Notes to Internet Research Ethics
1. With thanks to David Dittrich, University of Washington Applied Physics Laboratory for these examples.
2. HIPAA refers to the “Health Insurance Portability and Accountability Act”.
3. With thanks to Laura Odwazny, J.D., U.S. Department of Health and Human Services, Senior Counsel to OHRP.
5. In the US context, these conditions include:
The research or demonstration project is to be conducted by or subject to the approval of state or local government officials and is designed to study, evaluate, or otherwise examine: (i) public benefit or service programs; (ii) procedures for obtaining benefits or services under those programs; (iii) possible changes in or alternatives to those programs or procedures; or (iv) possible changes in methods or levels of payment for benefits or services under those programs; when the research could not practicably be carried out without the waiver or alteration; the research involves no more than minimal risk to the subjects; the waiver or alteration will not adversely affect the rights and welfare of the subjects; or whenever appropriate, the subjects will be provided with additional pertinent information after participation (45 C.F.R. §§ 46.116c,d, 46.117, 46.408c).
6. See, for instance, the language suggested by the Research Ethics Boards at St Mary’s University and Mount Allison University.