethical of her to deliberately conceive while taking the medication. But why, exactly? Any child she conceives during this time will have these limb deformities, but its other ‘option’ is nonexistence; and limb deformities, while burdensome perhaps, don’t make a life not worth living. She does not wrong the child by conceiving it. Nor does she harm any nonexistent child that she might have brought into existence later on, for you cannot harm a nonexistent being. Variations on this problem and its practical and theoretical implications have been widely discussed and continue to feature in heated debates in bioethics (e.g., Boonin 2014, McMillan 2014, Jecker 2012).

According to this line of reasoning, going out of one’s way to create a disabled child through genetic engineering, selective abortion, or preimplantation genetic diagnosis (PGD) cannot count as harming the child, since that particular child has no options for existing other than as disabled. (This issue has most often come up with respect to deaf parents, who sometimes prefer to have a deaf child—e.g. in Wasserman and Asch 2012). And yet, many writers have the strong intuition that intentionally creating a disabled child is a wrong done to the child—for instance, Silvia Camporesi (2010) argues that “choosing deafness with PGD is unjust toward [the child] because it is a broad limitation to a ‘reasonable array of different life plans’.” The non-identity problem forces us to search for an explanation of what sort of injustice this could be, given that this child could have had no non-limited future to start with. Responses to the non-identity problem may conclude that (1) indeed there is no wrong done by bringing someone into the world in a way that compromises her opportunities for flourishing (Heyd 2009), or that (2) the wrong involved is not one done to the child—for instance, it might be wrong on roughly consequentialist grounds (Brock 1995), because it promotes problematic values or reflects unacceptable motivations (Kumar 2003), or because it fails to promote the interests of an alternative possible child (Holtug 2009), or (3) that the non-identity problem is illusory, and that someone can indeed be harmed by being brought into existence (Benatar 2006, Harman 2004).

As Roberts and Wasserman (2009) note, different strategies for resolving the non-identity problem emerge from different accounts of harm—e.g. as concerning states of affairs, or as (uniquely) concerning identifiable individuals—and will therefore have distinctive implications for obligations of beneficence and non-maleficence in reproduction. For some commentators, however, debate surrounding the non-identity problem carries tenuous import for real-life procreative decision-making, and offers little help to prospective parents in addressing the ethical challenges associated with reproduction (e.g. Overall 2012, 154). A strategy for addressing the non-identity problem, then, is not equivalent to a strategy for addressing the challenges of harms and benefits to future children for prospective parents. (See the entry on parenthood and procreation for further discussion).

2.1.3 Social Concerns and the Disability Rights Critique

Many have worried that the increasing routinization of PT is tantamount to eugenics. As the term is paradigmatically used, eugenics involves an intentional, top-down planned social program for engineering an entire population so as to eliminate or propagate particular traits. Those defending either strong rights to procreative liberty or strong responsibilities of procreative beneficence (e.g. Robertson 1996, 2003; Savulescu 20007; Mills 2011; Elster 2011) defend PT against charges that it should be understood as ethically equivalent to eugenics by emphasizing the role of individual, autonomous parental choices in controlling this technology. Yet some doubt that any genuine procreative freedom is preserved when PT is treated as required (e.g., Sparrow 2011). Many have argued that a kind of bottom-up eugenics will be instituted through the routinization of PGD and PT; as declining control and accepting devalued traits in one’s children become less socially acceptable choice for prospective parents, some homogenization of the gene pool and elimination of diversity will emerge regardless of whether this is anyone’s planned agenda (Tremain 2006, Rothschild 2005). Furthermore, while individual parents may be free to decide whether or not to avail themselves of tests, which tests are available will likely reflect and entrench existing social norms regarding valuable and disvaluable traits (Sparrow 2007, Malek 2010). Some have argued that PT, particularly as linked with selective abortion, has expressive meaning for everyone with that condition: it symbolically suggests that not only this fetus’s life but the life of anyone who has this trait is not worth living or preserving, perpetuating and reinforcing denigrating social attitudes toward persons with disabilities (e.g. Saxton 2000, Edwards 2004, Valentine 2024). Or, one might argue that it is the routinization of testing—the practice of checking for a condition and making abortion available as a ‘normal’ part of ‘responsible’ prenatal care—is what has expressive devaluing significance. It follows that individual decisions to use these tests may collectively instantiate a eugenic and/or ableist project that reflects these values, even if this project does not belong to any centralized intentional agent. On the other hand, it seems that we already engage in such ‘bottom-up’ eugenics by taking steps to have children with valued traits, whether by seeking out attractive mates or by taking folic acid during pregnancy (Mahowold 2002). The question is, then, whether the routinization of PT introduces eugenics in a new and problematic way, and if so, whether this worry is sufficient to override its advantages.

A related but distinct critique of PT draws upon the disability justice movement in order to critically question the increased routinization of PT and selective abortion (Asch and Wasserman 2005, Parens and Asch 2000). In general terms, the disability rights critique raises the worry that PT and selective abortion risk further stigmatizing disabled people and harming disability communities. It points out that the offer of a prenatal test for a particular trait is never neutral; it implies that a reasonable person might wish to know whether her fetus has this trait, and that this information might reasonably be the basis for a decision not to continue the pregnancy. Although many contributors to the disability rights critique of PT consider themselves firmly in favor of general abortion rights, they share at least a prima facie worry about the ethics of aborting fetuses on the basis of tests for future disability. One such argument concerns the entrenchment of the medical model of disability, according to which a disability is a pathology or impairment of an individual body. On this model, the disabled person is less able to perform various functions than the able-bodied person due to these physical differences (rather than social or environmental barriers and exclusion). Further, assuming it is the job of medicine to fix bodies or at least minimize the undesirable effects of their medical conditions, it is appropriate for doctors to fix or mitigate disability when they can (Saxton 2000). The routinization of PT arguably institutionalizes the idea that disability is a medical condition detected at the level of the individual body, and entrenches the practice of ‘fixing’ disability through a medical intervention—specifically, the extreme intervention of simply eliminating the disabled body. According to the disability rights critique, this limits our ability to imagine addressing and alleviating disability at the social level.

Some arguments suggest that the routinization of PT and abortion for a particular condition will weaken the relevant disability community. PT and abortion will come to be seen as the only responsible and socially supported option, threatening quality of life and availability of resources for those who remain, who may be faced with increased stigmatization and less possibility for community. Some commentators deny that things have gotten worse for people with disabilities since selective abortion of fetuses with impairments has gained popularity (e.g. Overall 2012, 166). However, the rarer a condition is, the less social and political motivation will exist to provide resources, support, tailored educational activities, and the like for those who have it. A connected concern appeals to the distorting effect on decision-making of current genetic counseling practices, which do not include any exposure to people who have the tested-for conditions or any discussion of the social resources available for families with children with the conditions. Even supposedly nondirective counseling often uses stigmatizing language to talk about disability and the choice not to abort a fetus with a disabling trait, and reflects unsupported negative judgments regarding the abilities of and quality of life for persons with disabilities (Asch 2000, Madeo et al. 2011). In order for genuinely informative and trusting interactions to take place between counselors and prospective parents, however, counselors must be equipped with “disability competencies,” which involve experience with disabilities and understanding of how various disabilities affect lives and families; improving counseling practices will require mandatory training in these areas (Sanborn and Patterson 2014).

A further argument (mentioned above) suggests that PT encourages an inappropriately commodifying and perfectionist approach to potential children: by allowing particular traits to determine reproductive decision-making, potential parents adopt an attitude of conditional acceptance that is directly at odds with the nurturing and devotion children need to flourish (Asch and Wasserman 2005). Others, however, question the requirement of so-called unconditional love, given that this requirement has developed in a context where mothers are judged by the completeness of their caregiving roles, and where other social factors impeding good care and acceptance are ignored (e.g. Gedge 2011). Some critics of PT reject the assumption that bearing and raising a child with a disability is inevitably more burdensome than raising a non-disabled child—Marsha Saxton, for instance, argues that it is not disability itself that burdens women who have disabled children, but rather the unjust circumstances of caregiving, where ongoing sacrifices are expected from mothers, and community resources and support remain woefully inadequate (2000, 2006). However, as long as this state of affairs remains, it is hard to deny that raising a child with a disability can be a serious challenge for many people.

Assuming that we believe that some, but not all, prenatal tests should continue to be available, we need to ask more specific questions: for example, which traits and conditions we ought to be testing for and which traits it is permissible to test for. Disability theorists have worried that it seems nearly impossible, in practice, to draw a line between acceptable and unacceptable tests. Nearly all scholars agree that testing for Tay-Sachs or other diseases that lead to a short life filled with intense suffering and no hope of a cure is ethically acceptable, and nearly all agree that testing for vanity traits such as eye color would be unacceptable. But when it comes to deciding which conditions are ‘serious’ enough to warrant the availability of prenatal tests, there is little agreement. Anywhere this line is drawn risks risks treating the ‘seriousness’ of a condition as a fixed medical fact rather than as a potentially socially malleable state of affairs; and further risks stigmatizing those with ‘serious’ conditions and belittling the challenges faced by those with ‘unserious’ conditions (Parens and Asch 2000). We also need to settle which, if any, of these tests will be covered by insurance, and how we want to manage the consequences of PT for later insurability. We need to decide whether procreative liberty and privacy rights give parents the right to test their fetuses for what we might consider morally unacceptable reasons, such as sex-selection. Finally, we must decide how we will manage and control the genetic information that results from prenatal tests, which can have significant consequences for other, genetically related family members who might have a strong stake in knowing or in not knowing this information. All of these questions are the subjects of vigorous bioethical debate; a classic source that discusses all the above issues is Buchanan et al. 2000. Other widely cited authors and collections contributing to these discussions include Harris 2010 and Shakespeare 2006.

2.2 Birth and Mode of Delivery

Disagreement between advocates for birth medicalization and ‘natural’ birth often centre upon the nature of childbirth: a dangerous and abnormal process best managed by medical experts in an institutional setting, or a ‘natural’ and ‘normal’ bodily function requiring formal medical intervention only in unusual cases? Proponents of ‘natural’ childbirth point out that current norms of hospital birth often result in a cascade of interventions; recent research points to routinization of interventions such as induction and episiotomy, leading to medically unnecessary treatments for some women and negative—or even traumatic—experiences of hospital delivery. When misused, technology can subjugate women to medical authority, undercut their sense of dignity and control, and alienate them from the birth process; however, it can also be used to enhance women’s agency, alleviate fear, and mitigate the pain of childbirth. Meanwhile, a relatively ‘natural’ birth that does not get caught up in a cascade of medical interventions can be empowering. But natural childbirth advocates often paint an idealized picture of how birth is supposed to proceed (see also Crossley 2007), and treat ‘success’ at natural childbirth as a mark of maternal character (see also Kukla 2008). Women who for various reasons—including pre-existing medical conditions or various complications during labor—do not manage to have a vaginal delivery free of pain medication and medical intervention may feel that they have ‘failed’ to give birth properly. Lyerly (2006) argues that the problem with modern birthing practices is not the use of technology or the lack of it per se, for technology itself has no inherent meaning or import. Rather, the problem lies in a culture of birth that is expert-centered rather than patient-centered, and in the imbalance of power and control that then arises. This perspective is at the heart of Emily Martin’s critique of hospital delivery norms, in which she compares the choice of home-birth (and that of non-compliance with standard operating procedures in hospital delivery) to political resistance. She describes women’s ‘sabotage’ of hospital policies and systems, including stalling going to the hospital as long as possible by hiding the progress of labour, surreptitious eating and drinking against nurses’ orders, and walking around the hospital or taking long showers so that fetal monitors cannot be used (1989, 186–7). Women’s interference with machines and sterile tools is compared to Luddite attacks on machinery; and in the choice of home-birth, “there is perhaps the most effective tactic of all, the equivalent of opening up your own shop or becoming your own boss: never going to the hospital at all and having your baby at home” (1989, 143).

Disrespect for patient autonomy in obstetric care has been a subject of critique by feminist scholars and proponents of midwife-assisted birth for several decades. Some have criticised the tendency to pathologise deviations from statistical norms in the progression of labour, noting that hospital policies often allow for little personal variation from patient to patient; interventions such as induction, administering of pitocin, or caesarean section may be encouraged or even demanded if a labouring patient strays too far from the standardised timeline. A systematic review of women’s treatment during childbirth across the globe found widespread reports of patients “feeling a loss of autonomy, including objectification and disrespect of safe traditional practices and birthing positions, which rendered them passive participants” (Bohren et al 2015, 18). Another large-scale analysis found frequent reports that medical service providers failed to meet professional standards of care in childbirth, including refusals to provide pain relief and failure to obtain informed consent; women reported that invasive examinations and interventions such as episiotomy were carried out without explanation or permission (Beck 2018, 99). Some writers have argued that the over-medicalization of pregnancy and childbirth is not alone responsible for disrespectful service provision, disregard for patient autonomy, or obstetric abuse. They highlight the contributing effects of pervasive normative stereotypes of appropriate maternal behaviour as self-sacrificial, a perceived duty to protect the fetus from “irresponsible” maternal choices, and widespread trends within the broader sphere of medical service provision treating women as unreliable in managing or reporting their own health (see e.g. Baron 2019; Criado-Perez 2020; Kingma 2021).

Advocates for midwife- or doula-assisted delivery (at home or in midwifery centres) often present this as a more respectful and less interventionist alternative to over-medicalized hospital delivery, sometimes characterising this mode of delivery as “woman-centred.” Proponents of the medical model of birth, on the other hand, argue that while serious complications during labor are reasonably rare, they can occur quickly and their effects can be catastrophic, and it is simply good risk reasoning to have the expertise and resources of high-tech medicine available during labor. Some ethicists go so far as to argue that physicians have a moral responsibility to refuse to attend home birth. The choice of home birth over hospital delivery is framed here as a matter of the patient’s subjective desires (regarding childbirth experience) being prioritised unreasonably over the needs and wellbeing of the fetus (see e.g. Chervenak et al 2013; Matějek 2014). The attitude that childbirth is always a potential medical emergency, and that hospital delivery is therefore the only responsible choice, underlies laws in some countries—such as the Czech Republic and Hungary—which prohibit attendance at home births by midwives and physicians (see Chen and Cheeseman 2017; Baron 2023b). Nonetheless, even fervent critics of home-birth acknowledge evidence that midwife-assisted home birth offers numerous benefits for labouring patients: Lachlan de Crespigny and Julian Savulescu compare the choice of home-birth to putting one’s child in the car without a seat-belt, but recognise that, “Women have less pain at home and increased satisfaction, plus fewer episiotomies, lacerations, postpartum haemorrhages, retained placentae and infections” (2014, 3). Chervenak et al argue that physicians have a moral responsibility to refuse to attend home birth, but suggest that, “Current, inappropriate practices may be fueling the recrudescence of planned home birth. Physician leaders need to closely scrutinize organizational policies and practices and should see to it that staffing is competent and adequate” (2013, 35).

A further ethical debate surrounds the choice of caesarean delivery for non-medical reasons. Empirical evidence does not decisively support either vaginal or caesarean delivery as clearly superior. A 2006 NIH State of the Science conference assessed the available scientific evidence concerning the short and long term risks to women and infants of vaginal and surgical delivery, and concluded that there was insufficient evidence to issue a recommendation concerning the relative safety of planned vaginal and caesarean births. The most comprehensive meta-analyses reveal different risks in each case that are hard to commensurate and a dearth of high-quality data. Thus from a narrowly medical evidence-based point of view there is no justification for recommending one approach to delivery over the other (Minkoff 2006, Lee and D’Alton 2008). There is no validated and universal medical code to indicate such deliveries, and therefore no clear data showing whether elective caesareans (typically referred to as Caesarean Deliveries on Maternal Request, or CDMRs) significantly impact the overall caesarean rate. Nevertheless, some worry about the prevalence of caesarean sections indicating the rise of a technological imperative in standard obstetrical practice (Burrow 2012). Women who elect for caesarean deliveries without medical necessity are sometimes stereotyped as “too posh to push”, and seen as privileging their own convenience over their children’s well-being and their maternal responsibilities; these narratives bear resemblances to those regarding women’s choice of home-birth over hospital delivery. However, as Elizabeth Chloe Romanis and Anna Nelson note, the categorisation of CDMRs as straightforwardly “elective” has problematic connotations. It may obfuscate the fact that CDMRs are often chosen “due to an underlying health condition that, while not meeting the threshold of severity to make caesarean a clinical necessity, is still significant and might be impacted by vaginal delivery”; and the fact that whether a caesarean delivery is deemed medically necessary is “a matter of clinical discretion” (2020, 726–7).

Some of the ethical literature on this issue (Minkoff and Chervenak 2003, Schwartz 2004) takes it as obvious that incorporating CDMR into obstetrical practice would enhance patient autonomy (by giving pregnant women more options), and then asks whether this advantage is offset by the harm of medically unnecessary surgery. But others have argued that autonomy consists of more than choice, and that in social context, making CDMR routinely available might actually impede women’s autonomy (Bergeron 2007; Kukla et al. 2009; Burrow 2012). Furthermore, the act of offering CDMR may itself contribute to the normalization of technologically intensive birth and medicalization—this would appear to be supported by the widespread trend of growing rates of caesarean section mentioned above (see Ghosh and James 2010; Betrán et al. 2021). In a context where doctors have high cognitive and social authority, and technological intervention and management are associated with safety, the offer of CDMR will not be a neutral offer but one that has performative force and a normative valence: it may well alter the patient’s preferences and her understanding of what counts as a socially sanctioned choice, creating “a technological imperative that cuts against autonomy” (Burrow 2012, 45).

2.3 The Fetus as Patient

Medical care for pregnant women generally impacts fetuses, whether by design or as a side effect. Likewise, direct attempts to provide medical assistance to fetuses inevitably impact the women in whose bodies they reside. A recurring issue in obstetrical ethics concerns whether and when the fetus should be conceptualized as a patient in its own right. Doing so has substantive and complex implications for doctors, who have distinctive duties to their patients, as well as other possible legal and ethical consequences. In several papers (the first published in 1996), Chervenak and McCullough have argued that late-term, viable fetuses ought to be conceived of as patients who are owed beneficence and respect for their (future) autonomy. A pre-viable fetus, in their view, should become a patient if and only if the pregnant woman autonomously chooses to grant it such status. Once the fetus is a patient (a status that they consider to be distinct from personhood), they argue that the doctor has a duty to try to protect its well-being and balance its needs against the needs of the pregnant woman.

While at times the interests of the woman and the fetus may diverge, typically these interests are inextricably related, both because expectant mothers usually care intensely about fetal well-being, and because protecting the health of the pregnant woman is typically the best way to protect the health of the fetus (Mattingly 1992, Lyerly, Little and Faden 2008a). Nevertheless, many feminist bioethicists have been concerned that conceiving of the fetus as a separate patient tends to imaginatively bolster the personification of the fetus; it encourages conceiving of the mother and fetus as beings with entirely separate interests, which may then be in conflict as easily as aligned (Brione 2015; Baron 2019). Rebecca Brione suggests that “at the very least, it must be recognized that the ability and tendency to view the unborn fetus as a separate person is likely to exert a subtle bias on the patient’s decision-making, which must be recognized if such decision-making is to be truly autonomous” (2015, 75). Elselijn Kingma points out that the nature of maternity care makes it unique “in that it harms one patient (the mother) not primarily for the promotion of her own health but for the benefit of another (the baby)” (2021, 456). Although in other medical contexts, such as living-donor transplantation, this is recognised as a factor demanding particularly careful attention to informed consent and the protection of autonomy. However, in maternity care, “the altruistic sacrifice is deemed normative; its ethical legitimacy is assumed; and consent procedures are often minimal or absent” (2021, 459).

Maternal-fetal surgery to correct serious anatomical anomalies (such as spina bifida) is a relatively new field of medicine, evolving through experimental interventions. Such procedures were originally known—and widely continue to be known—as ‘fetal surgery’, a label that overlooks the fact that, in all fetal surgeries the pregnant woman undergoes surgery herself. This may be more or less invasive: open fetal surgery involves the opening of the uterus (and demands that this and any future babies are delivered by caesarean section); fetoscopic surgery is minimally invasive, and requires only small incisions. Early assessments of ‘fetal surgery’ considered only the risks and potential benefits to fetuses, while the medical consequences for women were understudied and received short shrift in the informed consent process (Lyerly and Mahowald 2001). At a 2000 conference on ‘fetal surgery’ at Vanderbilt University, Susan Wolf suggested the switch to the term ‘maternal-fetal surgery’; this terminology was adopted by the NIH, and by many—though not all—practitioners and commentators (ibid). However, even the switch to describing such surgeries as involving two patients whose well-being must be weighed separately may be insufficient, since this language may still reproduce a conceptual separation: “there is little terminology available that allows us to discuss the maternal-fetal relationship without seeming to refer to two entities” (Baron 2019, 492). In both theory and practice, maternal-fetal surgery raises a number of ethical issues we discuss in this article, including questions concerning pregnant women’s autonomy, consent under social pressure and in the shadow of powerful social values, and attitudes towards disability (Antiel 2016).

One such question concerns the extent to which offering maternal-fetal surgical interventions presupposes burdensome normative stereotypes of maternal love and self-sacrifice, and of the relative importance of (a) fetal prospects and (b) the best interests of a pregnant patient. This applies not only to existing forms of maternal-fetal surgery, but also to experimental forms and to potential future uses of such techniques in the context of ectogestational intervention (that is, the use of external gestation environments). Considering this latter possible context, Claire Horn describes the emotional force of motherhood as something that would sway her own decision-making: “I don’t believe that individual doctors should be permitted to run untested experimental interventions on preterm babies under any circumstances [...] But I also know that if the preterm baby in question was my baby, the actual, tangible baby that I have been carrying for months, then I might feel differently. I might say yes to something that had never been tested, or attempted only once on animals, if I was offered the narrow possibility that it could work” (2023, 38). We need not assume that maternal love will necessarily sway the reasoning of every patient; acknowledging that it will have a powerful influence on patient deliberations in some cases is enough to suggest that even offering experimental interventions in the field of maternal-fetal surgery has potential to constrain women’s autonomy and not only to expand it. We noted above that the disability rights critique of PT argues that the offer of a prenatal test for some trait is not neutral; on the same argument, the offer of (established or experimental) maternal-fetal surgical interventions implies that a reasonable mother might accept risks to her own health and well-being for the sake of the fetus.

3. Compromises of Pregnant Women’s Autonomy

When a pregnant woman is decisionally competent, health care practitioners and ethicists strongly privilege her right to make final treatment decisions in complicated cases where her interests may conflict with those of her future child (although see section 3.2 below). But when the pregnant woman has diminished or no autonomy, the situation is murkier. In this section, we take up ethical issues that arise in the medical management of pregnant women who are decisionally impaired, as well as the question of whether it is ever ethically justifiable to override a pregnant woman’s autonomous refusal of medical intervention for the sake of the well-being of her fetus.

3.1 Incapacity for Autonomy: Pregnancy in Decisionally Impaired Women

When a patient is decisionally impaired or incapacitated, ethical dilemmas concerning medical decision-making arise: Should the patient be included in decision-making in a limited way, to the best of her abilities, or should paternalistic decision-making take over? Should a proxy decision-maker make choices on the basis of the patient’s best interest, or by simulating as best she can the autonomous decision that the patient would have made, had she been in a position to make one? Such issues are familiar in the context of end of life care and care for children and the cognitively impaired.

When a pregnant woman is decisionally impaired or incompetent, however, there are extra layers of ethical complexity to contend with; her treatment typically affects not only her, but also her child to-be. The developing fetus clearly has welfare (or at least future welfare) interests, but no capacity for autonomous choice, and we have no formula for combining its interests and moral claims with those of the mother. For extra complication, the well-being of the child to-be is typically not independent of the well-being of its mother. Further ethical issues may arise in cases where, prior to serious decision impairment (due, for example, to massive brain injury or brain death), the pregnant woman has autonomously expressed her preference to continue to gestate and give birth. In such cases, ethicists at both the clinical and policy-making level may face questions about how to respect the pregnant woman’s autonomy while balancing concerns for the potential child. They may be required to consider how external factors such as available caregivers for the potential child may factor into the possibility and desirability of going forward with the pregnancy. Thus doctors must balance autonomy-based and beneficence-based obligations to the pregnant woman, along with beneficence-based obligations to the fetus (e.g. Coverdale et al. 2004).

3.1.1 Pregnancy in Fully Incapacitated Women

Cases have arisen in which a pregnant woman has zero decisional capacity and no hope of future agency, for instance when she is in a long-term persistent vegetative state or has suffered frontal brain death and is being kept alive artificially (for discussion of recent case studies see, e.g., Warren et al. 2021). The central questions raised in such cases include whether it is ethical to keep a pregnant woman alive for the sole purpose of continuing the pregnancy, who should make this determination, and which considerations should factor into that decision. Some such cases demonstrate the continuing power of fetal protection legislation in contexts where anti-abortion laws are in place. For example, in 2013, a woman from Texas became brain-dead at 14 weeks pregnant, and was kept on life-support against her and her family’s wishes, until it was established that her fetus was also brain dead (Ecker 2014); a similar case took place in Ireland a year later (Hurley 2015).

In some of these cases, questions about how to include the woman’s voice or respect her agency are off the table, and her welfare interests, if any, are minimal. She has no conscious experience or future narrative to protect. We may, however, believe that she still has interests in dignity and in having her former narrative and values respected. Protecting these interests may preclude certain forms of treatment of the dead, including artificially continuing pregnancy (Sperling 2006, 77–80). Protecting these interests may also, conversely, raise issues regarding performing abortions on pregnant women who have become brain dead (Watt 2016, 57–58). Some feel that it is unacceptable to use a pregnant woman’s body as a mere means by continuing her life solely for its incubation function (see e.g., Lindemann Nelson 1994; Purdy 1994). Lindemann Nelson argues that the woman no longer exists as a person of the sort that can have agent-relative duties towards her fetus; she worries, furthermore, that such extraordinary measures help enforce an image of the fetus as already a person with a claim on resources as large as or even larger than that of existing persons.

This image seems to underpin arguments in favour of forced interventions such as cesarean section for the sake of fetal benefit when a pregnant patient refuses to accept medically advised interventions (see e.g. Savulescu 2007a; Deshpande and Oxford 2012). In the context of forced treatment of living women—whether considered legally competent or otherwise—“recent fetal protection efforts seem to hold pregnant women to significantly greater responsibilities to their fetuses than parents to their living children” (Baron 2023a, 66). However, in cases in which the pregnant patient has suffered brain-death or similar, it is difficult to analogise obligations to the fetus and obligations to one’s living child; it is far more conceivable that a court would mandate the donation of a brain-dead parent’s blood or organs to their sick child than that they would consider mandating such a donation by a living parent. Anna Smajdor has recently argued that the use of brain-dead women’s bodies as fetal incubators could be analogised to organ donation, calling this “whole body gestational donation” (2022); whilst this argument prompted controversy, it raises the question of whether objection to one, but not the other, is more a symptom of moral squeamishness than of a clear distinction in the ethics of our instrumental use of deceased persons’ bodies.

Others might argue that if the father-to-be wants to raise his child, it is callous to deny the child-to-be its chance at life and the father his chance at parenthood in virtue of abstract concerns about instrumentalism and respect. The woman will experience no extra suffering, and no thwarting of her autonomous preferences, assuming she left no advance directive—but here, it is important to note there are still a large number of jurisdictions (including at least thirty US states) in which authorities may invalidate the prior advance directives of pregnant patients for the sake of fetal benefit (Krause 2023, 807).

3.1.2 Pregnancy in Decisionally Impaired Women

Pregnant women with limited capacity for autonomous agency and decision-making (due to cognitive disability, mental illness, drug use, etc.) still have the right to have their (limited) autonomy respected and fostered to the largest extent possible. At the same time, both they and their future children must be protected somehow from harms that bad choices stemming from decisional impairment could cause. Such women are often particularly socially vulnerable and frequent targets of manipulation; they face multiple barriers to having their reproductive and sexual health needs recognized and met (e.g. see Greenwood and Wilkinson 2013 on women with intellectual disabilities). Protecting their agency and well-being as well as the well-being of their future children can thus be a delicate negotiation. Furthermore, physicians and family members may not be neutral parties when it comes to assessing a pregnant woman’s level of decisional competence: if they disagree with her expressed desires concerning her own care (for example, her opposition to abortion, or refusal of medication or bed rest) or believe her choices put her fetus at unacceptable risk, they may be motivated to overestimate her level of decisional impairment, thereby justifying paternalistically overriding her expressed wishes.

In the UK case NHS Trust v JP [2019] EWCOP 23, the court approved a request to have a pregnant woman with learning disabilities covertly placed under general anaesthetic and have her child delivered by caesarean section, contrary to her express wishes. Williams J gave approval for this order despite acknowledging that the young woman in question, JP, was “likely to experience distress, distrust, anger, frustration at both the deception that may be necessary and the carrying out of a surgical procedure against her will in respect of such a profoundly important matter” (¶43, i). However, the court’s judgement—and that of the practitioners and family members who had supported it—was proven unfounded when JP went into labour ahead of her due date, attended hospital, and delivered a healthy child through natural childbirth without any need for sedation or restraint.

Douglas Diekema (2003) points out that decisional capacity is not a threshold capacity, and that it may fluctuate with timing, context, and type of decision. Hence, in settling on how much paternalism is appropriate in managing a decisionally impaired patient, doctors have a responsibility to try to find a time and approach that will promote and assist rather than foreclose the possibility of the patient’s meaningful autonomous participation in medical decision making. Facilitating patients’ autonomy in reproductive decision-making while protecting their best interests is perhaps especially challenging in cases where mood or personality disorders may erratically influence decision-making capacity (e.g. Zalpuri et al. 2015). Coverdale et al. (2004) argue that respecting the autonomy of decisionally compromised patients involves actively working towards removing or diminishing circumstantial and reversible barriers to participation in decision-making. This might include education, creative forms of involvement in decision-making from loved ones, postponing a medical decision until after psychotropic medication has had time to become effective, accommodating a patient’s special needs for an environment conducive to making a decision, etc. The presence of a fetus should not serve as ground for detracting from our duty to protect a pregnant woman’s right to participate in decisions about her own care to whatever extent she is capable (which is not to say that paternalistic interventions on behalf of her or her fetus’s welfare are never appropriate for decisionally impaired women).

3.2 Overriding Autonomy: Forced Interventions During Pregnancy

When a decisionally competent pregnant woman refuses an intervention that doctors judge provides a substantial benefit or life-saving intervention for her fetus, is overriding her refusal ever ethically justified? It is typically a sacrosanct principle in medical ethics that patients have an absolute right to refuse medical interventions, including life-saving interventions, if they make an autonomous, informed, competent choice to do so. However, in the case of pregnant women, this principle has been questioned and sometimes violated by force in the name of protecting the fetus. Examples have included forced cesarean deliveries, mandatory HIV testing, and life-saving blood transfusions performed despite religious objections (Kingma and Porter 2021; M’hamdi and Beaufort 2021). In 2009, Samantha Burton was forced to stay in hospital for prescribed bedrest when her membranes ruptured at 25 weeks. Burton’s competence was not in doubt, but her interests in leaving the hospital (to return to her other children and her job) were overridden because her fetus could be exposed to greater risk if she failed to comply with bedrest orders. The hospital’s obstetrician testified in favour of court-ordered care in the role of the fetus’s attending physician, and the judge ruled that any interventions required for the fetus should be administered. A few days later the fetus was delivered by cesarean, already dead. Another case concerned an asylum seeker in Ireland who sought an abortion after discovering that she was pregnant as a result of rape; despite finding that her life was indeed in danger, the health authority refused her request. When, in protest, the woman (known as Ms Y in court documents) went on hunger strike, a court-ordered caesarean section was carried out against her will at 25 weeks gestation (Fletcher 2014). These cases illustrate the restriction of pregnant women’s rights to refuse interventions, which have been treated as violable in cases where refusing care may harm the fetus (for discussion see Cantor 2012; Flanigan 2016).

Cases of forcing a manifestly competent pregnant woman to undergo an intervention over her objections have been increasingly rare in the last two decades. However, forced interventions are still sometimes performed on women who are vulnerable due to poverty, mental illness, immigration status, racism, etc. (Roth 2003, Roberts 1996). These vulnerable women, whose contact with the health care system is more likely to be fragmented, are more open to being assessed as incompetent when their expressed decision differs sharply from the judgment of medical professionals responsible for their care. Social marginalization can create the appearance of incompetence, and it can also genuinely hamper competence when it comes to negotiating physician-patient interactions. Nevertheless, there is now widespread legal and ethical agreement that pregnant women, as autonomous adults and full citizens, do not lose their rights to privacy and bodily integrity in light of their pregnancy. Even when the survival of a fetus depends on a pregnant woman undergoing some intervention, she can no more be compelled to consent to it than anyone else could be compelled to undergo a medical intervention to save another person. Although ordinary requirements for informed consent may be waived in extreme emergencies—and childbirth may sometimes give rise to such emergencies—Flanigan argues that this cannot justify discounting patient autonomy or the need for consent, especially since “women in labor are more likely than other patients in emergency situations to have a prior relationship with physicians, to take the opportunity to prepare medical directives in advance, or to designate a surrogate decision maker” (2016, 231).

Some authors have expressed concern that forcing interventions on pregnant women for the sake of the fetus contributes to our cultural imagining of the fetus as a full-fledged person who functions as a patient with rights and medical needs equivalent to the woman’s own (Roth 2003, Baron 2019). Indeed, as Paltrow and Flavin discuss, even embryos and fertilized eggs may enjoy the protections of personhood status, albeit not as a result of formal legislation; evidence suggests that wide acceptance of such extensions of personhood will be particularly detrimental to the procreative autonomy of vulnerable women (Paltrow and Flavin 2013). On the other hand, some forced interventions are designed to improve the health of the children that fetuses will become. If the fetus will survive, there will eventually be a full-fledged person with interests that can be harmed during pregnancy. So forced interventions do not necessarily personify the fetus; they may instead force the pregnant woman to sacrifice her own well-being or autonomy for the sake of her future child. There may be good moral reasons why pregnant women ought not to refuse various interventions in particular cases; one might argue that, at least in the case of voluntary pregnancy, the pregnant woman has taken on a special duty to protect the well-being of her future child in continuing to be pregnant. Savulescu (2007a) argues for a ‘duty of easy rescue’—regardless of whether the fetus counts as a person, he claims, a pregnant woman has a duty to allow acts that do not significantly harm her while protecting her future child from significant harm. However, moral obligation comes apart from legal compulsion. As Kingma and Porter argue, there may be cases in which parents do have a moral obligation to undergo surgical interventions for the sake of their children, whether this is an obstetric intervention for a future child or a donation or blood or tissue for a born child; however, “a positive answer to the question about moral duty does not directly translate to an answer about the moral justification for compulsion” (2021, 283).

Cases involving possible forced interventions on pregnant women are often framed as instances of ‘maternal-fetal conflict’, in which doctors or courts must adjudicate between the wishes of the woman and the well-being or rights of the fetus. It has been argued that such a framing implies an adversarial stance, and positions the fetus as in need of rescuing from a callous mother (although it is worth noting that in medical contexts, ‘maternal-fetal conflict’ also often refers to cases in which fetal development compromises the health of the mother). Some authors conclude that the very notion of maternal-fetal conflict ought to be discarded: not only may it undermine pregnant women’s autonomy, it falsely describes the nature and source of the conflict, which is more often a conflict between maternal wishes and the practitioner’s prescriptions. Baylis, Rodgers, and Young (2008) suggest that such disagreements are perhaps better cast as maternal-physician conflicts than as maternal-fetal conflicts. However, Bonnie Steinbock argues that the original phrase may sometimes still be apt: “it must be recognized that a pregnant woman can have interests, including entirely legitimate interests, which may conflict with what will protect the life or health of her fetus [...] It is wishful thinking to pretend that what is best for the pregnant woman is necessarily best for the fetus or future child, or that what is best for the fetus always promotes the pregnant woman’s interests” (2011, 156). In rare cases, such as some advanced cancers, treatment decisions for a pregnant woman necessitate a choice between saving her life and that of the fetus, or other dramatic trade-offs. In such cases, there is general consensus that the primary consideration should be saving the life of the mother (i.e. see Puls, Terry, and Hunter 1997). Charles Weijer (1998) points out, however, that in some cases a pregnant woman’s decision to refuse treatment and sacrifice herself for her child should be counted as an autonomous decision worth respecting, and that we should not assume that only self-interested decisions can be autonomous.

4. Managing and Communicating Reproductive Risk

The language of risk pervades our public discourse surrounding pregnancy and birth, both currently and historically (e.g. Hallgrimsdottir and Benner 2014; Stohl 2018; Klassen 2021). Where cost-benefit analyses serve as paradigms of rationality and hallmarks of efficiency, social problems are framed as exercises in risk management. While most pregnancies in developed countries yield healthy mothers and babies, pregnancy unavoidably involves risk for women and fetuses alike. Many have argued that pregnant women (as opposed to policy makers, fathers, industrial manufacturers, etc.) are disproportionately burdened with the responsibility for managing reproductive risk; they are often expected to survey and discipline virtually all aspects of their bodies and lives in accordance with elaborate, ever-proliferating, ever-changing rules of risk minimization (Kukla 2008, Lyerly et al. 2009, Baron 2023a).

Women generally care deeply about the well-being of their future children, and hence are typically concerned with managing reproductive risk. More broadly, as a social body, we have a strong collective interest in the health and welfare of our future community members, and hence reproductive risk is a matter of public concern. In managing and communicating about reproductive risk, we face several challenges. First and perhaps most obviously, while pregnant women and fetuses are inextricably physically intertwined, the risks and potential benefits to each of them of various actions, situations, and interventions are typically different and can even be in tension. Managing risk can be especially complicated and ethically charged given this entwinement of two different sets of risks and potential benefits. Second, as will be discussed below, there are various reasons why good-quality evidence about reproductive risk is hard to come by, and hence we often must make decisions about how to manage such risk under a great deal of uncertainty. Third, features of our cultural context can distort our perceptions of reproductive risk (Drabble et al. 2011). Such distortions become ethically relevant to the extent that they either lead us to decisions that are not, as they purport to be, in the best interests of babies or their mothers, or that place inappropriate burdens and responsibilities on pregnant women that are not responsive to reality. The following sections survey some ethical issues that highlight these barriers to high-quality reasoning about reproductive risk.

4.1 Alcohol and drug use during pregnancy

Pregnant women who use alcohol and drugs violate deeply held cultural visions of appropriate motherhood. We tend to frame any level of drinking or drug use during pregnancy as indicating serious maternal irresponsibility. The United States and Canada advocate total abstinence from drinking during pregnancy, or even when becoming pregnant is a possibility; campaigns by the Centers for Disease Control and Prevention have encouraged women to attend to their “preconception health” by cultivating fetus-friendly habits (including ceasing use of cigarettes and alcohol) before they even become pregnant (Waggoner 2015). And yet, although it is well-established that heavy alcohol use during pregnancy (particularly among those who smoke and experience further stressors such as poverty) can result in Fetal Alcohol Syndrome, researchers have repeatedly failed to find concrete evidence of fetal harm from light to moderate maternal drinking (Armstrong 2003, Lee 2009). In 2014, the Centers for Disease Control and Prevention released an extensive study showing no measurable ill effects on children from light maternal drinking. Two years later, the Center released an advisory telling all women who could become pregnant to abstain entirely from drinking, whether or not they were or planned to become pregnant (CDC April 2014, February 2016).

It is tempting to think that even if light drinking or drug use poses only a small teratogenic risk, women are morally obligated to refrain from it. For instance, Elizabeth Harman (1999) claims that any smoking during a pregnancy one plans to carry to term is “morally impermissible”, and Gilmore (2008) argues that women who are or might become pregnant ought to abstain from drinking any alcohol. But we cannot, of course, ask pregnant women to abstain completely from all voluntary activities carrying some fetal risk, for they would be paralyzed into inactivity (which would itself come with some risk). We are not nearly so draconian in our attitudes towards other risky behaviors during pregnancy, such as driving a car, playing sports, or travelling abroad, although (as noted above) pregnant women still experience a broad range of social pressures and scrutiny regarding day-to-day activities and habits. This does not only touch behaviours considered to carry risks of fetal harm, but also applies to steps that could be taken to benefit the fetus. Fiona Woollard argues that there is a general assumption “operating in academic literature, medical advice given to mothers, mainstream media and social media” that an expectant mother has a general duty to do anything that could benefit her fetus, and otherwise must have a good reason justifying her failure to do so (2018, 126). This assumption “has pernicious effects on mothers and gender equality, contributing to a culture of pervasive guilt and continuous self-sacrifice that undermines women’s emotional wellbeing and discourages pursuit of career or other nondomestic goals” (ibid).

The failure of extreme risk-aversion strategies to reliably decrease harmful behaviours and contribute to positive health outcomes for pregnant women and their fetuses should lead practitioners and researchers toward alternative approaches to understanding, communicating about, and managing risks for pregnant women (Ballantyne et al. 2016). Alternative approaches call for clearer understanding of fetal risk among both clinicians and policy makers, and explicit consideration of the social and political values that shape current forms of risk management in pregnant women (Minkoff and Marshall 2016). Elizabeth Armstrong (2003) and Janet Golden (2006) have argued that widespread social anxiety over Fetal Alcohol Syndrome constitutes a ‘moral panic’ over mothers engaging in what we imagine as self-indulgent or decadent behavior, rather than an evidence-based response to risk. Focusing on the consumption of alcohol or drugs as a particularly pernicious form of risk-taking seems to have more to do with images and ideologies of maternal self-sacrifice, purity, and decadence than with rational concern for fetal well-being. This is especially visible in responses to drug abuse in pregnant women: Iris Marion Young describes the “particular rage” directed at these women—often greater, she argues, than that directed against other criminals—which, she suggests, responds specifically to their motherhood. This rage “unconsciously recalls the feeling we all had as children of rage toward our mothers who were not always there for us, did not always respond to our needs and desires, and sometimes pursued their own purposes and desires” (1994, 36).

Many states have tried (successfully, in some cases) to prosecute pregnant drug users for separate crimes beyond illicit drug use, such as child abuse or fetal endangerment (Goodwin 2014; Cosgrove and Vaswani 2020). In one Indiana, US case, a woman who procured a medical abortion was found guilty of both neglect of a dependent child and feticide; she successfully appealed these charges in 2016 (for discussion, see Milne 2020, 182–7). Not infrequently, pregnant drug users have had their children removed from their care at birth, or have been coerced into treatment. These forms of intervention may have the opposite of the desired effect, by discouraging pregnant women who use drugs and alcohol from seeking prenatal care or obtaining support that would help with drug use cessation (Roberts and Pies 2011; Terplan, Kennedy-Henricks and Chisolm 2015; Haffajee et al. 2021; Weber et al. 2021). On empirical study across eight US states found that punitive policies that “criminalized substance use during pregnancy, considered it grounds for civil commitment, or considered it child abuse or neglect” were associated with higher rates of neonatal abstinence syndrome among neonates (Faherty et al. 2019). In addition to creating barriers to effective prenatal care, punitive and coercive approaches to drug use during pregnancy may inappropriately diminish women’s agency and misconstrue the interests of pregnant women who use drugs (Olsen, Banwell, and Madden 2014). Punitive approaches imply that pregnant addicts are ‘choosing’ their own pleasure over their children’s well-being; however, drug use among addicts is rarely a voluntary choice based on a rational assessment of the risks and potential benefits of drug use. Accordingly, some argue that punitive measures against pregnant women addicted to drugs are inherently unjust, especially when taken in a system that fails to meet the basic health needs of marginalized women and children (Flavin and Paltrow 2010). Poor and minority pregnant women are disproportionately tested for drugs and threatened with punishment, even though they use drugs at rates no higher than their white, middle-class counterparts, and hence a punitive approach is likely to be unjustly applied (see also Hans 1999).

Iris Marion Young distinguishes between three approaches to drug abuse during pregnancy: punishment, treatment, and empowerment (1994). As do many of the scholars mentioned above, she rejects the punishment approach as both immoral and impractical. However, she expresses reservations about the treatment approach as currently practiced; she argues that it still treats addiction as an individual, medicalized health problem, rather than as a social problem. An empowerment approach of the sort that Young favors offers treatment, but in the context of a project of social empowerment and consciousness-raising designed to foster a critically reflective “sense of collective influence over the social conditions of one’s life” (Young 1994, 48). She advocates programs that help women develop a perspective from which overcoming addiction can be understood not just as an individual health or will-power problem, but as part of a shared project of personal and community transformation.

4.2 Research and Medical Treatment Involving Pregnant Women

Up until the early 1990s, women were dramatically underrepresented in clinical research trials. Historically, the two most common reasons given for women’s default exclusion were their purportedly more complicated and variable hormonal patterns and the possibility that they might be or become pregnant during the study, which could harm the fetus (Giacomini and Baylis 2003; Criado-Perez 2020). The National Institutes of Health solicited a report from the Institute of Medicine in 1992 on the effects upon women’s health of these routine exclusions, and the report concluded that serious harms were being done to women, who were disproportionately denied the direct benefits that might come from study participation. Their systematic exclusion from clinical trials meant that medical service providers did not know how to design appropriate treatment plans for women, whose different hormones and reproductive system, longer life span, and other medically relevant differences meant that treating them as ‘smaller men’ for the purposes of dosing drugs and other treatment decisions was medically unsound. In 1993, the NIH changed its policies to make inclusion of women the default in all research, variation from which requires explicit justification. Constance Holden (2008) reported that as of 2006, women comprised 68.9% of participants in clinical trials. However, some argue that women continue to be significantly outnumbered by male subjects in biomedical research and clinical trials generally; these commentators suggest that women’s inclusion rates were artificially inflated by a small number of single sex studies (Kim, Tingen, and Woodruff 2010). Moreover, disclosure of inclusion practices and rates in clinical trials is unreliable, and recent reviews fail to confirm reports of significant progress in diverse inclusion (Woodruff et al. 2015, Geller et al. 2011).

In any case, pregnant women remain an official ‘vulnerable group’ under the federal policies governing human subjects research, and are exempt from the inclusion mandate. Indeed, virtually all clinical research excludes pregnant women out of purported concern for teratogenic effects on fetuses, while even trials for interventions not classified as potentially teratogenic routinely exclude pregnant women (Shields and Lyerly 2013). Ongoing exclusion stymies development of safe and effective medical interventions for pregnant women, whose metabolism, blood volume, hormones, immune system, and other bodily systems are affected by pregnancy in ways that impact their response to medication (Blehar et al. 2013). While the lacuna of reliable evidence regarding safe and effective medical interventions for pregnant women and their fetuses is widely acknowledged as a problem, it has not, in general, shaken the consensus that it is unethical to put fetuses at unknown risk for the purposes of research. As a result, “the majority of medicines are administered in pregnancy ‘off-label’, and over 90% of clinically approved drugs lack appropriate information on efficacy, safety, teratogenicity and pharmacokinetics in pregnancy” (Scaffidi et al. 2016, 132).

Advice for pregnant women is generally conservative; women are advised to avoid medical interventions and medications during pregnancy if at all possible. For example, women with mental illnesses such as bipolar disorder and depression are often counseled to avoid medication during pregnancy, both because psychotropic drugs tend to diffuse readily across the placenta, and because typically, the mental state of the mother does not directly impact the health of the fetus (in contrast with, for instance, diabetes or life-threatening cancer). However, mental illness in pregnant women matters to fetal development: untreated depression, for example, is associated with premature birth, low birthweight, and other complications (Gold and Marcus 2008). Moreover, some researchers argue that evidence for negative health outcomes for children born from women taking anti-depressants is scant and unreliable, and provides little guidance for treatment (Byatt, Deligiannidis, and Freeman 2013, Pearlstein 2015). Without improved evidence, it is difficult to give any rules of thumb for the ethics of treating mental illness during pregnancy. Similar problems can be found across the medical spectrum: “pregnant women remain therapeutic orphans, with the vast majority of current accepted therapies for medical conditions never having been studied in pregnancy” (Costantine et al. 2020, 2).

As well as a widespread failure to investigate the efficacy and safety of non-pregnancy-related drugs for use by pregnant women, there is also little pregnancy-related drug-trial activity (compared with non-pregnancy-related pharmaceutical interventions). For example, although pre-eclampsia and lung cancer have very similar incidence rates (approximately 42 in 100,000 and 43 in 100,000 the total population respectively, according to Australian data) a study of the five largest interventions databases found nearly 50 times as many lung-cancer-focused drug trials as pre-eclampsia-focused trials active in the period 2013–14 (Scaffidi et al. 2016, 137). Existing gaps in medical research observed regarding problems exclusive (or near-exclusive) to the female body, such as pre-menstrual syndrome and dysmenorrhea, have been highlighted in recent years (see e.g. Criado-Perez 2020; White and Clayton 2022). The relative dearth of research into pharmaceutical interventions for pregnancy-related morbidities may be grounded in the same longstanding inattentiveness to female medical needs, but is likely to be confounded by the ethical issues discussed above regarding research risks for pregnant women and fetuses.

The conservative approach to doing research with/ treating women during pregnancy generally emphasizes the risks to fetuses from intervening, but not the risks from not intervening (Lyerly, Little, and Faden 2008b). When we exclude pregnant women from research or discourage treatment because of a lack of knowledge about the effects of a medication, we are not typically erring on the side of fetal safety; rather, we generally have no idea whether it is riskier for the fetus to be exposed to a medication or to the effects of untreated maternal morbidity. As Lyerly, Little and Faden point out, “If research is important to tell us when medications are unsafe, it is also important to reassure us when drugs are safe … In the absence of information about the safety and efficacy of medications, pregnant women and their providers are left with two unsavory options—take a drug, with unknown safety and efficacy; or fail to treat the conditions, thus leaving the woman and fetus vulnerable to the consequences of the underlying medical problems” (Lyerly, Little and Faden 2008b, 12, 19). Pregnant women who have medical needs during pregnancy are typically told to weigh the risks and benefits when deciding whether to proceed with a treatment whose impact on fetuses is unknown. But this is an impossible demand; no one can weigh unknown risks and benefits, and excluding pregnant women from research sustains the impossibility of this calculation.

It is unclear, however, how best to craft appropriate standards for inclusion. Not only is the random exposure of fetuses to unknown teratogenic risks ethically problematic, but few pregnant women are likely to enroll in such trials. Some bioethicists propose ethical guidelines for inclusion of pregnant women in clinical trials that attend to both the woman and her fetus as patients (Chevernak and McCullough 2011). As others point out in response, however, the fetus as patient approach will likely entail continuing strict limitations on clinical trial participation, including in cases where the intervention in question is potentially life-saving for the pregnant woman but risky to the fetus. The approach does not resolve the problem of pregnant women’s exclusion from medical research participation and associated health impacts; we are in need of new practices and policies that are sensitive to the difficulties and dangers of research on pregnant women, but are undistorted by assumptions that it is always more responsible and safer to protect fetuses from unknown interventions (White 2015).

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Copyright © 2024 by
Quill R Kukla
Teresa Baron <teresa.baron@nottingham.ac.uk>
Katherine Wayne

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