1. The Basic Law, Goos reminds us, is premised on “Würde des Menschen”—typically translated as human dignity. However, contrary to present day worries about the conceptual ambiguity of dignity, Goos explains that post-war German legal scholars expressed clear minded certainty about its meaning. Goos draws special attention to the influential constitutionalist, Günter Düring, who stated, “Having dignity means: being a personality” (translated and cited by Goos [2013: 81]). However, this certainty had ironic results, given the position of the Grundgesetz as a legal reaction to Nazi atrocities. Goos explains: According to Düring, a person “ripens” to personality when they hold themselves in relations of responsibility to God, self, and community. Accordingly, the fundamental right of the Grundgesetz belongs always and only to, “the responsible person, never the bondless individual” (Ibid). The problem is, by articulating positive, substantive conditions for what it takes to have dignity, Düring left room for distinguishing those who do not have it. In short, Düring left room for the idea of “subhumans”, whom Düring did indeed think were unprotected by the fundamental right of the Grundgesetz.

2. To start, Kent (2017) herself notes that important exceptions to this trend in Christian theology can be found in John Scotus Eriugena and Robert Grosseteste. Or consider Soskice (2013). In some ways, Soskice is an example par excellence of the imago Dei platitude (see, e.g., 2013: 240). However, she notes that Christian and Jewish theologians have glossed what it means to be made “in the image of God” in different ways, many focusing on rational capacities or capacities for speech, but also noting that these properties have not been taken as decisive in individual cases. For example, babies are thought to be made in the image of God. In any event, she concludes that no specific set of qualities decisively characterizes what it means to be made in the image of God, and that “a certain vagueness is indeed desirable and ineliminable in the notion” (2013: 235). Reinforcing this point, Imbach (2014) notes that in the Middle Ages, the claim that humans were made in the image and likeness of God was understood in a number of ways. Hugo of Saint Victor and Anselm of Canterbury, for example, thought that the claim was true by virtue of the fact that human beings are rational (2014: 65). Bernard of Clairvaux thought that it was true by virtue of the fact that humans possess a free will (ibid.). And Bonaventure thought that it was true by virtue of the human possession of the faculties of memory, cognition, and willing (ibid.). This said, Imbach also admits that the operative concept of “dignity” in these traditions is inadequate from a contemporary perspective insofar as it is compatible with intra-human hierarchy and, more specifically, slavery and the death penalty (2014: 70–1).

Meanwhile, Hanvey (2013) argues that egalitarianism is tied to a few different strands of a Catholic concept of dignity, not all of which are based on imago Dei. In particular, he cites Leo XIII’s Quod Apostolici Muneris as a text that offers a “comprehensive statement of equality” and “of ultimate accountability in which responsibilities and corresponding rights may be applied” (2013: 214), but also Vatican II, especially Gaudium et Spes and Dignitas Humanae (2013: 215). Hanvey further argues that, in the Augustinian-Thomist tradition, although “reason might be necessary to secure human dignity, it cannot be sufficient” (2013: 221). Instead, human dignity is grounded in relation to God and other humans (ibid.), although it is unclear exactly what “is grounded in” means for Hanvey. For example, he sometimes emphasizes the “redemptive moment” of Catholic conceptions of human dignity, which he understands in terms of the “preservation” and “restoration” of dignity (2013: 223). But if dignity has to be preserved and can be restored, then its possession begins to look like a kind of achievement, and not as a property that humans have independently of their actions. Then again, there is understandable reason to render dignity at least in part, constitutively relational—“something which we are and possess, but also something which we are called to realize both in ourselves and others” (2013: 226–7). For, such ontological insecurity opens another line of thinking on original sin and its relation to human dignity in the Christian tradition. Thus Mieth (2014) distinguishes between the “dignity of creation, which could never be lost” and the “dignity of salvation that humans could lose through sin” (2014: 75). He attributes this distinction to Lotario dei Conti di Segni’s, De miseria humanai conditionis, and later to Pope Innocent III (ibid).

This “relational” line on the Christian concept of dignity is also explored and defended by Schwöbel (2006). However, Schwöbel comes round to underline the necessity of the relationship to God, as opposed to other humans. He argues that the threat to human dignity represented by original sin should be understood in terms of a denial of the status of the human being as a creature. The promise of the serpent, after all, is that human beings will create their own values and confer dignity on themselves, and this kind of self-conferral of dignity ultimately threatens it because genuine dignity is conferred by God in the act of creation. As such, dignity exists always through the human being’s relationship with God (2006: 52–3):

If the relationship with God is no longer the foundational relationship for all human life, then human dignity becomes something that is conferred or withheld by other finite entities…It is no longer acknowledged and recognized as something that is already there in virtue of the fact that every human life in every stage of its development is created in the image of God, but instead becomes something that is actively constituted in social relationships between humans. If it is constituted in this way, however, it can also be denied and destroyed in this way. (2006: 53)

(See also, Jenson 2006, who notes that the kind of relationality referred to by Schwöbel is found in Christian trinitarian theology [2006: 59]. For Jenson, according to trinitarian theology, the Father, Son, and Spirit each owe their specific being to their relationships to the two other terms in the trinity [2006: 60]).

Finally, it should be noted that the doctrine of imago Dei is connected to human dignity in the Jewish Tradition in some distinctive ways. Thus, Lorberbaum (2014) notes that the claim that humans are made in the image and likeness of God involves a democratization of a Mesopotamian idea, in which the image and likeness of God was present only in kings and their offspring (2014: 138). Correspondingly, the doctrine of imago Dei has concrete political and legal ramifications in the Jewish tradition. Lorberbaum notes that it not only rejects royal theology but is brought to bear on what kinds of punishments were thought fitting for various crimes. For example, it formed the basis of the idea that the death penalty was an appropriate punishment for murder in Genesis, and it made desecration of the body unacceptable in response to any crime in Talmudic law (2014: 139–40). This said, he also notes that for Maimonides, the active intellect was the mark of the image of God. Thus, only those whose intellect was developed to a high degree existed in the image of God. In turn, “Unlike Rabbi Akiva and his school, Maimonides approved of capital punishment”, for the reason that the criminal’s deeds were proof that he does not exist in the image of God (2014: 142).

3. The canonical tropes discussed in this section are also increasingly being challenged through the introduction of new historical sources for consideration. For example, despite his rejection of Pico as a Renaissance origin of our contemporary notion of human dignity, Copenhaver (2017) argues that Pico’s predecessor, Giannozzo Manetti, does seems to be a fruitful source. Similarly, Bayer (2014) argues that Martin Luther deserves a place in the theological study of imago Dei, in part for his clarity on explaining the break between the natural world and “man” (who is “most distinguished from other animals”). According to Luther, this break stems specifically from God’s “gifts” of language and reason (2014: 103). And Verbeek (2014) positions Rousseau as a critic of any view, like Pico’s or Luther’s, which assigns humans an “exalted position” in nature by “natural right”. For Rousseau, society not only corrupts human nature in ways that require us to struggle to regain authenticity, but also, this struggle ironically can succeed only in society. Verbeek thus writes of Rousseau:

Dignity is no longer a status in virtue of which an individual has rights and duties but something which to a large measure depends on others: it is through the mere presence of others that we lose it and it is only with others that we can regain it. (2014: 123)

New historical sources have also been introduced by those looking to connect contemporary debate on dignity to non-western religious and cultural traditions. For example, Metz (2010) finds the basis of human dignity in traditions of sub-Saharan African thought, which appeal to ideals of communal relationships that ground norms of interpersonal behavior. Or consider Düwell et. al.’s ambitious Cambridge Handbook of Human Dignity (2014), which offers entries on dignity in the indigenous thought of the Americas (Pharo 2014); Hinduism (Braarvig 2014b); Buddhism (Braavig 2014a), and Confucianism (Luo 2014), among others. Similarly, Shah (2017) gives us reason to think we would be well served by looking to classical Arabic traditions, especially for medieval origins of human dignity.

Finally, scholars are increasingly considering alternative narratives about human dignity that start from the viewpoints and experiences of historically oppressed and marginalized people within the western world, e.g., women, black and brown peoples, Latin-X peoples, gay and lesbian peoples, disabled people, etc. For example, Bernard Boxill (2017) reminds that romantic idealizations of human dignity in the modern world are belied by various social paradoxes. Boxill takes as his foil W.E.B DuBois’s efforts to endorse emergent ideas of human equality in the face of the gross inequity facing black people in the western world. Through this foil Boxill further explores the lamentable burden of other early Africana philosophers (c. 1800–1900) to reconcile the burgeoning ethos of dignity with the lived experience of oppression throughout the nineteenth century. Of course, this burden did not end in the nineteenth century. “I had hoped”, Martin Luther King wrote in 1963, from a Birmingham jail cell,

that the white moderate would understand that the present tension in the South is a necessary phase of the transition from an obnoxious negative peace, in which the Negro passively accepted his unjust plight, to a substantive and positive peace, in which all men will respect the dignity and worth of human personality. (1963 [1986]: 295)

One wonders exactly what King meant by “dignity.” But that is partly the point of quoting him here. We have much still to learn about the conceptual history of dignity as it unfolded outside the boundaries of the white, male, western academic tradition.

4. As for what Shultziner calls the “moral-philosophical” use of dignity, Shultziner advocates a distinction between “thick” and “thin” distinguishing properties. Thick conceptions, he argues, lean on the human side of “human dignity”, in order to articulate the norms of “good” or “bad” human worth, character and conduct. Thin conceptions lean on the dignity side of “human dignity”, to articulate the nature and conditions of what it means to humiliate or lower human worth in the light of the thick criteria (2007: 86).

5. This point might bring to mind famous ideological critiques of modernity like Marxism or canonical attempts to analyze seismic historical evils like chattel slavery, colonialism, or the holocaust, such as those offered by Du Bois, Fanon, or Arendt. And, indeed, some of these views and authors have already been linked to the concept of dignity, albeit now sometimes critically and even skeptically, either explicitly at the source or through scholarly interpretation and analysis. For example, regarding Marx, see Healy and Wilkowska 2017, or Varga 2017. Regarding Du Bois, see Boxill 2017. Regarding Fanon, see his own remarks in The Wretched of the Earth (1963: 9, 21, 109) or Black Skin, White Mask (2008: 119). Regarding Arendt, see Parekh 2008.

6. Earlier, we noted Killmister’s allowance that her three strands of dignity require different forms of recognition (one form for personal and social dignity; another for status dignity, including human dignity). And this might seem to be a monkey wrench in the attempt at unified theory. Appraisal respect and recognition respect are two very different things, as Darwall originally conceived them. They are two kinds of respect. So, given that respect fleshes out a principal definitional criterion about the normative function of dignity, why not think that the objects of these two kinds of respect are similarly distinct in kind?

7. The term “recognition respect” comes originally from Darwall (1977). It is thus important to note that Darwall (2013) revised his view to better distinguish two species of recognition respect: “moral recognition respect” (or “moral respect”) and “honor recognition respect” (or “honor respect”) Moral respect requires a reciprocal recognition of the authority or standing to address second-personal claims and hold others responsible for those claims. By contrast, to honor respect another person is to recognize them as having a specific social status which not “just anyone” can have (Darwall 2013: 17). For the same reason, honor respect has an asymmetrical quality reflecting a difference in the facts about a person’s social role, such as one’s being a “representative of the court” or an “elder” or “upper class”, which difference both explains and is used to justify hierarchical patterns of recognition. In other words, when we honor respect another person, we make greater deference to them in our deliberations than they would expect in return, or we make special deference (e.g., the way “all rise” in American courtrooms at a judge’s entrance). This distinction between moral respect and honor respect is especially relevant in the context of human dignity, given that, as we saw, one prominent strand of modern dignity theory subscribes to something like Appiah’s or Waldron’s idea of dignity-as-elevated rank. Those views raise the question of whether the correct form of recognition in those theories is supposed to be what Darwall calls honor-respect? If so, how do they explain its hierarchical implications, which seem diametrically opposed to the core tenants of human dignity? Darwall (2017) asks some of these questions and concludes that such theories come up wanting.