1. When \(X\) is infinite, we need to define a \(\Sigma\)-algebra on \(X\), but these technical issues are not important for us at this point, so we restrict attention to finite sets. In this case, \(p:X\rightarrow[0,1]\) is a probability measure when \(\sum_{x\in X} p(x) = 1\).

2. This does not mean that the player will know exactly what the other players will do in the game. There may be more than one “rational choice” or the other players may randomize.

3. A variant of this problem is the well-known sleeping beauty problem, which has been extensively discussed in the philosophy literature. Of course, much of the discussion of the sleeping beauty problem found in the philosophy literature is relevant here; however, the issues surrounding the sleeping beauty problem is typically framed differently than we have done in this section. See Titelbaum (2013) for a survey and pointers to the relevant literature.

4. Some of the literature in epistemic game theory distinguishes between “belief-based” approaches when Harsanyi type spaces are used as a model of a game and “knowledge-based” approaches when Aumann structures (also called Kripke structures) are used as a model of a game. However, both types of models can be used to represent both knowledge and beliefs of the players in a game.

5. While hard information shares some of the characteristics that have been attributed to knowledge in epistemology, such as truthfulness, researchers in epistemic game theory are well aware of discrepancies between hard information and our philosophical understanding of knowledge.

6. Once again, philosophical carefulness is in order here. The whole range of informational attitudes that are labeled as “beliefs” in the epistemic game theory literature falls into the category of attitudes that can be described as “regarding something as true” (Schwitzgebel 2006 [2021]), among which belief seems to form a proper sub-category.

7. Recall that, for simplicity, we identify the outcomes of the game with the strategy profiles. It is not difficult to adapt the models presented in this entry to account for uncertainty about outcomes associated with a given strategy profile.

8. Given an equivalence relation \(\sim_i\) on \(W\), the collection

\[\Pi_i=\{[w]_i\mid w\in W\}\]

is a partition. Furthermore, given any partition \(\Pi_i\) on \(W\),

\[\sim_i=\{(w,v)\mid v\in \Pi_i(w)\}\]

is an equivalence relation with \([w]_i=\Pi_i(w)\).

9. If \(W\) is infinite, we need an additional property that \(W\) is well-founded implying that every non-empty subset of \(W\) has a maximal element according to \(\succeq_i\). /p>

10. As mentioned in Footnote 1, when \(W\) is infinite, we need to define a \(\Sigma\)-algebra on \(W\), but these technical issues are not important for us at this point, so we restrict attention to finite sets of states. In this case, \(p:W\rightarrow[0,1]\) is a probability measure when \(\sum_{w\in W} p(w) = 1\).

11. Of course, one could consider a different class of models where monotonicity does not hold, such as neighborhood models (Pacuit 2017).

12. Even though it is important to consider situations in which a player’s pure strategy is strictly dominated by a mixed strategy, we do not extend the above definition to probabilities over the opponents’ strategies. That is, we do not replace the above definition with:

Suppose that \(G=\langle N, (S_i)_{i\in N}, (u_i)_{i\in N}\rangle\) is a game in strategic form. We say that \(m_i\) is strictly p-dominated \(m_i'\) with respect to \(X\subseteq \Delta(S_{-i})\), provided that for all \(q\in X\), \(U_i(m_i,q)>U_i(m_i',q)\), where \(U_i(m_1, q)=\sum_{s\in \times_{i\in N}S_i} m_i(s_i) * q(s_{-i}) * u_i(s)\).

It is not hard to see that strict dominance and p-strict dominance are equivalent. Obviously, p-strict dominance implies strict dominance. To see the converse, suppose that \(m'\) is strictly dominated by \(m\) with respect to \(X\subseteq S_{-i}\). We show that for all \(q\in \Delta(X)\), \(U_i(m_i,q) > U_i(m_i',q)\) (and so \(m'\) is p-strictly dominated by \(m\) with respect to \(\Delta(X)\)). Suppose that \(q\in \Delta(X)\). Then,

\[ \begin{align*} U_i(m, q) & = \sum_{s_{-i}\in S_{-i}} q(s_{-i}) U_i(m, s_{-i}) \\ & > \sum_{s_{-i}\in S_{-i}} q(s_{-i}) U_i(m', s_{-i})=U_i(m',q).\\ \end{align*} \]

13. This discussion is related to the debate between causal and evidential decision theorists in Newcomb-like decision problems (see Weirich 2008 [2024]).

14. The uniqueness of the payoffs at each outcome is needed to ensure that there is a unique backward induction solution.

15. Player \(i\) does not have an incentive to deviate from a mixed strategy profile \(\mathbf{m}\) if there is no mixed strategy \(m'\) for player \(i\) such that \(i\) assigns strictly greater utility to \(m'\) than to \(\mathbf{m}_i\) given that the other players adopt their mixed strategies in \(\mathbf{m}\). To formally define this, we need to define the utility of a mixed strategy profile for a player. Suppose that

\[G=\langle N, (S_i)_{i\in N}, (u_i)_{i\in N}\rangle\]

is a game in strategic form and \(\mathbf{m}\in\times_{i\in N}\Delta(S_i)\) is a mixed strategy profile. Let \(S=\times_{i\in N} S_i\) be the set of pure-strategy profiles \(N=\{1, \ldots, n\}\). Then the utility of a mixed strategy profile \(\mathbf{m}\) for player \(i\) is:

\[U_i(m) = \sum_{\mathbf{s}\in S} \mathbf{m}_1(\mathbf{s}_1)*\cdots \mathbf{m}_n(\mathbf{s}_n)* u_i(\mathbf{s}).\]

16. See Joyce (2012) for a similar discussion about the well-known “Death in Damascus” example.

17.It is important to note that Harsanyi was not motivated by a dissatisfaction with the thought that players delegate their choices to a randomizing device. He was concerned with another puzzling feature of mixed strategy Nash equilibria. When all players play their component of a mixed strategy Nash equilibrium, each player is indifferent between all of her strategies that are assigned a non-zero probability by her mixed strategy. Harsanyi’s purification theorem explains why each player uses the probability given in the mixed strategy Nash equilibrium rather than some other mixture between her available strategies.

18. There can even be strategies outside the support of a mixed strategy that are a best response to the mixed strategy played by the others, although these cases are extremely unlikely (cf. the notion of an extra-weak equilibrium from Harsanyi 1973).

19. The models used by Samuelson differ from the ones presented in Section 2. In his model, each state is assigned a set of actions for each agent (rather than a single action). This formal detail is important for Samuelson’s main results, but is not crucial for the main point we are making here.

20. Recall the well-known distinction between “picking” and “choosing” from the seminal paper by Edna Ullmann-Margalit and Sidney Morgenbesser (1977).

21. Wlodeck Rabinowicz (1992) takes this idea even further and argues that from the principle of indifference, players must assign equal probability to all choice-worthy options.