Agendas, States of the World, and Probability Functions

• A finite set of propositions forms an algebra if (i) it contains a tautology and a contradiction, and (ii) it is closed under negation, conjunction, and disjunction.
• Given a set of propositions \(\mathcal{F}\) a world relative to \(\mathcal{F}\) is a function \(w : \mathcal{F} \rightarrow \{\mathsf{true}, \mathsf{false}\}\) such that
  • \(w(\top) = \mathsf{true}\) if \(\top\) is a tautology; \(w(\bot) = \mathsf{false}\) if \(\bot\) is a contradiction;
  • \(w(\neg X) = \mathsf{true}\) iff \(w(X) = \mathsf{false}\);
  • \(w(X \vee Y) = \mathsf{true}\) iff \(w(X) = \mathsf{true}\) or \(w(Y) = \mathsf{true} \);
  • \(w(X\ \&\ Y) = \mathsf{true}\) iff \(w(X) = \mathsf{true}\) and \(w(Y) = \mathsf{true} \);
  We write \(\mathcal{W}_\mathcal{F}\) for the set of all worlds relative to \(\mathcal{F}\).
• A function \(P : \mathcal{F} \rightarrow [0, 1]\) is a probability function if (i) \(P(\top) = 1\) and \(P(\bot) = 0\), and (ii) \(P(X \vee Y) = P(X) + P(Y)\) whenever \(X\) and \(Y\) are mutually exclusive.

Epistemic Utility Arguments concerning Outright Beliefs

An individual’s belief set \(\mathbf{B}\) is a subset of their agenda \(\mathcal{F}\).

An epistemic utility function \(EU\) for belief sets on agenda \(\mathcal{F}\) is Jamesian if, for each \(X\) in \(\mathcal{F}\), there are \(R_X, W_X \gt 0\) such that: \[ EU(\mathbf{B}, w) = \sum_{X \in \mathbf{B}\ \&\ w(X) = \mathsf{true}} R_X - \sum_{X \in \mathbf{B}\ \&\ w(X) = \mathsf{false}} W_X \]

A Jamesian epistemic utility function on \(\mathcal{F}\) has uniform ratio \(t\) if \(\frac{W_X}{R_X+W_X} = t\), for all \(X\) in \(\mathcal{F}\).

Then the Expectation Theorem for the Lockean Thesis follows from this lemma:

Expectation Lemma for the Lockean Thesis. Suppose \(P\) is a probability function on \(\mathcal{F}\), \(X\) is a proposition in \(\mathcal{X}\), and \(0 \lt R, W\). Then:

1. If \(P(X) \gt \frac{W}{R+W}\), then \(P(X) \times R + P(\neg X) \times (-W) \gt 0\).
2. If \(P(X) = \frac{W}{R+W}\), then \(P(X) \times R + P(\neg X) \times (-W) = 0\).

Dominance Theorem for Almost Lockean Completeness. Suppose \(\mathbf{B}\) is a belief set and \(0 \leq t \leq 1\) is a threshold. Then the following are equivalent:

1. Relative to any Jamesian epistemic utility function with uniform ratio \(t\), \(\mathbf{B}\) is not strictly dominated;
2. \(\mathbf{B}\) satisfies Almost Lockean Completeness with threshold \(t\).

Proof sketch for the Dominance Theorem for Almost Lockean Completeness. First, we define a matrix. Suppose \(\mathcal{F} = \{X_1, \ldots, X_n\}\) and \(\mathcal{W}_\mathcal{F} = \{w_1, \ldots, w_m\}\). Then define the following matrix:

\[ \mathbf{D}_t = \left [ \begin{array}{ccc} d_{11} & \ldots & d_{1n} \\ \ldots & \ldots & \ldots \\ d_{m1} & \ldots & d_{mn} \end{array} \right ] \]

so that:

\[ d_{ij} = \left \{ \begin{array}{rl} 1-t & w_i(X_j) = \mathsf{true}\ &\ X_j \in \mathbf{B} \\ -(1-t) & w_i(X_j) = \mathsf{true}\ &\ X_j \not \in \mathbf{B} \\ -t & w_i(X_j) = \mathsf{false}\ &\ X_j \in \mathbf{B} \\ t & w_i(X_j) = \mathsf{false}\ &\ X_j \not \in \mathbf{B} \end{array} \right. \]

Then, second, we note that:

• \(\mathbf{B}\) is not strictly dominated for any epistemic utility function with uniform ratio \(t\) iff there is no vector \(\mathbf{x}\) such that \(\mathbf{x} \geq 0\) and \(\mathbf{D}_t \cdot \mathbf{x} \lt 0\).
• \(\mathbf{B}\) is Almost Lockean Complete with threshold \(t\) iff there is a vector \(\mathbf{y}\) such that \(\mathbf{y} \geq 0\) and \(\mathbf{y} \neq 0\) and \(\mathbf{y} \cdot \mathbf{D}_t \geq 0\).

And finally we note the following theorem, known as Farkas’ Lemma, which says that the following are equivalent:

1. There is no vector \(\mathbf{x}\) such that \(\mathbf{x} \geq 0\) and \(\mathbf{D}_t \cdot \mathbf{x} \lt 0\).
2. There is a vector \(\mathbf{y}\) such that \(\mathbf{y} \geq 0\) and \(\mathbf{y} \neq 0\) and \(\mathbf{y} \cdot \mathbf{D}_t \geq 0\).

QED.

The proof of the Dominance Theorem for Almost Lockean Completeness for Plans proceeds in a similar way.

Epistemic Utility Arguments concerning Precise Credences

A credence function on \(\mathcal{F}\) is a function \(C : \mathcal{F} \rightarrow [0, 1]\).

\(\mathcal{C}_\mathcal{F}\) is the set of credence functions on \(\mathcal{F}\).

\(\mathcal{P}_\mathcal{F} \subseteq \mathcal{C}_\mathcal{F}\) is the set of probabilistic credence functions on \(\mathcal{F}\).

An epistemic utility function for credence functions on \(\mathcal{F}\) is a function \(EU : \mathcal{C}_\mathcal{F} \rightarrow [-\infty, 0]\).

Probabilism and the Chance-Credence Norms

The Dominance Theorem for Probabilism and the Chance Dominance Theorem for the General Chance-Credence Norm both follow from the same fact about strictly proper epistemic utility functions, so we state that now:

Dominance Lemma for Convex Hulls. Suppose \(EU\) is continuous and strictly proper. And suppose \(\mathcal{X} \subseteq \mathcal{P}\). Then:

1. For every \(C\) that is not in in \(\mathrm{cl}(\mathcal{X}^+)\), there is \(C^*\) in \(\mathrm{cl}(\mathcal{X}^+)\) such that, for all \(P\) in \(\mathcal{X}\), \[ \sum_{w \in \mathcal{W}} P(w)EU(C, w) \lt \sum_{w \in \mathcal{W}} P(w)EU(C^*, w) \]
2. For every \(C\) in \(\mathrm{cl}(\mathcal{X}^+)\) and any \(C^* \neq C\) there is \(P\) in \(\mathcal{X}\) such that, \[ \sum_{w \in \mathcal{W}} P(w)EU(C^*, w) \lt \sum_{w \in \mathcal{W}} P(w)EU(C, w) \]

Proof sketch for the Dominance Theorem for Convex Hulls. The trick is to use the epistemic utility function to define something like a measure of distance from any probabilistic credence function to any other credence function. Given \(EU\) and credence functions \(P\), \(C\), where \(P\) is probabilistic, define \(D_{EU}(P, C)\) to be the difference between the expected epistemic utility of \(C\) from the point of view of \(P\) and the expected epistemic utility of \(P\) from the point of view of \(P\): that is,

\[ D_{EU}(P, C) = \mathrm{Exp}_P(EU(P)) - \mathrm{Exp}_P(EU(C)) \]

We can then show that, for any set \(\mathcal{X}\) of probabilistic credence functions, if \(C\) lies outside \(\mathrm{cl}(\mathcal{X}^+)\), then the function \(D_{EU}(-, C)\) takes a minimum value on \(\mathrm{cl}(\mathcal{X}^+)\). And we can show that, if \(C^*\) is the credence function at which it takes that minimum value, then, for all \(P\) in \(\mathcal{X}\),

\[ D_{EU}(P, C^*) \lt D_{EU}(P, C) \]

And so, unpacking the definition of \(D_{EU}\),

\[ \mathrm{Exp}_P(EU(C)) \lt \mathrm{Exp}_P(EU(C^*)) \]

as required.

Then:

• the Dominance Theorem for Probabilism follows from this if we let \(\mathcal{X}\) be the set of omniscient credence functions, \(V_w\) for \(w\) in \(\mathcal{W}\), since \(\mathcal{P}\) is the closed convex hull of that set;
• the Chance Dominance Theorem for the General Chance-Credence Norm follows if we let \(\mathcal{X}\) be the set of possible chance functions.

Conditionalization

1. An evidential situation is a function \(\mathcal{E}\) that takes a possible world \(w\) and returns the proposition \(\mathcal{E}(w)\) learned at that possible world in that evidential situation.
2. An updating rule is a function \(R\) that takes a possible world \(w\) and returns the credence function \(R_w\) endorsed by that plan at that world.
3. An updating rule \(R\) is available at an evidential situation \(\mathcal{E}\) if, whenever \(\mathcal{E}(w) = \mathcal{E}(w')\), we have \(R_w = R_{w'}\).
4. An evidential situation is factive if, for every world \(w\), \(\mathcal{E}(w)\) is true at \(w\).
5. An evidential situation is partitional if \(\{\mathcal{E}(w) : w \in \mathcal{W}\}\) forms a partition.
6. An updating rule \(R\) is a conditionalizing rule for prior credence function \(C\) and evidential situation \(\mathcal{E}\) if, for every world \(w\), if \(C(\mathcal{E}(w)) \lt 0\), then \(R_w(-) = C(- \mid \mathcal{E}(w))\).

Expectation Theorem for Partitional Plan Conditionalization. Suppose \(EU\) is strictly proper, \(\mathcal{E}\) is a factive and partitional evidential situation, and \(C\) is a probabilistic credence function. Then:

1. For any updating rules \(R, R'\), if \(R\) and \(R'\) are both conditionalizing rules for \(C\) and \(\mathcal{E}\), \[ \sum_{w \in \mathcal{W}} C(w)EU(R_w, w) = \sum_{w \in \mathcal{W}} C(w)EU({R'}_w, w) \]
2. For any available updating rules \(R, R'\), if \(R\) is a conditionalizing rule for \(C\) and \(\mathcal{E}\), but \(R'\) is not, then \[ \sum_{w \in \mathcal{W}} C(w)EU(R'_w, w) \lt \sum_{w \in \mathcal{W}} C(w)EU(R'_w, w) \]

Proof sketch for the Expectation Theorem for Partitional Plan Conditionalization. We prove (ii). Since \(\mathcal{E}\) is partitional, let \(\{\mathcal{E}(w) : w \in \mathcal{W}\} = \{E_1, \ldots, E_n\}\), write \(R_i\) for the credence function that \(R\) recommends at each world at which \(E_i\) is true and write \(R'_i\) for the credence function that \(R'\) recommends at each world at which \(E_i\) is true. Then, for each \(E_i\) with \(C(E_i) \gt 0\), since \(EU\) is strictly proper and \(R_i\) is a probabilistic credence function,

\[ \sum_{w \in \mathcal{W}} R_i(w)EU(R'_i, w) \leq \sum_{w \in \mathcal{W}} R_i(w)EU(R_i, w) \]

with strict inequality if \(R_i \neq R'_i\). But \(R_i(-) = C(-\mid E_i)\), so

\[ \sum_{w \in \mathcal{W}} C(w\mid E_i)EU(R'_i, w) \leq \sum_{w \in \mathcal{W}} C(w \mid E_i)EU(R_i, w) \]

again with strict inequality if \(R_i \neq R'_i\). And so

\[ \sum_{w \in E_i} C(w)EU(R'_i, w) \leq \sum_{w \in E_i} C(w)EU(R_i, w) \]

again with strict inequality if \(R_i \neq R'_i\). Since \(R_i\) is conditionalizing and \(R'_i\) is not, there is some \(E_i\) such that \(R_i \neq R'_i\), and so

\[ \sum_{E_i}\sum_{w \in E_i} C(w)EU(R'_i, w) \lt \sum_{E_i}\sum_{w \in E_i} C(w)EU(R_i, w) \]

And so

\[ \sum_{w \in \mathcal{W}} C(w)EU(R'_w, w) \lt \sum_{w \in \mathcal{W}} C(w)EU(R_w, w) \]

as required.

Dominance Theorem for Partitional Plan Conditionalization. Suppose \(EU\) is additive, continuous, and strictly proper, \(\mathcal{E}\) is a factive and partitional evidential situation, \(C\) is a probabilistic credence function, and \(R\) is an available updating plan in \(\mathcal{E}\). Then:

1. If \(R\) is not a conditionalizing plan for \(C\) and \(\mathcal{E}\), there is a credence function \(C^*\) and an updating plan \(R^*\) that is available in \(\mathcal{E}\) such that, for all \(w\) in \(\mathcal{W}\), \[ EU(C, w) + EU(R_w, w) \lt EU(C^*, w) + EU(R^*_w, w) \]
2. If \(R\) is a conditionalizing plan for \(C\) and \(\mathcal{E}\), then there is no credence function \(C^*\) and updating plan \(R^*\) that is available in \(\mathcal{E}\) such that, for all \(w\) in \(\mathcal{W}\), \[ EU(C, w) + EU(R_w, w) \lt EU(C^*, w) + EU(R^*_w, w) \]

Proof sketch for the Dominance Theorem for Partitional Plan Conditionalization. We'll sketch the proof of (i). Suppose \(EU(C, w) = \sum_{X \in \mathcal{F}} s(V_w(X), C(X))\). Then we define a measure of distance from one credence function to another as follows:

• First, given two credences, \(p\) and \(q\), define \(d_s(p, q) = (ps(1, p) - (1-p)s(0,p)) - (ps(1, q) - (1-p)s(0,q))\).
• Second, given two credence functions, \(C, C'\), define \(D_s(C, C') = \sum_{X \in \mathcal{F}} d_s(C(X), C'(X))\).

Next, since \(\mathcal{E}\) is partitional, let \(\{E(w) : w \in \mathcal{W}\} = \{E_1, \ldots, E_n\}\). Now suppose \(R\) is an available updating plan in \(\mathcal{E}\), and write \(R_i\) for the credence function it endorses at any world at which \(E_i\) is true. Next, write \(\mathcal{F} = \{X_1, \ldots, X_m\}\), represent a credence function \(C\) by the vector \((C(X_1), \ldots, C(X_m))\), write \(C \frown C'\) for the concatenation of \(C\) and \(C'\), which is \((C(X_1), \ldots, C(X_m), C'(X_1), \ldots, C'(X_m))\), and define

\( \overline{R} = \{V_w \frown R_1 \frown \ldots \frown R_{i-1} \frown V_w \frown R_{i+1} \frown \ldots \frown R_n : \)
    \( i = 1, \ldots, n\ \&\ w \in E_i\} \)

Then, if \(R\) is not a conditionalizing plan for \(C\),

\[ C \frown R_1 \frown \ldots \frown R_n \not \in \overline{R}^+ \]

It then follows that there is a credence function \(C^*\) and an updating rule \(R^*\) that is available in \(\mathcal{E}\) such that

\[ C^* \frown R^*_1 \frown \ldots \frown R^*_n \in \overline{R}^+ \]

such that, for all \(i = 1, \ldots, n\) and all \(w\) in \(E_i\),

\( D_s(V_w, C) + D_s(R_1, R_1) + \ldots + D_s(R_{i-1}, R_{i-1})\ + \)
    \( D_s(V_w, R_i) + D_s(R_{i+1}, R_{i+1}) + \ldots + D_s(R_n, R_n)\ \gt \)
\( D_s(V_w, C^*) + D_s(R_1, R^*_1) + \ldots + D_s(R_{i-1}, R^*_{i-1})\ + \)
    \(D_s(V_w, R^*_i) + D_s(R_{i+1}, R^*_{i+1}) + \ldots + D_s(R_n, R^*_n) \)

But then, since \(D_s(C, C) = 0\), \(D_s(R_i, R_i) = 0\), and \(D_s(R_i, R^*_i) \geq 0\),

\[ D_s(V_w, C) + D_s(V_w, R_i) \gt D_s(V_w, C^*) + D_s(V_w, R^*_i) \]

And so

\[ EU(C, w) + EU(R_i, w) \lt EU(C^*, w) + EU(R^*_i, w) \]

as required.