The Philosophy of Dance

What counts as “philosophy” of dance? This is a vexed methodological question. The array of academic approaches undertaken to promote serious investigation into the distinctive nature, and human importance, of dancing evidences the complexity of capturing movement in words. Some writers utilize tools familiar from Anglo-American analytic philosophical traditions. Others develop conceptual resources from existentialism, phenomenology and, more recently, somaesthetics. Many equally rigorous ways of addressing philosophically resonant aspects of dance are pursued by thinkers who start from embodied or practice-based foundations. Thought-provoking analyses incorporate insights and methods used by dance studies scholars, sociologists, historians, educators, anthropologists, ethnographers, practitioners, dance critics, evolutionary biologists, cognitive scientists, and psychologists. As a field, philosophy of dance has grown to encompass an array of resources needed to understand the varied cultural and personal dimensions of dancing.

The potential for this area of inquiry is enormous. This is, in part, because dance engages many branches of philosophy, including metaphysics, epistemology, the philosophy of mind, ethical theory, aesthetics, and the philosophy of art. The topic is also intellectually rich because humans have danced throughout all of recorded history for artistic, educational, therapeutic, social, political, religious and other purposes. In addition, there are dance-like undertakings on the margins of what many regard as dance-proper, such as digital/animated dance or forms of competitive dancing analogous to sports like gymnastics or ice-skating (see McFee 1992). As a result, the question of what counts as “dance” can arise readily alongside the question of what counts as the philosophy of dance, generating both philosophical and meta-philosophical opportunities for sustained deliberation.

The challenge for any scholar in dance philosophy is to draw together a multiplicity of approaches and concerns so they are in productive dialogue with one another. While there are marked differences in academic style across the field, all participants have an intellectual stake in illuminating our dancerly lives so we might better understand just what dance is and appreciate why it matters. The primary aim of this entry is to introduce several basic families of concern that recur across disciplinary domains and to offer resources for further research at the end of each section.

For more on the relationship between philosophy and dance, as well as detailed treatments of questions about dance philosophy and interdisciplinarity, see Boyce 2013, 2021; Burt 2009; Carroll 2003; Challis 1999; Cohen 1962; Colebrook 2005; Conroy 2012, 2019; cf. Cull Ó Maoilearca 2018; Cvejić 2015b; DeFrantz 2005; Farinas and Van Camp 2021b; Foster, Rothfield, and Dunagan 2005; Fraleigh 1999; cf. Franko 2014a; Friedman and Bresnahan 2021; Levin 1983; T. Lewis 2007; McFee 2013a; Pakes 2019b; Redfern 1983; Sheets-Johnstone 1984; Shusterman 2005; Sparshott 1982a, 1982b, 1983, 1988, 1993, 1995, 2004; and Van Camp 1996a, 2009, 2021a.

• 1. Analytic Approaches to Dance as Art
  • 1.1 Problems of Identity and “Re”-Activities
  • 1.2 Dance as an Ephemeral Artform
• 2. Dance, Action, and Agency
  • 2.1 Choreography, Authorship, and Copyright
  • 2.2 Dance Improvisation
• 3. Dance, Lived Experience, and Kinaesthetics
  • 3.1 The Primacy of Practice
  • 3.2 Bodily Responses
• 4. Dance and Cognitive Science
• 5. Additional Dance and Philosophy Connections
  • 5.1 Non-Western and Non-Traditional Philosophy and Dance
  • 5.2 Dance, Ethics and Social-Political Philosophy
  • 5.3 Dance, Film and Digital Technology
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Analytic Approaches to Dance as Art

Although many dance-related topics have been treated by philosophers of a broadly analytic persuasion, thinkers in this intellectual community have had an overriding interest in dance qua artform. Hence, they have attended primarily to concert or theater dance, and have given sustained thought to three central questions: What is the difference between a movement event that is dance and one that is non-dance? (The definitional question.) What kind of thing is a work of dance art? (The ontological question.) What conditions must be satisfied for the same work of dance art to be performed on multiple occasions? (The identity question.)

The definitional question preoccupied a number of early contributors to the field of dance philosophy from roughly the 1950s to the 1990s. Their shared goal was to offer an account that could distinguish the dancing in concert performances from other kinds of movement that might be seen on stage and, thereby, to indicate what makes dance, as a form of human moving, special. Well-known suggestions highlighted, among other things, the expressive qualities of the movements performed (Beardsley 1982), the symbolic potential of the movement performance (Langer 1953a and b; cf. Conroy 2015), or the performance’s relationship to artistic institutions and dance art practices (Carroll and Banes 1982). (See Section 2.) Several influential philosophers of dance, however, resisted the definitional project, arguing that it must suffer from underinclusivity given the wide array of extant dance styles and forms (Sparshott 1988; cf. Sparshott 1995) or urging that the attempt to offer essentialist definitions is futile (McFee 2021b). In recent decades, attention in so-called “analytic aesthetics” has shifted away from various attempts to define dance and toward explorations that highlight its distinctiveness by emphasizing metaphysical and appreciative issues.

Those projects that address the ontological question introduced above center on identifying what kind of thing the product of dance art-making is—an object, an abstract entity, an event, a more fluid process, or something else. It should be noted, however, that philosophers differ with regard to which aspects of dance as art should be given primacy of place for the purposes of pursuing ontology. Dance art practices recognize an array of metaphysically relevant features that one might aim to accommodate, including the seemingly “commonsense facts” that many works of dance art are repeatable (they can be performed on more than one occasion), underdetermined (they permit of performances that differ qualitatively from one another), created by humans at a certain time in history (they are not eternally existing Forms), and potentially modally flexible (the original dancemaker could have chosen some different intrinsic or identity-constitutive features) (see Carroll 2019; D. Davies 2011 and 2024; McFee 1992, 2011, and 2018; Pakes 2020).

With considerations such as these in mind, several widely debated ontological accounts of dance qua art have emphasized repeatable choreographic structures. For Nelson Goodman, such structures are typically described as being anchored metaphysically in an actual score for the dance work that specifies its essential features (Goodman 1976; cf. McFee 2012, Pakes 2020, and Van Camp 2019a). A competing structure-based approach, defended by Graham McFee, argues that works of dance art are types that can be tokened in live performance, where the parameters of the type that constitutes any particular dance artwork are established by an in principle possible score or a work “recipe” (McFee 1992b, 2011b, and 2018). Several more recent accounts depart from the details of McFee’s view, but embrace his core insight that works of dance art are fundamentally “performables” that are also typically multiples, i.e., they are works of art made for performance that can have more than one correct instance. For example, Noël Carroll recasts the ontological question to ask, “What makes something a dance-art-work?” and suggests that the answer lies in the “constitutive purposes” of the choreography as these would be appropriately understood by someone embedded in the particular community for whom the dancemaker creates (Carroll 2019: 74). Other more metaphysically complex alternatives include accounts that construe dance artworks as indicated action-types answerable to both contemporary danceworld norms and historical considerations (Pakes 2020) or as “Wollheimian types” grounded in dance art appreciative practices (D. Davies 2024).

Despite their differences, all such approaches are united insofar as they stand in contrast to those adopted by dance philosophers who think that the art-relevant focus of dance might be something other than the structure of the dance “work” construed as some kind of artistic object. Such thinkers tend to observe that dance art creations typically lack supplementary texts and are often developed without the use of any written plan (see Franko 1989, 2011a, and 2017; and Pakes 2017). They also note that even when there is a notated score, it is not always used as an “essentialist recipe” for generating future performances as it may, instead, serve as inspiration for a novel theatrical presentation (see Franko 1989). Furthermore, standardized dance notation systems are controversial, and none is used or accepted universally (see Franko 2011a and Van Camp 1998). Finally, many philosophers begin their theorizing from the belief that what makes dance art special, and, therefore, worthy of focused philosophical attention, lies in dance’s bodily, tactile, dynamic, felt, perceived or intuited aspects (sometimes referred to as its kinaesthetic or somatic elements). For these theorists, the central foci of theory and appreciation should be features of performance events and evolving danceworld experiences, rather than static scores or underlying abstract structures. (See Sections 2 and 3.)

For more on the general question, “What is dance?”, see D. Carr 1987; Carroll 2003, Copeland and Cohen 1983; McFee 1998a and 2013a; Pakes 2019b; Sparshott 1988; and Van Camp 1981. For more on meaning, expression, authenticity and communication as central or definitive aspects of dance art, see D. Carr 1997; Best 1974; Franko 2014b; Hanna 1983 and 1979 [1987]; Martin 1933a, 1939, and 1946; and Van Camp 1996b. For an extended treatment of the dance art appreciative practices to which an ontological account might aim to be responsive, see D. Davies 2024. See also Meskin 1999 for an alternative view of dancework ontology that holds that dance audiences experience three works of art: a choreographic-work, a production-work, and a performance-interpretation work; cf. Thom 2019. For discussion of "dance as text" and a replete history of this idea, see Franko 1993, 2011a, and 2011b; cf. Pakes 2020.

1.1 Problems of Identity and “Re”-Activities

The ontological question is pressing for many philosophers because it bears directly on a number of other important issues pertaining to dance preservation and dance art appreciation. As mentioned briefly above, there are many potential “problems of identity” for dance that arise in analytic aesthetics, where these are all related to the basic issue of how the numerical identity of any given work is secured across different performances (cf. Fraleigh 2004 for an alternative usage of the word “identity” for dance). One concern is that, as a matter of practice, the occasion on which a dance is composed does not “fix” the creative product for all time. Although dance works are usually known by the name and date of their first performance, subsequent iterations and casts can change structural and qualitative features of the inaugural presentation, sometimes substantially. A related concern is that many dance art creations simply have no notated score. Even for those that are preserved via video or other form of tangible fixation, later performances may still deviate from these frameworks in significant ways.

There are additional complications to consider. For example, in those relatively rare cases where there is a score from which dance artists work (roughly, as an architect builds from a blueprint), following notated instructions might not produce performances that are experientially identifiable as the “same” work of art. Furthermore, a dance notation might function as the jumping-off point from which to make a radically new kind of dance, rather than as a limitation on innovation that constrains future choreographers and dancers. There is also the issue that what a dance “is” in practice, or for purposes of public appreciation, may not be identical to what a dance “is” for purposes of numerical identity and historical preservation. In this way dance is not unlike music (for more on this see S. Davies 1991).

Another complication arises from the fact that there are different kinds of “re”-activities commonly undertaken in dance, and the distinctions between them are not clear from the way language is used by members of the danceworld. Philosophers of dance, dance studies scholars, and practitioners, for instance, recognize the possibility of re-performing a dance art creation, reviving one that has languished but not fallen prey to the vicissitudes of time and memory, reconstructing a “lost” piece of dance art history from scholarly resources and personal interviews, and reenacting historically important dance moments or ideas by mounting performances that re-visit them in a new way. The possibility of returning to our dance art past under these various descriptions raises a number of questions. Is it desirable to attempt to reconstruct a work, or is it more profitable to reenact important elements of a choreographer’s oeuvre? If historical reconstruction aims to recover a forgotten piece of dance history, must it thereby be understood as an enterprise that aims to preserve the numerical identity of the reconstructed work? What is the difference (if any) between revival and reconstruction, and why should dance insiders pursue either of these “re”-activities rather than creating new works of dance art? Can reenactment provide historical knowledge about our dance pasts?

For detailed treatment of these issues by multiple authors (who are both theorists and practitioners), see anthologies edited by Jordan 2000, Franko 2017, and Main 2017. For more on various issues surrounding dance work identity and “re”-activities, see D. Carr 1997; Cohen 1982; Conroy 2013b; Franko 1989 and 2017b; McFee 1994, 1998a, and 2011b; Pakes 2017 and 2020; Rubidge 2000; Sparshott 1988 and 1995; Thomas 2018; and Van Camp 1981 and 2019a. For more on the role of scores in dance, see Armelagos and Sirridge 1978; D. Davies 2011b; Goodman 1976; McFee 2011b and 2018.

1.2 Dance as an Ephemeral Artform

One feature of dance as a performing art that is often noted, and contributes to the challenge of offering a philosophical answer to the identity question, is that it moves and changes, both during the course of any given performance and over time. A catchall phrase for this sort of impermanence—reflecting the lack of entirely stable art objects in this artistic milieu—is that “dance is an ephemeral art.” While it admits of alternative interpretations (see Conroy 2012; Copeland and Cohen 1983; Copeland 1993; Jollimore 2019; and Pakes 2020), in no case should this common locution be taken to imply that dance art is insubstantial or unserious. Instead, it signals that there is something vital about dance that disappears as the dancers perform, and its use is often meant to encourage philosophers to regard this as a significant, or even central, feature of dance qua artform.

To wit, dance critic Marcia Siegel famously wrote that dance “exists at a perpetual vanishing point” which, for Siegel, means that dance exists in “an event that disappears in the very act of materializing” (1972: 1). She posits that artistic dance escaped the mass marketing of the industrial revolution “precisely because it doesn’t lend itself to any reproduction…” (1972: 5). The most conservative ontological interpretation of Siegel’s claims might be that dance performances are one-time, transient events (Conroy 2012). This, however, would not be a philosophically consquential reading because it is (relatively) uncontroversial that all theatrical performances are events and all events are transient. Hence, what seems to be at stake in describing dance art as ineluctably ephemeral is the idea that its fleetingness is more significant appreciatively than is the transience characteristic of the other performing arts, such as music and theater. If this is true, then it will be crucial for every full-blooded philosophical account of dance to address the nature and aesthetic-artistic importance of its fragility.

One way to address this challenge is to adopt a negative view of the ephemerality of dance art. To this end, one might argue that dance’s natural tendency to “evaporate” in real time threatens the possibility of presenting the same dance artwork on multiple occasions and, thereby, puts pressure on the idea that dance falls under the “classical paradigm” discussed by D. Davies (2011b) and upheld by Goodman (1976) and McFee (2011b and 2018). Another tactic is to emphasize facts about the practical realities of life in the dance art community. Because dance artists do not trade in writing scores or scripts, and dance practitioners are highly tolerant of making adjustments for both artistic and pragmatic reasons, many dance art creations simply do not survive for very long unless they continue to be performed consistently.

A contrary approach takes the ephemeral character of dance to be one of its good-making features. On this positive view, we ought to appreciate, rather than decry, dance’s ever-changing and disappearing nature (Jollimore 2019). Defenders of this view often note that ephemerality is a key attribute that makes a performance of a dance into a vital experience for both the dance performers and the audience. The positive proposal celebrates the live nature of the dance event and aims to explain why kinesthetic responses to dance art performances could be both appreciatively relevant and viscerally powerful. It also suggests that ephemerality might serve an important aesthetic role for dance insofar as it provides a uniquely robust “you had to be there” theatrical experience. (See Bresnahan 2014a for an account of improvisational artistry in live dance performance consistent with this perspective.) Depending on how it is cashed out, this interpretation of the idea that dance “exists at a perpetual vanishing point” might or might not be tension with contemporary theoretical approaches that regard dance art as in a new era of “post-ephemerality” (Franko 2018b).

2. Dance, Action, and Agency

Philosophers of dance frame questions about action and agency in markedly different ways, though most embrace the basic view that dancing is an activity and, therefore, not something that can be done accidentally (see McFee 1992, 2011b, and 2018). Those with an interest in dance as a form of expert action (akin to sports) tend to center their analyses on technical and athletic prowess, as well as on artistic skills like moving with expressivity or grace, and to focus on dance as art (see Montero 2016). Others with an interest in vernacular or communal dance forms explore puzzles that can arise when movers coalesce into temporary dancing communities that seem, for the duration of the dance event, to have an agential component that exceeds, and is distinct from, that of any particular dancer in the group (see Kronsted 2021 and 2023). The presumption that dance is not mere physical movement opens up a number of roles for intentional action to play in any philosophical treatment of dance as art or social activity.

One family of philosophical interests is responsive to the definitional question mentioned in Section 1. To this end, one could characterize dance as an artform that involves “action” in a specific way in virtue of its expressive character. Dance historian Selma Jean Cohen (1962) claims that expressiveness is present in all dance, inspiring Monroe C. Beardsley (1982) to argue that this might be a necessary, if not sufficient, condition for dance as art. Borrowing explicitly from action theory, Beardsley notes that one bodily action can, under the right circumstances, sortally generate another kind of action. Thus, the act of running can, if conditions are right, become artistically expressive and, thereby, be part of the performance of a dance art creation (see Beardlsey 1982 and Van Camp 1981; cf. Khatchadourian 1978, who argues that dance movements are not actions).

A famous alternative that also addresses definition, broadly construed, is offered by Susanne K. Langer (1953b), who holds that dance as art is a symbol-making endeavor. For Langer, dance’s symbolic character, or “primary illusion”, is what she calls “virtual power” or gesture, in contrast to virtual time (for music), virtual space (for the plastic arts) or the illusion of life (for some poetry and some drama). This semiotic theory implicates action in both the creation and performance of dance artworks and suggests that dance art is constituted of much more intentionally rich ingredients than mere movements or strings of choreographic sequences. Sondra Horton Fraleigh (1996) offers a different conceptual approach, but maintains with other authors considered in this section that dance is necessarily expressive and transitive action. (See Meskin 1999 for more on dances as action sequences rather than mere movements. See Carroll and Banes 1982 for a critique of Beardsley’s theory of dance as expressive action.)

Another set of concerns about action in dance relates more readily to the ontological question (see Section 1). For instance, Anna Pakes’ view of dance works as indicated or initiated action-types appeals to action to articulate what kind of things such artworks are at the most fundamental metaphysical level (Pakes 2020). Pakes agrees that action is a necessary feature of dance in general (2013) and, with Aaron Meskin (1999), urges that the embodiment of dance in physical, intentional events renders works of dance art better construed as created action-structures than eternal types or Platonic Forms. Considerations about the embodied nature of dancing also incline Pakes to be wary of the idea that there could be such a thing as purely “conceptual dance”, i.e., a dance artwork in which the actions that constitute the dancing are merely a means to some further artistic-intellectual end (Pakes 2019a). A distinct, but obliquely related, topic in this domain is how to understand the normativity embedded in dance art as the product of intentional actions undertaken in the appropriate contexts, issuing from the right kind of psychological states (McFee 2021b).

Other contemporary dance philosophers regard the minded agency involved in creating choreography, performing dance, or both, as a primary area of philosophical interest. Often their accounts are connected to normative, epistemic and ontological commitments about what dance is and why it matters. Many such theorists (including Bresnahan 2014a, 2017a, and 2019b; Kronsted 2020 and 2023; Merritt 2015; and Montero 2016) utilize tools from both analytic and phenomenological traditions, coupled with insights from research in the cognitive sciences. (See Section 4.) Some attend to the activities and agency of audience members qua appreciators, but most focus on the intentional and embodied activities of dancers.

It is helpful to keep in mind that three disctinct, though not mutually exclusive, kinds of agency are often explored in connection with dance performers. First, there is a “thin” sense of agency that simply distinguishes dancing persons from, say, Boston Dynamic robots on the grounds that the former, but not the latter, execute movements under intentional descriptions (McFee 2018). Second, there is a “thicker” sense of agency that tracks the degree to which dancers are afforded various kinds of opportunities to make free decisions that express their intentionality, and unique personalities, as they perform (Bresnahan 2014a). Third, there is a phenomenon one might call “mixed” agency that refers to cases in which dancers have the conflicted experience of being both the authors of their movements and of losing executive control to a partner or larger group (Kronsted 2021 and 2023).

For more on dance agency and intentional action see Bunker, Pakes and Rowell 2013; D. Carr 1987; J. Carr 2013; Conroy 2021; Noland 2009; and Sheets-Johnstone 1981, 1999, 2011, and 2012.

2.1 Choreography, Authorship, and Copyright

In an extension of the thicker sense of agency articulated above, Van Camp (1980) holds that, for purposes of art-critical judgment and artistic appreciation, it is sometimes the case that the dancer “creates” and is not limited to merely interpreting the dance that is viewed. Dancers often supply structural and stylistic elements in the course of rehearsing and presenting a dance piece that were neither specified, nor provided by, the choreographer during the compositional process. If these additions are artistically significant, then what the dancer contributes might be better understood as a kind of dancerly “creation” than taken to be a mere performance “interpretation” of an already completed work.

This suggestion is opposed by McFee (2011b, 2013c and 2018), who argues that works of dance art are authored by choreographers but embodied by dancers to render the dancemaker’s creative choices visible to audiences. (See also Chris Challis 1999.) On the choreographer-as-sole-dancework-creator view, the dancer’s role is both instrumental and subsidiary to the dancemaker’s vision. Furthermore, on this account, a dancer’s area of expertise qua embodier is the activity of dancing, not dance-art-making. It follows from this that, while dancers contribute the raw material for dance performances, they are more like skilled technicians or artisans than author-artists.

Two points are important to clarify this view. First, it does not entail that choreographers cannot dance their own works; but it does maintain that, in their role as dancers of works they have created, they are to be assessed as interpreters rather than makers. Second, it recognizes that dancers often contribute substantially to the choreographic and qualitative contours of the works we see on stage, but holds that these kinds of contributions are insufficient to render the performers “co-authors” with the choreographer. This is because it is the dancemaker, rather than the dancer, who ultimately decides what elements of the work will be regarded as necessary and what aspects will remain underdetermined, thereby providing those who embody the work on stage opportunities to exercise interpretive license in performance.

This view has been criticized in various ways for neglecting the artistic significance of the performers’ role in making and performing dances (see Alpert 2016; Bresnahan 2013; and Pakes 2020). It has also been suggested that the dancer might be rightly regarded as a co-author (with the choreographer) of a different kind of artistic product, the “performed work”, a concatenation of the performable crafted by the dancemaker and the performance interpretation created by the dancers (see Thom 2019). McFee (2018) bolsters his controversial account with the idea that authorship of dance artworks is, and should be, attributable only to those who bear both generative and artistic responsibility for them. This comes close to, yet stops short of, equating authorial credit for dances with intellectual property rights. It is worth noting, therefore, that it is by no means the case (particularly in the U.S.) that those who create works of dance art are the persons given public credit for, or granted legal copyright over, them.

For more on creative decision-making and choreography in dance see Cvejić 2015a and 2017; Foster 2011; and Melrose 2017. For an article on video choreography see Salzer and Baer 2015. Cf. S. Davies 1991 for a discussion of whether creative additions to a “thin” work of art can “thicken” it. For more on issues of authorship in dance and copyright, see Kraut 2010, 2011 and 2016; Pakes 2020; and Van Camp 1994. For a book on dance, disability and the law see Whatley et al. 2018.

2.2 Dance Improvisation

“Improvisation” in dance often refers to the agency and intentional action of dance-makers and performers (who might or might not be the same people) rather than to the result of their activity. Three kinds of improvisation in theater dance, as articulated by Curtis Carter, are often discussed (Carter 2000: 182): (1) embellishments where set choreography persists, (2) improvisation as spontaneous free movement for use in established choreography, and (3) improvisation for its own sake brought to a high level of performance. An example of (1) is a case in which a dance performer is allowed to amplify existing movements (doing a triple pirouette in place of a double, for example) or permitted to add a stylistic flourish (such as an extra flick of the wrist or tilt of the head). An example of (2) is a sitution in which no choreography has been provided for eight bars of music and the dancers are instructed to move as they wish in this compositional gap. Finally, (3) covers cases of what D. Davies (2011b) calls a “work performance”, that is, situations in which a dance work is choreographed by the dancers while dancing. It also includes cases where either the whole performance, or a substantial part of it, is improvised from start to finish. Dances comprised of Steve Paxton’s “contact improvisation”, for example, could count as improvisation in this third sense (see Paxton 1975 and 1981).

Danielle Goldman (2010) offers critical analysis of the idea of “freedom” implicit in the second kind of improvisation. She suggests that we examine social and historical constraints on the genuine possibility of “freedom”, since creative liberty cannot exist in oppressive cultural conditions where prohibitive social and physical barriers prevail or exert pressure. Goldman thus suggests an alternative conception of improvisation as

a rigorous mode of making oneself ready for a range of potential situations…an incessant preparation, grounded in the present while open to the next moment’s possible actions and constraints. (2010: 142)

Susan Leigh Foster (2003) shares Goldman’s view that it is the moment immediately before an actual dance movement occurs that lends a distinctive aesthetic quality to dance improvisation when used in art-presentational contexts. “[I]t is,” she claims,“this suspense-filled plenitude of the not-quite-known that gives live performance its special brilliance” (2003: 4). She also offers a phenomenological account of the kind of agency involved in dance improvisation, equating the lived experience of improvising with the use of a “middle voice” in which a dancer finds herself in a flow of movement that occupies an intermediate position between deliberative choice-making and passive direction.

Dance philosophers have identified other forms of dance improvisation that do not fit neatly into Carter’s three categories. Kent de Spain (2003), for example, draws attention to a kind of improvisation practiced by dancers to achieve a movement-based somatic state. Somatic improvisation, or the results of such improvisational exercises, may be included in a theater performance for an audience, but need not be. Constance Valis Hill (2003) includes “challenge dance” performances, stemming from the African-American tradition of dance “battles”, where the goal is to win an ever-escalating competition of skill and style. Like somatic improvisation, challenge dance improvisation can be offered for audience appreciation in a concert context, but need not be—it often takes place in social and street settings for pure entertainment or socio-political purposes. In addition, Aili Bresnahan (2014a) defends the claim that all live dance performance involves improvisational artistry, and argues that the ineluctably improvisatory nature of artistic dancing can be regarded as a form of embodied and extended agency (continuous with 4-E accounts advanced in the philosophy of mind, esp. Clark 2011).

For more on improvisation in dance, see Albright and Gere 2003; Clemente 1990; De Spain 1993, 2014, and 2019; Kloppenberg 2010; Matheson 2005; Novack 1990 and 1988 [2010]; Pallant 2006; Paxton 1975 and 1981; Zaporah 2003; and The Oxford Handbook of Improvisation in Dance (Midgelow 2019). For more on improvisation in the arts, see the Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism special issue on Improvisation in the Arts, Spring, 2000 (Hagberg 2000); Alperson 1984, 1998, and 2010; Bresnahan 2015; Brown 1996; Hagberg 1998; G. Lewis 2014; the Oxford Handbook of Critical Improvisation Studies (2 volumes, Lewis and Piekut 2016/Piekut and Lewis 2016); and Sawyer 2000. Cf. Symposium, 2010, “Musical Improvisation” in The Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism. For recent discussion of improvisation in vernacular dance forms, particularly those that often include dance battles, see Kronsted 2021 and 2023.

3. Dance, Lived Experience, and Kinaesthetics

There are fields of philosophy, particularly in the Continental, pragmatic, and non-Western traditions, that treat art as both an activity and an experiential phenomenon. These approaches regard lived experience, including its bodily and somatic aspects, as something that can provide legitimate descriptive or causal evidence for philosophical claims. Richard Shusterman has developed a distinctive phenomenological theory, “somaesthetics”, to explain our embodied engagement with all art, including dance, in a way that includes various kinds of bodily awareness (see 2008, 2009, 2011a, 2011b, 2011c, 2012, and 2019). A commitment common to such thinkers is that understanding dance, in all its forms, requires us to look beyond the information provided by the projective sense modalities of sight and hearing and to consider what, how, and why dance experiences make us feel.

For more on these general topics, see Dewey 1934; Merleau-Ponty 1945 and 1964; along with Berleant 1991; Bresnahan 2014b; Foultier and Roos 2013 (Other Internet Resources); Johnson 2007; Katan 2016; Lakoff and Johnson 1999; and Merritt 2015. For more on phenomenological approaches to dance, see Albright 2011; Fraleigh 1996 (which also contains material on the history of dance in aesthetics), 2000, and 2018; Franko 2011b; and Sheets-Johnstone 1966 and 2015. Cf. Ness 2011 for an account of a shift in dance away from phenomenology with Foucault. For more on dance and somatics, see Eddy 2002; Fraleigh 2015; Weber 2019; and Williamson et al. 2014. See also LaMothe 2009; Pakes 2003, 2017a, and 2019; and Parvainen 2002 for work on the related field of dance, the body, and epistemology.

3.1 The Primacy of Practice

Philosophers who treat lived experience as legitimate evidence for theory are firmly committed to the validity of practice in the philosophy of dance. Thinkers at home in analytic aesthetics, however, often find it necessary to explicate or defend their philosophical recourse to what transpires in the “dirt and mess” of studio rehearsals, is understood collectively during polished stage performances, and is articulated individually in critical notices. David Davies (2009 and 2024), for example, urges that ontologies of art should operate under a “pragmatic constraint” that tethers abstract metaphysical claims to relevant features of the artistic practice under consideration. Barbara Montero (2012, 2013, and 2016) argues, instead, that there is strong empirical evidence to support the idea that practitioners are experts in their domains; hence, their specially informed perspectives should be given due theoretical weight, if not pride of place.

Other philosophers also argue that analytic dance aesthetics should be more thoughtful about, and attentive to, actual danceworld practices. Julie Van Camp has proposed

that the identity of works of art [including dance] be understood pragmatically as ways of talking and acting by the various communities of the art world. (2006: 42)

Renee Conroy (2013b), by contrast, defends three “minimal desiderata” for an adequate account of dancework identity, two of which require that any metaphysical theory be responsive to the complex socio-artistic matrix of the dance artworld. Despite their differences, all four of these broadly analytic thinkers place a premium on ensuring that philosophical treatments of dance remain respectful of danceworld conventions, values, and norms.

It should be noted, however, that this shared goal can be accomplished in different ways and these approaches are not methodologically equivalent. For some, commitment to the primacy of practice is a reflective one that allows the results of good theory to be revisionist with respect to our core beliefs about works of dance art and, hence, to potentially alter some danceworld practices. For others, philosophical treatment of dance should begin with danceworld norms and customs and develop accounts that elucidate, or highlight the complexities of, extant dance art practices while leaving the beliefs and behaviors they support largely intact.

For more on the relationship between dance practice and dance philosophy, see Pakes 2020. For an account of dance practice as research, see Pakes 2003 and 2017a. For more on dance expertise and its relevance to philosophical theory, see Bresnahan 2017b and 2019a, He and Ravn 2018; Melrose 2017; Montero 2013 and 2016; Vass-Rhee 2018; and Washburn et al. 2014.

3.2 Bodily Responses

There is sustained controversy in dance philosophy about how to construe the felt, bodily responses that audience members can experience while watching a dance performance. These somatic reactions are often called “kinaesthetic” (or “kinesthetic”), combining the reference to movement in “kinetic” with the sense of “aesthetic” often associated with grace and beauty. Two central questions surrounding kineasthesia are: (1) What is the causal process by which kinaesthetic responses are generated? and (2) To what extent, if any, does this process inform a proper understanding of dance qua art?

With respect to the first question, it is generally acknowledged that the causal processes that might explain kinaesthetic responses to watching a live dance performance are not well understood. It is not clear, for example, how “empathy”, taken in the broad sense as the ability to feel something based on what we perceive to be another person’s physical or emotional state, plays a role in viewers’ kinaesthetic reactions to what they witness at a dance event.

With regard to the second query, some contemporary philosophers of dance (e.g., Montero 2006a, 2006b, 2012, and 2013) appeal to research in cognitive and neuroscience to help explain why audience members report having kineaesthetic experiences, such as a quickening heart rate, a dropping stomach, and various muscular tensions, while they watch dancers in action. Recent discussions also highlight the relationship between felt bodily responses in audience members and various uses of the imagination, drawing on Kendall Walton’s highly influential Mimesis as Make-Believe: On the Foundations of the Representational Arts (1990) (see Conroy 2020; cf. Heckman 2023). The scope of concern about kineasthesia and dance appreciation has also been expanded to include analysis of the kinds of “frissons”, or bodily thrills, a dance art performance might be designed intentionally to inspire in audience members (Nanay 2023).

Dance philosophers defend a range of views about the significance of felt bodily responses to dance art appreciation. Some authors presume they are important, but do not elucidate why or in what manner kinaesthetics might contribute to engaging works of dance art aptly. Others are “appreciative optimists” (here modifying D. Davies 2013, see Section 4) who argue that viewers’ bodily responses might be valuable, or even necessary, for identifying correctly some of a dance work’s artistic properties, such as the gracefulness of an arm movement or the beauty of an extended physical line (see Montero 2006a and 2006b; cf. Seeley 2020). At the opposite end of the argumentive spectrum are “appreciative pessimists” who deny that a viewer’s felt somatic reaction to a dance art performance can ever be relevant to grasping the artistic features of the dance qua artwork (see McFee 1992, 2011b, 2018).

Those who occupy a middle position in this debate contend that while bodily responses can bear on the appreciative understanding of a dance art creation, and contribute to our regard for some of its art-relevant features, kinaesthetic reactions do not register the work’s fine-grained artistic properties reliably (see Conroy 2013a and 2020). All of these positions are conceptually distinct from those defended in the debate over the value of utilizing scientific data and empirical studies as elements of dance philosophy (see Section 4). They do, nonetheless, tend to track optimism and pessimism about this discrete methodological issue.

For more on empathy and the kinaesthetic aspects of performance, see Foster 2008 and 2011. For more on kinaesthetic responses to dance, see Bresnahan 2017b; Montero 2021; Reason and Reynolds 2010; Sklar 2008; and Smyth 1984.

4. Dance and Cognitive Science

The number of dance philosophers who appeal to scientific research to advance understanding of the physical aspects of making and appreciating dance art is large and growing. For example, Maxine Sheets-Johnstone’s extensive body of dance writing incorporates so much content from the cognitive and other sciences that it would require another entry to list all the relevant references (see this entry’s bibliography for “Sheets-Johnstone” as a start). Several important lines of thought have, however, introduced the topic of empirical research into on-going discussions of dance philosophers who work within broadly analytic traditions.

For example, Montero argues that proprioception (the innate capacity that apprises persons of their bodily position in space) might be construed as an aesthetic sense and appeals to scientific research on mirror neurons to defend this view (Montero 2006a, 2006b, 2013, 2016, and 2021). Carroll expands Montero’s argumentative project to consider how dance and music can work together to affect our kinaesthetic responses (Carroll and Moore 2011) and to explore how experimental results in neuroscience could bolster dance critic John Martin’s theory of “metakinetic transfer” (Carroll and Seeley 2013).

As noted above, writers who support the use of empirical research on kinaesthetic responses to dance also tend to hold that the felt bodily resonances engendered by watching a live dance performance can be relevant to appreciation of dance qua art. To this end, Carroll and Seeley (2013) argue that one central feature of understanding dance well is grasping the nature of the experience in all its aspects, including both cognitive and kinaesthetic elements. They maintain, therefore, that connecting common phenomenological reports with robust scientific explanations of them can be elucidating and is appropriate to generating comprehensive understanding of the dance-appreciative experience. This can be called the “moderately optimistic (methodological) view” (following D. Davies 2013).

By contrast, some philosophers adopt a stance that is “moderately pessimistic” (D. Davies 2013). These thinkers regard some questions central to dance aesthetics as simply unanswerable by science. Normative issues such as, “What counts as proper appreciation of a work of art?” are, they argue, such that the tools utilized in empirical study fail to engage them helpfully, if at all. Thus, the moderate methodological pessimist maintains that, if empirical research is to be used by dance philosophers and others with an interest in the performing arts, then it must be applied very carefully to the right set of questions (D. Davies 2011a, 2013, 2014, and 2024).

Being only “moderate”, however, this kind of pessimist can argue that philosophy ought not partition itself off entirely from science and other disciplines that could inform our best overall thinking about the world. We would do well, on this view, to follow the Quinean injunction that philosophy should be cognizant of, and responsive to, current science so we can assess how our philosophic positions fit into our broader web of beliefs. A moderate pessimist might also be sympathetic to the idea that, at a minimum, empirical research can help us avoid false assumptions about the arts based on simple empirical misunderstandings about human beings (Seeley 2011).

An “extreme (methodological) pessimist”, by contrast, will deny that causal or scientific explanations can ever be relevant to a philosophical treatment of issues pertaining to dance as an artform (see McFee 2011a, 2013b and 2018). One common argumentative defense of this position emphasizes the fact that artistic appreciation happens at the level of a person who appreciates under various normative constraints, not at the level of neurobiology. While optimists concede that kinaesthetic responses cannot alone generate a full, artistically sensitive apprehension of dance, they do think neurobiologic studies of them can contribute to our wider understanding of human responses to perceived movement, including dance art. Optimists and moderate pessimists, therefore, both maintain that scientific data has some legitimate place in dance philosophy, precisely the claim the extreme pessimist rejects.

For more dance philosophical writing that includes appeal to the cognitive and neuroscience, see Bläsing et al. 2012 and Bläsing et al. 2019; Bresnahan 2014a; Cross and Ticini 2012; Hagendoorn 2012; Katan 2016; Kronsted 2021 and 2023; Jang and Pollick 2011; He and Ravn 2018; Jola, Ehrenberg, and Reynolds 2012; Legrand and Ravn 2009; McKechnie and Stevens 2009; Merritt 2015; Montero 2006a, 2006b, 2010, 2012, and 2013; Seeley 2011, 2013 and 2020; Vass-Rhee 2018. See also Bresnahan 2017a for an account of how dance training affects our temporal experience, and Bresnahan 2019a for the view that expert dance movements are often experienced and perceived via subconscious processes before they are fully cognized. For more on Martin’s theory of “metakinetic transfer”, which he attributes to a natural human capacity for “muscular sympathy” and “inner mimicry”, see Martin 1939 and Franko 1996. For an additional discussion of various optimisms and pessimisms in this domain, see Bullot et al. 2017. For more on the relationship between music and dance, see Aasen 2021; Olsson 2024; and Van Camp 2021b.

5. Additional Dance and Philosophy Connections

The final section is spare because the reader is encouraged to seek out interdisciplinary sources beyond those mentioned in this entry, to look at the additional readings recommended at the end of each section, and to do independent research on the variety of approaches to thinking about dance that populate the pages of dance studies and performance studies journals.

5.1 Non-Western and Non-Traditional Philosophy and Dance

Here the reader is invited to consult sources that may not be called “philosophy” but something else, such as religious studies, ethnography, cultural anthropology, and oral history, particularly in traditions where philosophy and religious scholarship is meshed (as in Islamic philosophy and some forms of East Asian and Indian philosophy) or where the histories and values are communicated orally rather than in writing (as is often the case in the philosophy of native and indigenous peoples). There is also much of interest to be found in the literature, poetry, and song of groups and peoples who are not a traditionally enfranchised part of the Western philosophical canon. And, in recent years, there is increasing discussion in academic publications of both Western and non-Western vernacular or social dance forms.

The bibliographic sources provided on non-Western and non-traditional philosophy and/or non-Western forms of dance include: S. Davies (2006, 2008, 2012, 2017, and 2021) on Balinese Legong; Fraleigh (2010 and 2015) on the Japanese form of dance known as Butoh (which also addresses the question of whether Butoh is, itself, a form of philosophy); Friedman (2021) on post-colonial African philosophical frameworks as applied to dance; Hall (2012) on Fanon’s view of dance; Osumare (2007) on Africanist aesthetics and hip-hop; Schroeder (2009) on Nietzsche and the Kyoto school; Welch (2019) on Native American dance and the phenomenology of performative knowledge; and Welsh-Asante (1990), who has published a piece on Cabral, Fanon and dance in Africa. See also Section 5.2 below, particularly for Western non-traditional philosophy, some of which is critical work that has been placed under the social-political category.

5.2 Dance, Ethics and Social-Political Philosophy

Here the reader is invited to consult journals focused on ethics, social and political philosophy, periodicals that highlight cultural and critical studies (such as gender, race, disability, ethnicity, LGBTQ+ and others), and writing in both dance studies and dance history. For a subject-related entry that discusses the influence of post-structuralism and politics on dance philosophy, see Pakes 2019b. (Cf. Cull Ó Maoilearca 2012 for a Deleuzean account of the ethics of performance that might apply to dance.)

Additional sources one might consult include the following: Fiona Bannon’s monograph (2018) on dance and ethics (which makes use of Spinoza’s and Martin Buber’s moral theories); Karen Bond’s comprehensive and multifaceted book (2019), Dance and Quality of Life (which addresses how dance contributes to what is good for human beings); Bresnahan and Deckard (2019) and Hall (2018) on disability and dance; DeFrantz’s work on black dance and aesthetics (2005, 2019, 2021); Eva Kit Wah Man’s book (2019) on bodies, aesthetics and politics in China (which is not specifically about dance); Royona Mitra’s work on Akram Khan’s style of dance and choreography as a form of inter-culturalism (2015 and 2018); Melpignano (2023) on dance as a form of political expression; Eric Mullis (2021) on dance and political power; Halifu Osumare’s memoir, Dancing in Blackness (2018), and its companion piece, Dancing the Afrofuture (2024); and Sherman (2018) on dancers, soldiers and emotional engagement. See also the three-part essay on dance as embodied ethics in Bresnahan, Katan-Schmid, and Houston (2020).

5.3 Dance, Film and Digital Technology

Dance made for social or artistic reasons includes more than real-time bodily performances presented on the concert stage, in the streets, or other live venues. There is a great variety of dancing designed to be appreciated in digital, filmic or other technologically-mediated formats, even excluding the recent explosion of dance on Tik-Tok. New dance philosophy, as philosophy of these new dance arts, is developing accordingly. Dancemakers have a long history of enthusiastic experimentation with emerging technologies going back, at least, to Loïe Fuller in the late 19th century. Thus, contemporary philosophical questions in this domain are complicated by the unprecedented array of technologies now available to create dances, and there is particular interest in issues surrounding dance and AI.

In this multi-faceted area of inquiry, it is important to mark a distinction between Screendance (a hybrid art genre of dance and film), dances made for screen (such as a sanctioned recording of a performance designed to be viewed in movie theaters or on television), and dance on screen (video traces of past live dance events). Current philosophical debates emphasize questions such as: When we view a dance performance through a mediated format, do we have genuine commerce with the work of dance art? (D. Davies 2019 and 2021; McFee 2018) Are substantive aesthetic-artistic experiences, or opportunities for meaningful kineasthetic engagement, compromised when we watch dance on screen? (Berleant 2021; Heckman 2021) How does the use of video recording or other digital tools to generate new works of dance art, or create dance scores, affect our best accounts about what kind of things dance works are? (Blades 2015b; Pakes 2020)

In addition to considering the following resources, the reader is encouraged to conduct dance philosophy research by watching film and reading emerging technology journals. Dance philosophers who write on dance and film include Brannigan 2014; Carroll 2001; McFee 2018; and Salzer and Baer 2015. Hetty Blades (2015a and 2015b) has written specifically on dance, virtual technology and scoring, and her work addresses other forms of dance technology as well. For a piece on dance, ethics and technology, see Mullis 2015. See also the extended section on dance and technology in the Bloomsbury Handbook to Dance and Philosophy (2021) edited by Rebecca Farinas and Julie Van Camp, with consultation by Craig Hanks and Aili Bresnahan.

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Acknowledgments

As of the 2025 update, Renee Conroy has taken responsibility for updating and maintaining this entry. In the earlier version of this entry, an attempt was made to canvass some of the history of the philosophy of dance as it existed and had developed in western philosophical aesthetics. In that domain dance is treated as a meaning-making and often communicative, expressive or representational theater or concert art that is practiced and performed for audience appreciation. The present version of the entry attempts to map out a broader terrain for a larger and more inclusive philosophy of dance. But it is still incomplete. This reflects, in part, limitations of space as well as the fact that the much of dance philosophy exists in locations disparate enough that often they are not (yet) in communication with one another. (See Pakes 2019b for an excellent overview of the field of philosophy of dance—it is our recommendation that this work be treated as a companion piece to this entry.)

To make room for this expanded account of the philosophy of dance, earlier sections of this entry on the history of dance in Western analytic aesthetics, comparisons with music and theater, on the concepts of representation and expression, and on dance criticism have been supplanted by new sections. Those readers who wish to review the philosophical aesthetics history will find it in the earlier version of this entry. See also the references to Plato, Nietzsche, Scott 2018, and Sparshott 1998 for additional historical sources.