1. For more on Clarke’s theory of necessity, see Yenter 2014 (265–266), Sangiacomo 2018, and Jorati 2021.

2. See Schliesser 2014 (44 & 48) for a more modest reading of Clarke’s argument. See Henry 2020 for an argument that Clarke’s views on this matter depart significantly from Newton’s views.

3. See especially Obligations 179–180 of 1706 edition; sermon preached Oct 11 1709; Whiston 1730, 146; Sermon CXXI, 2.38–39. See also Snobelen 2004 (275–284) and Wigelsworth 2009 (58ff).

4. Clarke is not clear on what exactly it is about consciousness that requires unity (Rozemond 2003, 175–177). Officially, consciousness is a reflexive act in which I recognize my thoughts as my own and is therefore prior to memory, although Clarke sometimes writes “consciousness” when he seems to mean “memory” (Thiel 2011, 231).

5. Note that Clarke’s use of the term “a priori” is not that which has been standard since Kant. The argument is a priori not primarily because it is available independent of experience, but because it argues from the nature of the cause to the nature of the effect; this is in contrast with the argument a posteriori which works from the effects — e.g., the design of the world— to the cause — e.g., the designer.

6. There is disagreement about the structure of Clarke’s argument and how much of it proceeds a priori. Ferguson (1976, 26) claims that “Clarke employs four arguments—the three traditional ones, the cosmological, the ontological, the teleological, and a further argument from the nature of space and time.” More frequently, scholars see a single argument, all of which is called the argument a priori. Although the reconstruction provided here follows traditional usage in calling the entire argument “the argument a priori,” only the first stage is a priori. Midway through, Clarke appeals to the existence of intelligent beings, which is an a posteriori claim, and this ushers in the transition from the metaphysical to the moral attributes of God. For more on this, see Pfizenmaier 78–81.

7. Clarke does not explicitly acknowledge that “something always was” is ambiguous between a stronger, de re reading and a weaker, de dicto reading. Because the stronger, de re claim (this particular thing has always existed) seems unwarranted by the argument thus far and the next step of the argument is to establish that there is a single independent being, the more plausible and weaker de dicto claim (some thing or another, perhaps a succession of various things, has always existed) can be assumed. See also Mary Shepherd’s assertion that Clarke (and Locke) “assumed that which was in question; namely, that every existence must have a cause” (Shepherd 1824, 36–37).

8. See especially Prop. 25 (W 4.150); Prop. 27 (W 4.151); and Prop. 34 (“The Son, whatever his metaphysical essence of substance be, and whatever divine greatness and dignity is ascribed to him in scripture; yet in this he is evidently subordinate to the Father, that he derives his being, attributes, and powers, from the Father, and the Father nothing from him”; 4.155). To the Father alone are ascribed “independence and supreme authority” (Proposition 27; 4.151). Every other attribute and power that can be ascribed to the Father can also be ascribed to the Son, “but the titles ascribed to the Son, must always carry along with them the idea of being communicated or derived” (4.153).

9. Although his Boyle lectures went through ten editions in thirty years, Dahm (1970, 176) finds only one translation during that time, into French.