Supplement to Rudolf Carnap

E. The Reconstruction of Scientific Theories

Throughout his career, the rational reconstruction of scientific theories constituted one of the cornerstones of Carnap’s work (see, e.g., Demopoulos 2007, Andreas 2007, Lutz 2012a,b for surveys). For Carnap, this involved the reconstruction of the syntax and (later) semantics of a scientific language in a formal framework, the classification of scientific terms and sentences—as represented in the framework—according to categories of philosophical interest, and the reconstruction of a theory’s deductive structure and empirical justification with the help of the resources of the framework. Logic was to supply the methods by which traditional epistemology could be transformed into a “logic of science”. The hope was that logical reconstruction would not only clarify the structure, the foundations, and the applications of science itself, but also make the philosophical analysis and interpretation of science more transparent. This program became the starting point of a new philosophical subdiscipline which we now call “philosophy of science” (which is broader in scope now, of course, than it was in Carnap’s day):

The works of the Vienna Circle and related groups have as their object to investigate science either as a whole or in its individual branches: they analyse the concepts, sentences, proofs, and theories that appear in different scientific fields, and they do this not so much from the point of view of the historical development of science as from the logical point of view. This field of work, for which there exists as yet no commonly recognized general term, may perhaps be called the theory of science and more precisely the logic of science. By “science” is to be understood here the totality of accepted sentences; and this includes not only the assertions of the scientists but also those of everyday life; for there is no sharp boundary between these two fields. (Carnap 1934, “The Task of the Logic of Science”)

In what follows, we do not attempt an exhaustive survey of Carnap’s entire contribution to this subject, but touch first on some general issues that have clouded the perception (and reception) of Carnap’s ideas, particularly Quine’s critique of Carnap’s supposed “reductionism” in the period after the Aufbau, and the critique by Quine and many others of Carnap’s “verificationism” or the “verification theory of meaning”. Then we turn to Carnap’s later work on the reconstruction of scientific theories, as exemplified in “The Methodological Character of Theoretical Concepts” (1956a), “Beobachtungssprache und theoretische Sprache” (1958, “Observation Language and Theoretical Language”), “Theoretical Concepts in Science” (1959a), some of Carnap’s remarks in his Schilpp volume (Carnap 1963a,b), and his Philosophical Foundations of Physics (1966), among other texts. After a section reviewing the critiques of this account, we address its structuralist tendency, especially in the light of current discussions of “structural realism”.

1. Quine’s Critique of Carnap’s Reductionism and the Verification Theory of Meaning

Quine (1951) thought the “second dogma of empiricism”, reductionism, at odds with the holism about confirmation he embraced in his own work. Quine regards Carnap’s “reductionism” to come in two versions, a radical one and a less radical one, the former of which he associates with the Aufbau (compare the supplement on Aufbau):

Radical reductionism… sets itself the task of specifying a sense-datum language and showing how to translate the rest of significant discourse, statement by statement, into it. Carnap embarked on this project in the Aufbau. (Quine 1951: 36)

Indeed, Carnap holds explicitly in the Aufbau that there are necessary and sufficient “recognizable indicators” for all scientific states of affairs (§49). Because the formulas of his phenomenalist constitution system supposedly express these indicators, Carnap takes each scientific statement to be translatable into the language of the system without affecting its extension, that is, truth value. Since, ultimately, all of these formulas quantify over (sets of sets of…) elementary experiences without including any primitive descriptive term other than “Er”, all indicators may be viewed as constraints just on elementary experiences and Er. Finally, in one passage of the Aufbau (§180), Carnap maintains that,

(I1)
since the experiencing and memorizing subject can, at least in principle, determine whether an elementary experience stands in the Er relation to another one, and
(I2)
since there are only finitely many elementary experiences (as Carnap assumes), the subject is, in principle, in a position to determine the truth value of any scientific statement. In other words: there is no scientific question that does not have an answer.

Obviously, few philosophers today would go along with this conclusion (any more than Carnap himself would later go along with it, after the Aufbau): even if (I1) and (I2) were granted, the general existence claim concerning recognizable indicators would be rejected, and it would be denied that the translation from the language(s) of science into that of Carnap’s phenomenalist constitution system would always preserve truth value (as Carnap himself denies this in 1936 in §15 of Testability and Meaning). (Leitgeb 2011 argues, however, that Carnap’s intended translation mapping in the Aufbau might still preserve empirical content.) So Quine does put his finger on a weak point of Carnap’s Aufbau; radical reductionism fails. For Quine’s (1951) closely related criticism of Carnap’s attempt at defining three-dimensional space from the two-dimensional visual field in the Aufbau, see the supplement on Aufbau (Section 4).

While Quine acknowledges that Carnap no longer upheld “radical reductionism” after the Aufbau (and even there had perhaps not done so as far as the physicalist constitution systems of the Aufbau are concerned), he also thinks that Carnap’s later work is still committed to a less radical variant of reductionism:

Reductionism in its radical form has long since ceased to figure in Carnap’s philosophy. But the dogma of reductionism has, in a subtler and more tenuous form, continued to influence the thought of empiricists. The notion lingers that to each statement, or each synthetic statement, there is associated a unique range of possible sensory events such that the occurrence of any of them would add to the likelihood of truth of the statement, and that there is associated also another unique range of possible sensory events whose occurrence would detract from that likelihood. This notion is of course implicit in the verification theory of meaning.

The dogma of reductionism survives in the supposition that each statement, taken in isolation from its fellows, can admit of confirmation or infirmation at all. My countersuggestion, issuing essentially from Carnap’s doctrine of the physical world in the Aufbau, is that our statements about the external world face the tribunal of sense experience not individually but only as a corporate body. (Quine 1951: 38)

The unit of empirical significance is the whole of science. (Quine 1951: 39)

Quine here attributes to Carnap (but is vague on the details) a less radical form of reductionism that, he thinks, is “implicit” in the “verification theory of meaning” held by some parts of the Vienna Circle during certain periods. About this supposed post-Aufbau non-radical reductionism, Quine makes two further claims: first, (Q1) Quine claims that the confirmation of scientific statements is holistic (confirmation holism); it is not possible to confirm or disconfirm a statement independently of the body of statements to which the statement belongs and/or which is presupposed when the statement is tested empirically. That body of statements might be a scientific theory or indeed all of science taken together. Secondly, (Q2) Quine claims that (Q1) rules out the post-Aufbau non-radical reductionism he attributes to Carnap.

Of course, (Q1) is in itself controversial, especially when confirmational holism is considered to be so global that each instance of confirmation or disconfirmation of any scientific statement whatsoever would have to depend on all of our presently accepted theories in all scientific areas in all disciplines. (See, e.g., Maddy 2007 and Wilson 2006 for strong arguments from the practice of science that speak against any such global holism about confirmation.) But here we will be interested less in (Q1) and (Q2) than in the question they presuppose: did Carnap even hold a reductionist view that contradicts confirmational holism—did he, in fact, even hold a “verification theory of meaning” in which such a reductionist view is implicit?

Shortly after the Aufbau, influenced both by his discussions with Neurath in the so-called protocol-sentence-debate (see Uebel 2007) and his engagement with Popper’s philosophy of science (Carus 2007a: Ch. 10), Carnap had come to prefer reconstructions of science in physicalist languages, which he took to be a better match with the intersubjective character of scientific claims and testing procedures than the phenomenalist constitution system that he had prioritized in the Aufbau.

Accordingly, in the Logical Syntax, Carnap takes physical law hypotheses to be tested against protocol sentences “by means of which the results of observation are expressed” and which may be reconstructed within the same physicalist language in which the law hypotheses themselves are reconstructed. (Though Carnap 1932e also leaves room for tolerance about the reconstruction of protocol sentences: compare the supplement on Tolerance, Metaphysics, and Meta-Ontology.) The protocol sentences accepted by scientists at a time are not taken as unrevisable data, but “are always being re-examined with the help of the ever-emerging new protocol-sentences” (LSS: §82). The theoretical terms that are included in scientific hypotheses are no longer necessarily reconstructed by chains of definitions but may be merely partially constrained through their occurrences in physical axioms (§82). The resulting rational reconstruction in the Logical Syntax of how scientific theories are tested and justified is a variant of hypothetico-deductivism in which

A sentence of physics… will be tested by deducing consequences on the basis of the transformation rules [that is, rules of inference ] of the language.

When a prediction that is logically derivable in a theory is falsified by an observation,

some change must be made in the system. For instance, the P-rules [physical rules] can be altered in such a way that those particular primitive sentences [physical axioms] are no longer valid; or the protocol sentence can be taken as being non-valid; or again the L-rules [logical rules] which have been used in the deduction can also be changed… There is in the strict sense no refutation (falsification) of an hypothesis; for even when it proves to be L-incompatible with certain protocol sentences, there always exists the possibility of maintaining the hypothesis and renouncing acknowledgment of the protocol-sentences. Still less is there in the strict sense a complete confirmation (verification) of an hypothesis… (LSS: §82)

When an observation speaks against a theory, in other words, there are always multiple different rational responses available, including revising one’s physical hypotheses, changing one’s logical system, or rejecting the validity of the observation result. What is more, the testing of scientific hypotheses is itself a holistic procedure:

Further, it is, in general, impossible to test even a single hypothetical sentence. In the case of a single sentence of this kind, there are in general no suitable L-consequences of the form of protocol-sentences; hence for the deduction of sentences having the form of protocol-sentences the remaining hypotheses must also be used. Thus the test applies, at bottom, not to a single hypothesis but to the whole system of physics as a system of hypothesis (Duhem, Poincaré) (LSS: §82)

This is the same confirmational holism that Quine himself adheres to in his later work (with Carnap’s “protocol sentences” now called “observation sentences”). If Carnap holds any “reductionist view” in the Logical Syntax at all, he certainly does not think of it as ruling out confirmational holism (cf. Friedman 2006).

More generally, there is every reason to believe that, throughout his life, Carnap regarded the confirmation and disconfirmation of scientific hypotheses to be theory-relative: e.g., Testability and Meaning (about which more below) defines confirmation deductively relative to bodies of so-called reduction sentences that may themselves have empirical content (pp. 443–445) and be discovered empirically (pp. 454f). While Carnap’s later work on probabilistic confirmation was confined, for simplicity, to languages without theoretical terms, Carnap did assume his probability measures to assign the maximal probability of 1 to all those statements of a language that were taken to be analytic (see, e.g., Carnap 1952b: Section 4, Carnap 1971a, and the supplement on Inductive Logic), and in his mature (non-probabilistic) work on theory reconstruction, he regarded the question which statements in a reconstruction of a scientific theory ought to be regarded as analytic as depending on the theory as a whole (see section 4 on theoretical terms below). (In a similar way, modern Bayesian confirmation theory relativizes subjective probability measures to corpora of background information.)

From at latest 1934 (the publication date of the Logical Syntax, and probably earlier than that), in short, Carnap rejected Quine’s “reductionism in its radical form”, and it is very hard to read even Quine’s non-radical version of the reductionist dogma of empiricism into either the Logical Syntax or Carnap’s later work, since Carnap does not claim empirical statements to be confirmable in isolation from other statements in a theory or framework.

Did Carnap ever adhere to a (or “the”) verification theory of meaning? In the Aufbau, Carnap does not put forward any general verificationist thesis about meaning at all: in fact, apart from his extensionalism (see supplement on Semantics (Section 2)), Carnap’s views about meaning at that time were close to those of Frege, and in some parts of the Aufbau he seems to defend a truth-conditional account of meaning (e.g., §161), even though he does not distinguish sufficiently clearly between truth conditions and verification conditions. (In his discussion of the phenomenalist constitution system of the Aufbau, however, Carnap does get close to a verificationism about meaning—see the beginning of this section.)

The Logical Syntax tries to steer clear of questions of meaning altogether or transforms them into syntactical questions (see the supplement on Logical Syntax of Language), and before long Carnap would take his semantic turn and regard the meaning or intension of a sentence as given by its truth conditions (see the supplement on Semantics (Section 1)). In “Wahrheit und Bewährung” (1936) Carnap says,

The question of the definition of truth must be clearly distinguished from the question of a criterion of confirmation, (1936 [1949: 126], the translation is a a modification of the original)

and neither his semantic works (such as Introduction of Semantics, 1942, or Meaning and Necessity, 1947) nor any of his later works on inductive logic mention the verification theory of meaning at all.

While Carnap does deal with criteria of empirical significance for theoretical terms and sentences (most importantly in Carnap 1956a—see Lutz 2012c, 2017 for an overview and assessment), these criteria were not so much meant as theories of meaning but were rather supposed to give some guidance on which primitive terms and syntactic formation rules one ought to use in the (re-)construction of scientific languages. At the same time, the resulting criteria were also supposed to help demarcate science from metaphysics; to which we turn in the supplement on Tolerance, Metaphysics, and Meta-Ontology (Section 2). (Moreover, these criteria of empirical significance were relativized to theories and, in this sense, “holistic” again.)

The only work which may indeed serve as an obvious target of Quine’s allusion to the verification theory of meaning is Testability and Meaning (Carnap 1936–37 [TM1 or TM2]), which presents a version of the “verificationist theory of meaning” in its very first paragraph:

the meaning of a sentence is in a certain sense identical with the way we determine its truth or falsehood; and a sentence has meaning only if such a determination is possible. (TM1: 420)

However, even that apparent endorsement of the verification theory is subject to two important qualifications (which might explain Carnap’s own “in a certain sense” qualification in this quotation). First, as suggested in the above quotations from the Logical Syntax, the term “determine” here should not be understood as verification proper:

If by verification is meant a definitive and final establishment of truth, then no (synthetic) sentence is ever verifiable… We can only confirm a sentence more and more; (TM1: 420)

complete verification is not even possible for observation sentences (TM1: 426, with a reference to Popper). So, verifiability as a criterion for (synthetic) sentences had already been replaced by confirmability. Although the Carnap of Testability and Meaning does not as yet have an opinion on “whether the concept of degree of confirmation can be defined satisfactorily as a quantitative concept” (TM1: 427), this line of reasoning would ultimately lead to the probabilistic work on numerical confirmation measures (see supplements on Methodology (Section 1), and Inductive Logic), and which culminated in the modern Bayesian treatment of confirmation.

Secondly, and more importantly, Testability and Meaning does not defend the traditional verifiability requirement for meaningful sentences that Carnap (TM1: 422) attributes to Wittgenstein, to earlier publications of the Vienna Circle, and to views “still held by the more conservative wing of this Circle” (that is, Schlick and Waismann, not including Carnap). Instead, Carnap himself transforms the verifiability requirement into a proposal about what languages one ought to speak in science, and how one should rationally reconstruct these languages. While Carnap acknowledges the availability of “non-empiricist languages”, in line with his principle of tolerance (see the supplement on Tolerance, Metaphysics, and Meta-Ontology (Section 1)), he also recommends that we use languages in which synthetic statements are considered grammatically well-formed only when they —“in principle”, indirectly, and relative to theories—can be confirmed or disconfirmed empirically. (In the probabilistic terms of his later work, the proposal amounts to something like this: construct and use languages, probabilistic confirmation measures, and explications of syntheticity, such that for every synthetic statement in any such language there is an observation sentence in the language that confirms or disconfirms the statement relative to at least one of the confirmation measures.) Hence, Carnap’s “verificationism” in Testability and Meaning is not a claim at all, but rather a proposal for how languages ought to be constructed or reconstructed in order to be scientifically fruitful.

Indeed, the whole second part of Testability and Meaning is devoted to the construction of a sequence of less and less restrictive “empiricist” languages corresponding to ever more complex fragments in the recursion-theoretic hierarchy of languages (differing in the number of nested alternating universal and existential quantifiers). This is combined, first, with the proposal to use one of these languages for the rational reconstruction of empirical science, and, secondly, with a reconstruction of the methods by which the sentences of these languages could be confirmed or disconfirmed empirically. The language that Carnap favors in the end is a full first-order or even higher-order physicalist language, the first-order part of which would have been perfectly acceptable even for Quine. While it is highly questionable whether Carnap thereby succeeded to

exclude all sentences of a non-empirical nature, e.g., those of transcendental metaphysics inasmuch they are not confirmable, not even incompletely, (TM2: 35)

as he had hoped originally in Testability and Meaning, the resulting “confirmability proposal” for the design of scientific languages (TM2: 34) in the second part of Testability and Meaning does not seem affected by any of Quine’s criticisms of “non-radical reductionism”. And even Quine would have subscribed to what Carnap calls “the objective of scientific empiricism” in the final paragraph of Testability and Meaning, that is, “the development of an increasingly scientific philosophy” (TM2: 38).

So in contrast to his criticism of the radical reductionism of Carnap’s Aufbau—which is actually valid—Quine’s criticism in “Two Dogmas” of the supposed non-radical reductionism of Carnap’s later work misses its target.

2. Disposition Terms in Testability and Meaning

In §7 of Testability and Meaning, Carnap calls attention to another important class of concepts for which the sole officially intended method of concept formation in the Aufbau, that is, definition, turns out to be too restrictive—disposition concepts, which cannot be straightforwardly defined on an observational basis:

Suppose, we wish to introduce the predicate ‘\(Q_3\)’ meaning “soluble in water”. Suppose further, that ‘\(Q_1\)’ and ‘\(Q_2\)’ are already defined in such a way that ‘\(Q_1\)(x, t)’ means “the body x is placed into water at the time t”, and ‘\(Q_2\)(x, t)’ means “the body x dissolves at the time t”. Then one might perhaps think that we could define ‘soluble in water’ in the following way: “x is soluble in water” is to mean “whenever x is put into water, x dissolves”, in symbols:

\[\tag{D} Q_3(x) \equiv (t)[Q_1(x, t) \supset Q_2(x, t)]. \]

But this definition would not give the intended meaning of ‘\(Q_3\)’. (TM1: 440)

It is easy to see that (D) would not be adequate: e.g., in a case in which an object is never placed into water at all, the definiens on the right-hand side would be (vacuously) true, which would entail by (D) that the object would have to count as water-soluble even when it is, e.g., made of wood. So (D) is not acceptable.

In Testability and Meaning, Carnap does not consider the option of defining disposition terms by means of counterfactual conditionals that might replace the material conditional in (D), though in later work he does mention the possibility of defining disposition terms on the basis of “logical and causal modalities” (see Carnap 1956a: 64). Instead, he proposes to introduce ‘\(Q_3\)’ by the following sentence in which the three predicates, the material equivalence symbol ‘\(\equiv\)’, the material conditional ‘\(\supset\)’, and the universal quantifier ‘(t)’ change their relative positions (compared to (D)):

\[\tag{R} (x)(t)[Q_1(x, t) \supset (Q_3(x) \equiv Q_2(x, t))], \]

in words:

if any thing x is put into water at any time t, then, if x is soluble in water, x dissolves at the time t, and if x is not soluble in water, it does not. (TM1: 440f)

In contrast to (D), the new principle (R) seems perfectly acceptable; it merely says that, given certain test conditions, an object has a disposition just in case it exhibits a certain response—which is exactly what dispositions are all about.

(R) belongs to the class of sentences called “reduction sentences” by Carnap, which he defines in precise syntactic terms in the first part of Testability and Meaning. Since explicit definitions, such as (D), constitute a special type of reduction sentences, the suggestion that scientific terms (in a reconstruction of a scientific theory) are introduced by reduction sentences—which are counted as axioms in the corresponding framework—liberalizes the method of concept formation that Carnap had advocated in the Aufbau. As Carnap says, “previously reducibility was not distinguished from definability” (TM1: 466), but he now considers this a mistake, since reducibility is strictly more general than definability and does not have the same general methodological features. In contrast to definitions, such as (D) above, a reduction sentence such as (R) does not afford the general eliminability of “\(Q_3\)” in favor of “\(Q_1\)” and “\(Q_2\)” in every syntactic context. Moreover, while (D) is conservative over any background theory that does not as yet include “\(Q_3\)”, (R) has proper factual content; it entails logically that if \(Q_1(x, t)\) and \(Q_2(x, t)\) are the case (and hence, with (R), also \(Q_3(x)\)), then \(Q_1(x, t') \supset Q_2(x, t')\) must be true as well, for arbitrary \(t'\). Or in Carnapian symbols: (R) above logically entails

\[ (x)(t)[(Q_1(x, t) \amp Q_2(x, t)) \supset (Q_1(x, t') \supset Q_2(x, t'))], \]

which does not include “\(Q_3\)” syntactically, but which is derivable once (R) is added to a theory even when the theory had not included that consequence beforehand. Thus, reduction sentences such as (R) neither satisfy the eliminability property nor the non-creativity property of explicit definitions (see Essler 1975 for more on this).

Carnap accepts these features of (certain) reduction sentences as similar in kind to the introduction of a theoretical term T by scientific laws (p. 443), which in general does not afford the translation of sentences containing T into sentences containing only “previous” terms, particularly observational terms, either. (Though translatability might perhaps be gained by introducing theoretical terms by means of indefinite or definite descriptions with higher-order quantifiers, as explained in section 4 below). Furthermore—and again similarly to theoretical terms in science—terms introduced by reduction sentences are indeterminate and open-ended, since arbitrarily many reduction sentences for one and the same term T may be added to one’s theory in the course of empirical investigations (e.g., when new testing or measurement procedures are discovered; see pp. 444–446). In this way, the meaning of T may be continually sharpened and its applicability extended. For these reasons, the rational reconstruction of scientific concept formation by means of reduction sentences in Testability and Meaning not only satisfies the exactness requirement for explications but also goes some way towards satisfying the similarity requirement (see supplement on Methodology (Section 1)). (Schurz 2009 is a recent example of philosophical work in which Carnapian reduction sentences are fruitfully applied as rational reconstructions of empirical indication or measurement laws for theoretical terms in science.)

In spite of these attractions, Carnap kept improving his logical reconstruction of scientific terms. In his later work, disposition terms are no longer treated as similar to theoretical terms, as in Testability and Meaning, but occupy an intermediate position between observational terms and theoretical terms proper; see below, sections 3 and 4.

3. Observation Terms and Sentences in Carnap’s Later Work on the Reconstruction of Scientific Theories

It is well known that Carnap distinguished between observational terms (or “elementary” terms in Carnap 1939) and non-observational terms in his reconstruction of scientific concepts. When V is the non-logical vocabulary of a formal language L that results from reconstructing (some fragment of) a scientific language, Carnap assumes that V can be partitioned into, on the one hand, the subset \(V_O\) of all observational terms in V, and on the other hand, V without \(V_O\), that is, the set of non-observational terms. In a first approximation, the members of \(V_O\) are meant to express in an ostensive and direct manner some observable or measurable properties/relations that apply to observable or measurable objects or events; for instance, terms such as “blue”, “hot”, “large”, “is warmer than”, “is (spatially) contiguous to” (see Carnap 1956a: 41), “Zürich”, “heavier-than” (Carnap 1958: 237). (Measurement itself is rational reconstructed in measurement theory, to which Carnap himself contributed in his “Physikalische Begriffsbildung” as early as 1926, by spelling out in precise axiomatic terms necessary and/or sufficient conditions for the measurability of concepts as determined by their scales; see also Carnap 1966, Chapters 5–9.)

In line with his principle of tolerance (see the supplement on Tolerance, Metaphysics, and Meta-Ontology), Carnap does not think that there is a uniquely determined “correct” or “natural” set of observation terms: as he had already put it in Testability and Meaning (in §16 on “Sufficient Bases”), “there can be several and even mutually exclusive bases” for confirmation by observation. On page 470 of Testability and Meaning, he even imagines a person who can only distinguish bright from non-bright and claims that the corresponding predicate “bright” and its negation would suffice as a basis for confirmation—all other observable or measurable differences could be “coded up” technologically and linguistically in these terms.

Moreover, Carnap regards “observable” as a vague term of ordinary language that requires a decision about where to draw the exact boundary between it and its negation “non-observable” (TM1: 454–457). Carnap’s mature position goes on to regard the observable-vs-non-observable dichotomy as spanning a continuum that may be made precise in different ways for different purposes:

There is no question here of who is using the term “observable” in a right or proper way. There is a continuum which starts with direct sensory observations and proceeds to enormously complex, indirect methods of observation. Obviously, no sharp line can be drawn across this continuum; it is a matter of degree… the physicist speaks of observables in a very wide sense compared with the narrow sense of the philosopher, but, in both cases, the line separating observable from nonobservable is highly arbitrary. (Carnap 1966: 226)

For instance, to philosophers, “observable” might apply to terms such as “blue”, “hard”, or “hot”, while to physicists it could apply to any term for “any quantitative magnitude that can be measured in a relatively simple, direct way”, such as a temperature of 80 degrees centigrade, or a weight of 93.5 pounds (Carnap 1966: 225)—where what is “simple” or “direct” is of course technology-relative. Accordingly, Carnap regards the distinction between observable and unobservable entities to be relative to the relevant methods of observation or measurement:

Unobservable entities have a habit of passing over into the observable realm as more powerful instruments of observation are developed. At one time, “virus” was a theoretical term. The same is true of “molecule”. Ernst Mach was so opposed to thinking of a molecule as an existing “thing” that he once called it a “valueless image”. Today, even atoms in a crystal lattice can be photographed by bombarding them with elementary particles; in a sense, the atom itself has become an observable (Carnap 1966: 255f).

But in Carnap’s view this does not undermine the desirability or usefulness of the distinction itself, either in science itself or in the effort to understand science (e.g., in philosophy of science).

Once it has been decided which of the terms in a linguistic framework are to be regarded as members of \(V_O\) (for certain purposes and relative to a certain set of methods of observation or measurement), these terms are simply taken as “given” for the purposes of that reconstruction (perhaps to be reconsidered later). In that respect, the observation terms in \(V_O\), which Carnap (1966) sometimes speaks of as “O-terms”, have a similar status as David Lewis’s “O-terms” in his influential “How to Define Theoretical Terms” (Lewis 1970), which builds directly on Carnap’s work, and to which we return briefly in the following sections. This said, where Lewis characterizes O-terms as “old” terms that have been understood already (maybe only partially and at previous stages of theoretical inquiry), Carnap assumes the meaning of observational terms to be determined completely by relatively simple methods of ostension or measurement (where “simple” allows for simple enough involvements of theory so long as the meaning of observational terms is not left only partially determined).

With the distinction between observational and non-observational terms in place, Carnap determines a corresponding set of observational sentences; this set constitutes a purely observational language \(L_O\) whose members serve as rational reconstructions of observation or measurement reports. The intended domain or universe of discourse of the language \(L_O\), a sublanguage of the full language L, is a set of observable objects or events about which the sentences in \(L_O\) make statements. Even with \(V_O\) being fixed, \(L_O\) may be determined in different ways depending on how much logical complexity is considered permissible for an observation or measurement report. The truth value of a non-trivial universally quantified statement ascribing observable properties to all observable events at all places and times, for instance, cannot always be determined by mere observation or measurement in view of the unrestricted universal quantifiers involved. So one might not want to count such a sentence as an observation sentence. And as with \(V_O\) (see above), there is no uniquely determined “correct” way of defining \(L_O\) either; indeed, e.g., Section II of “The Methodological Character of Theoretical Concepts” (1956a) merely enumerates various possible requirements of different kinds and strengths that might be imposed on \(L_O\). (This corresponds to the plurality of “empiricist languages” in Testability and Meaning that was discussed in section 1 above.) Once \(L_O\) has been defined in exact terms, e.g., a notion of analyticity for observation sentences can be defined: Carnap (1966: Chapter 27) suggests doing so, first, by stating metalinguistic designation rules, which, at least in principle, specify the meaning of all observational terms completely. Such as:

The term “animal” designates the conjunction of the properties (1),…, (5). The term “bird” designates the conjunction of the properties (1),…, (5), (6),…. (Carnap 1966: 261)

Carnaps adds that, for many purposes of reconstruction, it would not be necessary to list these designation rules in complete detail—rather it would be sufficient to specify a list of salient object-linguistic A-postulates (meaning postulates) that are merely supposed to constrain the interpretation of the observation terms in \(V_O\), and whose truth follows logically from the designation rules. Such as: All birds are animals. (Since everything that has properties (1),…, (5), (6),… must have properties (1),…, (5), by logical consequence.) Finally, an observation sentence in \(L_O\) may be defined as analytic just in case its truth is logically entailed by the designation rules, or, for many purposes, just in case the sentence itself is logically entailed by the set of A-postulates of the underlying linguistic framework.

4. Theoretical Terms and Sentences, and the Logical Structure of Theories

While Carnap takes observation terms to be fully interpreted (as mentioned above; see also, e.g., Section 4 of Carnap 1958)—they have determinate extensions and intensions, based on meanings that are understood more or less in the same manner throughout the relevant scientific community—he regards the extensions and intensions of typical non-observational terms to be only partially determined (“incomplete”, “open-ended”). (In what follows, we will almost exclusively focus on the extension of scientific terms. For more on Carnap’s general views of intensions and intensional semantics, see the supplement on Semantics (Section 1).)

The interpretation of disposition terms (e.g., “water-soluble”) is based on open-ended methods of operationalization, and theoretical terms (e.g., “force”, “field”, “particles”, see Carnap 1958: 242, or “electric potential”, “wave function”, see Carnap 1939: 62) are interpreted through theoretical postulates that may not determine extensions or intensions uniquely. As far as theoretical terms (or “abstract terms” in Carnap 1939) are concerned, Carnap builds on David Hilbert’s idea of treating both mathematical terms and theoretical terms in physics as “defined implicitly” (in a loose sense of the term, not in the precise model-theoretic sense of Beth’s 1953 definability theorem) by theories considered as axiom systems (see Chapter 4 of Ben-Menahem 2006 for a summary). As Carnap (1939: 69) puts it,

It is true that a theory must not be a ‘mere calculus’ but possess an interpretation, on the basis of which it can be applied to facts of nature. But it is sufficient… to make this interpretation explicit for elementary [observational] terms; the interpretation of the other terms is then indirectly determined by the formulas of the calculus, either definitions or laws, connecting them with the elementary [observational] terms.

(Compare also Carnap 1958: 241.)

In section 2 above we sketched Carnap’s reconstruction of disposition terms in Testability and Meaning, where so-called reduction sentences served as reconstructions of particularly salient types of operationalizations. This treatment of disposition terms carries over to his later work, except that Carnap now distinguishes more sharply between dispositional and theoretical terms. That is because the presence of a disposition (e.g., water-solubility) may at least be disconfirmed directly in a case in which its stimulus or test condition is satisfied (e.g., an object is put into water) but when the corresponding response condition is not satisfied (the object does not dissolve). On the other hand, typical theoretical terms in science do not allow for similarly simple assignments of stimulus and response conditions and therefore their application to objects does not allow for similarly simple methods of disconfirmation (see, e.g., Carnap 1956, Sections IX and X). That is why in “The Methodological Character of Theoretical Concepts” Carnap prefers treating dispositional terms as belonging to an extended observation language \(L'_O\) that neither coincides with \(L_O\) nor with the full language L; dispositional terms are no longer regarded as theoretical terms proper. In the following, we will concentrate solely on Carnap’s mature treatment of theoretical terms, which are the non-logical members of V that are not members of \(V_O\) and not disposition terms either; let \(V_T\) be the set of such theoretical terms in V. (Once again, Carnap regards “observational” and “theoretical” as useful but vague terms:

no sharp boundary separates the O-terms from the T-terms. The choice of an exact dividing line is somewhat arbitrary. From a practical point of view, however, the distinction is usually evident, Carnap 1966: 258.)

(For a general survey on theoretical terms in science from the contemporary point of view, see the entry on theoretical terms in science.)

We start with the reconstruction of theoretical terms and scientific theories in “The Methodological Character of Theoretical Concepts” (1956a). Here Carnap complements the observational sublanguage \(L_O\) by a purely theoretical counterpart, \(L_T\), which is a sublanguage of L built solely from logical and theoretical terms. The intended domain or universe of discourse of \(L_T\) consists of purely mathematical constructions (sets, sequences) based upon a given denumerable set of mathematical objects; if that set of objects is the set of integers, the domain would include the integers themselves, real numbers (as certain equivalence classes of countably infinite sequences of integers), tuples of real numbers, sets of tuples of real numbers, sets of such sets, and so on—all mathematical objects included in the hierarchy of integers, sets of integers, sets of sets of integers, and so forth, described by simple type theory (which Carnap had also used in his earlier work; see the supplement on Aufbau, and also Carnap 1958: 237). Physical, psychological, and social entities are taken to be representable mathematically in that domain (e.g., through the spacetime points they occupy which, in turn, may be represented as tuples of real numbers). A scientific theory itself is reconstructed as a finite set of postulates in \(L_T\) (e.g., logical reconstructions of some fundamental laws of theoretical physics), or, equivalently, as the finite conjunction of such postulates; call that conjunction: Th.

The final step of reconstruction consists in the introduction of so-called correspondence rules which logically relate observation terms and theoretical terms. (They are Carnap’s improved version of Bridgman’s (1927) well-known “operational rules”.) Correspondence rules are formulated by means of expressions in the full language L that includes both observational terms and theoretical terms; so Carnap does not count correspondence rules amongst the properly theoretical postulates of a scientific theory, that is, as belonging to Th. Correspondence rules may be formulated either as rules of inference or as statements (correspondence postulates, see 1956a: 47). A correspondence postulate might, for instance, relate the observational term “heavier than” with the theoretical term “mass” by means of the expression

if (observable) physical body u is heavier than (observable) physical body v, then the mass of the physical object at the coordinate region \(u*\) corresponding to u is greater than the mass of the physical object at the coordinate region \(v*\) corresponding to v.

Carnap also allows correspondence rules to involve assignments of statistical probability, as in the sentence,

if a region has a certain state characterized by theoretical terms so-and-so, then there is a probability of 0.8 that an event characterized by observable terms so-and-so occurs. (see 1956a: 49)

Without such correspondence rules, Th would merely be an uninterpreted calculus, but with them, theoretical terms receive a partial and indirect “epistemic” interpretation: they enable Th to be tested empirically by checking the observational predictions that can be derived jointly from Th and the correspondence rules. This includes cases in which one derives from Th and the correspondence rules the sentence stating that a certain type of observable event will occur with a certain statistical probability, which may be confirmed or disconfirmed inductively based on the observed frequencies of that event type. (Carnap 1956a regards probabilistic correspondence rules to be especially important in psychology, as he explains in Section XI which deals exclusively with the reconstruction of psychological concepts.)

In very special and atypical cases, such correspondence rules may coincide with explicit definitions or reduction sentences (as in section 2 above), but usually the logical form of correspondence rules is different; in particular, normally, theoretical terms cannot be reduced to observational ones by standard explicit definitions (see the supplement on Aufbau (Section 3) and section 2 above) or, more generally, by reduction sentences. (Below we will describe a proposal contained in Carnap’s mature theory reconstruction according to which theoretical terms can actually be defined: but with the help of non-standard definitions of predicates, that is, definitions by higher-order so-called epsilon terms.)

Now we turn to Carnap’s final treatment of theoretical terms and theory reconstruction in, first, Philosophical Foundations of Physics (1966; which is equivalent to that in “Observation Language and Theoretical Language”, Carnap 1958), and, secondly, in “Theoretical Concepts in Science” (1959a). The basic setting remains the same, especially the partitioning of terms into observational and theoretical ones. (For simplicity, we count dispositional terms as observational terms for now.) Empirical laws or generalizations (such as laws relating the pressure, volume, and temperature of gases) are taken to be reconstructable solely by means of logical and observational terms (so their reconstructions are members of \(L_O)\), they concern observables, they can be confirmed or disconfirmed directly by observations, and “they are used for explaining observed facts and for predicting future observable events” (1966: 227). On the other hand, pure theoretical laws (such as the kinetic theory of gases) are assumed to be reconstructable using only logical and theoretical terms (their reconstructions are members of \(L_T)\), and they concern “non-observables” (e.g., molecules), that is, entities that cannot be measured in “simple, direct ways” (1966: 227). Theoretical laws contribute to the explanation and prediction of empirical laws and may only be confirmed or disconfirmed indirectly by confirming or disconfirming the empirical laws they entail in the presence of correspondence rules (which are members of the full language L that includes logical, observation, and theoretical terms, such as, e.g., postulates relating the temperature of a gases with the mean kinetic energy of its molecules, or the pressure of a gas with the impact of molecules on the wall of a vessel; see 1966: 241). (Chapters 23–24 of Carnap 1966 include various further such examples.)

But there are also two important changes compared to “The Methodological Character of Theoretical Concepts”: a scientific theory Th as a whole is now reconstructed as the conjunction of correspondence postulates and theoretical postulates; and a distinction between the analytic and the synthetic content of Th is introduced (whereas analyticity had not played a role in “The Methodological Character of Theoretical Concepts”), to the effect that it is not single postulates which are classified as such but the theory as a whole is divided into an analytic and a synthetic part. (Carnap argues on 1966: 267f that it is unclear whether the analytic part of a theory could be determined by determining for each of its postulates whether it is analytic; e.g., if taken independently of correspondence postulates, theoretical laws are simply uninterpreted; but if taken together with all correspondence postulates, they may well entail synthetic sentences.)

Let the vocabulary in which a scientific theory is reconstructed consist of logical terms, observation terms, and theoretical terms again. Let \(\Th = \Th[T_1 ,\ldots ,T_n]\) be our theory reconstructed as a finitely long conjunction of postulates involving precisely n theoretical terms \(T_1 ,\ldots ,T_n\) which we take to be introduced using Th. Other than these theoretical terms, Th will normally contain various non-theoretical terms as well; so Th is formulated in the full language L. Intuitively, then, Th manages to do two things at once—to say what the world is like, and to determine the meaning of its theoretical terms \(T_1 ,\ldots ,T_n\). Carnap’s aim is to dissect and reconstruct these two roles of Th. Following an idea of F.P. Ramsey (1929), one may, first, replace each theoretical term \(T_i\) by a variable \(X_i\) of the same type, such that distinct theoretical terms are replaced by distinct variables that had not been used in Th before. Secondly, one adds existential quantifiers that bind these new variables. For example, if \(T_i\) is a predicate expressing a property of individuals (e.g., being a molecule), then \(X_i\) will be a predicate variable ranging over properties of individuals which is bound existentially by a second-order quantifier expression of the form \(\exists X_i\) (there is a property \(X_i\), such that…). None of the observational terms included in Th are affected by this. In this manner, given \(\Th (= \Th[T_1 ,\ldots ,T_n])\), one determines the so-called Ramsey sentence of Th, that is,

\[ R(\Th): \exists X_1,\ldots,X_n \Th[X_1 ,\ldots ,X_n] \]

which expresses that there are entities (e.g., properties or relations) \(X_1,\)…, \(X_n\) for which \(\Th[X_1 ,\ldots ,X_n]\) is the case. (The transition from Th to \(R(\Th)\) is often called the “Ramsification” of Th.) Clearly, \(R(\Th)\) does not involve any theoretical terms anymore, and it is easy to prove that an observation sentence (which does not include any theoretical terms) is logically derivable from \(R(\Th)\) just in case it is logically derivable from Th itself. In this sense, \(R(\Th)\) captures all of the consequences of Th that can be expressed without invoking theoretical terms; in particular, \(R(\Th)\) predicts deductively the same empirical laws as Th does. Since \(R(\Th)\) involves higher-order quantification, the logical derivability relation in question must be one of higher-order logic or, alternatively, derivability in first-order logic and set theory combined. (For more precise model-theoretic formulations of the properties of \(R(\Th)\), see van Benthem (1978, 1982, 2012), Ketland (2004, 2009), Dewar (2019).)

Carnap suggests that the synthetic content of Th is expressed by its Ramsey sentence \(R(\Th)\).

But that does not mean that Carnap was in the business of eliminating theoretical terms, as more traditionally minded, e.g., Machian empiricists might have advocated. (Nor does Carnap aim to eliminate “theoretical entities”; as Hempel 1958 pointed out, \(R(\Th)\) still claims the existence of entities \(X_1 ,\ldots ,X_n\), such that \(\Th[X_1,\ldots ,X_n],\) and Carnap was on board with that, of course.) Indeed, Carnap (1963a,b, 1966) acknowledges the scientific utility of theoretical terms (see Carnap 1966: 254 and 269) and proposes to identify a theory Th’s analytic content with what is expressed by (what is now called) the Carnap sentence of Th,

\[ C(\Th): R(\Th) \rightarrow \Th, \]

that is, the material conditional built from the theory’s Ramsey sentence and the theory itself (where Th involves \(T_1,\)…,\(T_n,\) as described). The idea behind the Carnap sentence is that if there are entities \(X_1,\)…, \(X_n\) for which \(\Th[X_1,\ldots, X_n]\) is the case, then one may just as well call “them” \(T_1,\)…,\(T_n,\) respectively. In Carnap’s words:

if the Ramsey sentence is true, we must understand the theoretical terms in such a way that the entire theory is true. (Carnap 1966: 270)

If “the” n-tuple of entities \(\langle X_1 ,\ldots ,X_n\rangle\) satisfying \(\Th[X_1 ,\ldots ,X_n]\) is not determined uniquely, this might require a “choice” concerning which is of the relevant n-tuples is meant to interpret the theoretical terms \(T_1 ,\ldots ,T_n\): but since Carnap supposes the only way of determining the meaning of \(T_1 ,\ldots ,T_n\) is by reference to Th, and since all of the relevant n-tuples realize \(\Th[X_1 ,\ldots ,X_n]\), it should not actually matter which n-tuple is “chosen” (or has been “chosen”). Moreover, in whatever way an n-tuple of entities \(\langle X_1 ,\ldots ,X_n\rangle\) satisfying \(\Th[X_1 ,\ldots ,X_n]\) is taken to interpret \(T_1 ,\ldots ,T_n\) (assuming there is such an n-tuple), the theory will turn out to be true under that interpretation, and hence the Carnap sentence as a whole will be true, its truth reflecting the fact that \(T_1 ,\ldots ,T_n\) have been assigned \(\langle X_1 ,\ldots ,X_n\rangle\), respectively—which is a semantic state of affairs, not an empirical one. That is why Carnap takes \(C(\Th)\) to be analytic (in the language of \(\Th)\): it is the single meaning postulate or “A-postulate” that determines the meaning of all theoretical terms of Th in one fell swoop. Accordingly, those scientific sentences in L are defined to be analytic which follow logically from \(C(\Th)\) (possibly augmented conjunctively by meaning postulates for observation terms; see section 3).

The following properties of \(\Th\), \(R(\Th)\), and \(C(\Th)\) are easy to derive:

(R1)
Th logically entails both \(R(\Th)\) and \(C(\Th)\); in that sense, \(R(\Th)\) and \(C(\Th)\) are both “parts” of Th.
(R2)
What is more, the conjunction of \(R(\Th)\) and \(C(\Th)\) is logically equivalent to T, so Th can in fact be recovered by joining its Ramsey sentence and its Carnap sentence.
(R3)
While \(R(\Th)\) logically entails the very same observation sentences as Th, the Carnap sentence \(C(\Th)\) can be shown not to entail any observations sentences other than logically true ones, as one would expect since \(C(\Th)\) is taken to express Th’s analytic content.

The upshot is: Th is decomposed into a theory part that corresponds to what the theory says about empirically observable phenomena (expressed by \(R(\Th)\)) and a theory part that fixes the meaning of theoretical terms. (Winnie 1970 shows that R1–R3 do not determine \(R(\Th)\) and \(C(\Th)\) uniquely, but uniqueness can be derived by adding a fourth “observational vacuity” condition concerning \(C(\Th)\); see also Demopoulos 2007.)

Schurz (2005) argues that Carnap’s reconstruction of Th by means of \(R(\Th)\) and \(C(\Th)\) solves several problems of scientific theory reconstruction, amongst them: to determine the meaning of theoretical terms \(T_1 ,\ldots ,T_n\) in a non-circular manner (which is non-trivial since the meaning of \(T_1 ,\ldots ,T_n\) and the meaning of Th seem to depend on each other) by interpreting \(T_1 ,\ldots ,T_n\) by any n-tuple \(\langle X_1 ,\ldots ,X_n\rangle\) that satisfies \(\Th[X_1 ,\ldots ,X_n]\) if there is such. And to avoid Kuhnian incommensurability between theories \(\Th_1\) and \(\Th_2\) that differ in their theoretical concepts, since, as long as their underlying observation languages are the same, their respective Ramsey sentences \(R(\Th_1)\) and \(R(\Th_2)\) will also belong to one and the same language (namely the observation language extended by higher-order quantifiers), and hence \(\Th_1\) and \(\Th_2\) will be mutually understandable and assessable by their Ramsey sentences being mutually understandable and assessable. On the other hand, Schurz (2005) also points out that \(C(\Th)\) does not define \(T_1 ,\ldots ,T_n\) in the sense of an explicit definition, nor does the distinction between \(R(\Th)\) and \(C(\Th)\) explain how the meaning of complex sentences involving \(T_1,\)…, \(T_n\) can be determined compositionally from the meaning of their syntactic components. (The lack of compositionality in Ramsification had previously been criticized by Glymour 1980.)

Carnap (1959a) may be understood as developing a response to the last two worries by suggesting theoretical terms to be definable with the help of higher-order indefinite descriptions. (He took his previous work to show that theoretical terms were not first-order definable from observation terms, as discussed in the supplement on Aufbau (Section 3) and section 2 above.) For simplicity, let us focus just on one theoretical term T introduced by \(\Th[T]\): the proposal is to regard T to be definable explicitly by

\[T = eX\Th[X]\]

where e is the so-called epsilon operator and \(eX\Th[X]\) is a so-called epsilon term. The epsilon operator had been introduced by David Hilbert in the context of arithmetical theories and was employed later by Bourbaki in foundational work in mathematics. In words: T is defined to be an X such that \(\Th[X].\) So e resembles the better known iota operator i that is used in definite descriptions, except that the definite “the” gets replaced by the indefinite “an”. Russell’s well-known paper (1905) had suggested the contextual elimination of definite descriptions in terms of quantified statements. Indefinite descriptions, that is, epsilon terms, do not necessarily need to be explained away contextually in favor of quantifiers; in fact, quantified expressions may in turn be regarded as abbreviations of expressions involving e: e.g., ‘\(\exists XA[Xk]\)’ may be considered as a metalinguistic abbreviation of \(A[eXA[X]].\) e itself may be understood as a primitive logical expression governed by new logical and semantic rules. On the logical side, the corresponding system is called the “epsilon calculus” in which—if applied to higher-order epsilon terms, such as \(eX\Th[X]\)—the sentence \(\exists X\Th[X] \rightarrow \Th[eX\Th[X]]\) is provable logically (see entry on theoretical terms in science for details). This means that the Carnap sentence \(C(\Th)\) results from replacing T by its definiens \(eX\Th[X]\) in the logical law \(\exists X\Th[X] \rightarrow \Th[eX\Th[X]]\); hence \(C(\Th)\) is a definitional truth. On the semantic side, the standard semantics for epsilon terms (see Leisenring 1969) interprets e by means of a choice function that maps each non-empty set of entities of the appropriate type to one of its members (e.g., a non-empty set of sets to one of its members). In this way, the intuitive gloss of a theoretical term T “choosing” an object X that satisfies \(\Th[X]\) (if there is such) receives a precise model-theoretic rendering. (Carnap 1961b also proposes a reconstruction of set theory with the help of epsilon terms in which, e.g., the set-theoretic axiom of choice becomes a logical principle.) The indeterminacy concerning the question which object X is chosen (if more than one X satisfies \(\Th[X]\)) shows up in the plurality of choice functions that are available model-theoretically and the arbitrariness which of them interprets the epsilon operator; indeed, one may think of “the” choice function that interprets epsilon terms to be left indeterminate. If \(eX\Th[X]\) is assigned a semantic value by a choice function, the semantic value of any complex expression \(A[eX\Th[X]]\) that includes \(eX\Th[X]\) can be determined compositionally in the usual manner, addressing the compositionality problem mentioned above. (See Andreas and Schiemer 2016 for a recent choice-theoretic reconstruction of theoretical truth in science that builds on Carnap’s account.)

Not much later, David Lewis (1970) proposed a similar treatment of theoretical terms, according to which theoretical terms are defined by means of definite descriptions. Lewis himself preferred first-order \(T = ix\ldots\) versions of such definitions and assumes (reifications of) second-order entities, such as properties and relations, to be members of the first-order universe of discourse. But the corresponding second-order version, which is closer to Carnap’s own approach, would look like this:

\[ T = iX \Th[X]. \]

Clearly, as Lewis (1970: 427) points out himself, his proposal is “in the spirit of Ramsey’s and Carnap’s” proposals, the only difference being that typical scientific theories are assumed to determine uniquely the meaning of the theoretical terms they introduce. (Lewis gave up on this general unique definability assumption in his later work.) As mentioned in the supplement on Aufbau (Section 2), the early Carnap had considered the same method of defining concepts by definite description in §§153–155 of his Aufbau, when he contemplated defining the basic predicate Er of his phenomenalist constitution system (see supplement on Aufbau (Section 2)) as the binary relation satisfying a particular condition that was stated in the language of the constitution system. (But Carnap, unlike Lewis, used a higher-order definite description.)

An application of Lewis’s method in philosophy is the so-called “Canberra plan”, which takes philosophy to proceed by conceptual analysis along the lines of Ramsey-Carnap-Lewis method, and was put forward by David Lewis, Frank Jackson (see Jackson 1998), and others. It clearly owes much to Carnap’s work on theoretical terms in science. Recently, Chalmers (2012) has developed a “close relative of the Canberra plan” (2012: 362) which even revives some aspects of Carnap’s methodology of the Aufbau (but which, unlike Canberra planners and the Aufbau, does not aim at the construction of a system of definitions). But there are also some important differences: Canberra planners use the Ramsey-Carnap-Lewis method for mere conceptual analysis (Jackson 1998), not for rational reconstruction (although the differences are fluid). Secondly, some Canberra planners invoke expressions such as “natural” or “fundamental” as primitive O-terms by which properties and relations can be qualified, which, for Carnap, would require rational reconstruction, and the reconstruction of which would be likely to be framework-relative; the same holds for nomic expressions such as “law” (in the metaphysical sense of the term), which Chalmers (2012) regards as primitive. Finally, both the Canberra planners and Chalmers take a priori justification and the corresponding notion of aprioricity to be of central importance in philosophy, and at least some of them (e.g., Chalmers) assume aprioricity to extend beyond analyticity or the purely conceptual; while for Carnap relativized notions of aprioricity in the sense of analyticity-in-a-framework are central (see supplement on Carnap versus Quine on the Analytic-Synthetic Distinction) and all synthetic a priori justification is rejected.

5. Criticism

Carnap’s rational reconstruction of scientific language and theories was enormously influential within 20th century philosophy of science and constitutes one pillar of what is sometimes referred to as the “received view” of scientific theories (together with the subsequent work of Hempel, Feigl, Nagel, and others). As such, it also attracted heavy criticism from various directions.

On the one hand, there is general criticism of logical empiricist philosophy of science to the effect that its logical methods were found to be overly restrictive, it was said to be focused too much on physics and mathematics, and that even in these two areas it had become increasingly removed from the actual practice of science (whereas its initial stages had been closely informed by state-of-the-art developments, such as relativity theory and set theory). While these general criticisms apply to Carnap’s philosophy of science, too, we will not discuss them here in further detail.

On the other hand, there is also criticism more specifically of Carnap’s philosophy of science, to some of which we now turn. (Other critical points we have discussed above (see section 1 and elsewhere; see supplement on Carnap versus Quine on the Analytic-Synthetic Distinction.)

First, the distinction between observational and theoretical terms came under attack (see, e.g., Putnam 1962, van Fraassen 1980), because all terms in a scientific theory might turn out to be theory-laden, and all of them may potentially apply both to observable and unobservable objects. Since Carnap does acknowledge the distinction to be vague and purpose-relative, as explained in sections 3 and 4, this seems like a minor point of criticism (so long as the decisions concerning the observational-theoretical distinction still turn out to pay off in theory reconstructions). Where necessary, Carnap might have taken Lewis’s later step from observational terms to “old terms” (recall section 4 above) or invoked the later Kripke-Putnam line on externalism about meaning to argue that the meaning of observational terms, which in any case are often simply terms from natural language, is referential and therefore depends on environmental and social factors but not so much on theories. All of that would have been compatible with Carnap’s main semantic point that observation terms may be reconstructed to be fully interpreted in a Tarskian fashion whereas the interpretation of theoretical terms after reconstruction is partial and open-ended.

A second, more pertinent criticism concerns Carnap’s presupposition that scientific theories can be reconstructed deductively in a formal language. The so-called structuralist or non-statement view of theories (as developed by authors such as Suppes, Suppe, Sneed, van Fraassen, Balzer, Moulines, and others; see entry on structuralism in physics for a survey) reconstructs theories instead as sets of mathematical structures or models. While Carnap had used model-theoretic methods in his early logical work in the 1920s even prior to his engagement with Gödel and Tarski (in particular, in his unpublished “Untersuchungen zur allgemeinen Axiomatik” from 1928, and in his logic textbook Abriß der Logistik from 1929, see Awodey & Carus 2001; Schiemer 2013; Schiemer et al. 2017), model theory only became prominent in Carnap’s work in his publications in semantics since the late 1930s (details in the supplement on Semantics). It took a while for Carnap’s model-theoretic reconstructions of language and logic to diffuse into his work in the philosophy of science, but there are clear indications that this is the path he would have followed, if his life had continued into the 1970s. In “The Methodological Character of Theoretical Concepts”, Carnap had already characterized observation terms and theoretical terms by describing their syntactic and semantic features (“the values of the variables must be…”, “no model contains more than…”, “the domain D of entities… includes a denumerable subdomain…”, see Carnap 1956a: 41 and p. 43). Similarly, in his work in inductive logic from the early 1960s, he no longer took probabilities of sentences as his starting point but rather probabilities of sets of models. As he says in his (posthumously published) Basic System of Inductive Logic. Part 1:

In our present system, we prefer to speak, not of signs of the language but instead of the corresponding entities, especially individuals and attributes. Therefore, we take as representatives of the possible cases with respect to a given language… models [Carnap’s emphasis], as is customary today in the (semantical) theory of logical language-systems and axiom systems. (Carnap 1971a: 54)

(See Sznajder 2016 for further discussion.) So we can safely hypothesize that Carnap would have gone along with central features of the non-statement view of scientific theories, except that he would have preferred to combine syntactic or proof-theoretic methods of theory reconstruction with model-theoretic ones, as is customary in logic. (The preferability of such combined accounts in the philosophy of science has recently been urged again by Lutz 2014 and Andreas 2013, 2014.)

Van Fraassen (1980: 54f) raised the additional worry that the sentences in the observational sublanguage \(L_O\) which follow logically from a theory Th do not capture precisely what Th says about observable objects; e.g., some of these sentences may claim the existence of unobservable entities lacking certain observable properties (“there exists something that is not blue and not hot and not hard and…”), even though they are members of \(L_O\) (no theoretical terms are involved). Since philosophy of science in general, and van Fraassen’s program of constructive empiricism in particular, require a notion of empirical adequacy, it would indeed cast doubt on the so-called syntactic view of theories if empirical adequacy, therefore, could not be reconstructed in syntactic terms.

From the viewpoint of Carnap’s mature reconstruction of scientific theories, however, there is a response (given informally by Friedman 2011) to this worry which can be made precise along the following lines (building on the formalization of Ketland 2004): Consider a formal language L to be given, including observation terms and theoretical terms, as described by Carnap. We fix the intended “actual” model so that the first-order domain of individuals includes a set of observable objects, so that observation terms apply solely to such observable objects, and so that all higher-order quantifiers range over all sets over the first-order domain that are of the appropriate set-theoretic type. In addition, the intended model may also contain unobservable objects, and it assigns interpretations to all theoretical terms. The theory Th, which is a finite conjunction of sentences in L, may be taken to correspond on the model-theoretic side to the class of models that satisfy Th. With these assumptions in place (which are not implausible from the model-theoretic viewpoint), one can show that the Ramsey sentence \(R(\Th)\) expresses in the object language (up to a cardinality constraint) what in model-theoretic terms is often meant when one calls a set of models, that is, a theory in the model-theoretic sense, empirically adequate: one of its models containing an “empirical” submodel (which comprises a subset of the domain and all interpretations of the members of the observational vocabulary on that domain) that is isomorphic to the submodel of the intended “actual” model that comprises the observable objects taken together with the observational properties and relations (which are again expressed by observation terms). See Theorem 6 of Ketland (2004) for a precise formal statement of this result. More briefly: \(R(\Th)\) is true in the intended model just in case the set of models corresponding to Th is empirically adequate (and also a certain cardinality constraint concerning non-observable objects is satisfied, which we will not explain in further detail here).

One should add that this model-theoretic notion of empirical adequacy is just a simplification of what van Fraassen (1980: Chapters 2–3) himself means by a set of models “saving the phenomena” or being empirically adequate. For van Fraassen considers multiple models determined by experiments and measurements on observable objects—each such model being an “appearance”—and calls a set of models empirically adequate just in case it includes a model M, such that every appearance is isomorphic to at least one empirical submodel of M (see Lutz 2012c: Section 4.2.1 for a precise statement). But the result for the simpler version of empirical adequacy should still be sufficient to show that at least one plausible model-theoretic account of the empirical adequacy of a theory can be expressed (up to a cardinality constraint) in terms of the truth of its Ramsey sentence. The deeper underlying point is that there is not much of a difference between a syntactic reconstruction of empirical content by means of a Ramsey sentence with a higher-order existential quantifier ( as in “there is a set D and a relation R on D, such that…”) and a model-theoretic existence statement (as in “there is a model with a domain D and a relation R on D, such that…”).

While this addresses van Fraassen’s worry, it points to yet another potential problem for Carnap’s account: if the Ramsey sentence of a theory Th expresses its empirical adequacy (up to the cardinality constraint), and if the Carnap sentence of Th is analytic in the language of Th (recall section 4, then where exactly has the “surplus content” gone by which, supposedly, the truth of Th exceeds its empirical adequacy and its conceptual presuppositions (assuming a realist semantics and metasemantics, that is, realist answers to the questions of what means what, and in virtue of what do these meaning relations hold)? We postpone a discussion of this point to section 6 below, where we address what might be called Carnap’s conceptual (or linguistic or semantic) structuralism.

A third type of criticism questions Carnap’s reconstruction of theories on inductive grounds. As Hempel demonstrates in “The Theoretician’s Dilemma” (Hempel 1958), theoretical principles in scientific theories do not just have the function of supporting deductive inferences but also allow for inductive systematizations: the assumption of certain theoretical principles may make certain observations likely, or more likely, given certain other observations—a feature of theoretical principles which may be exploited in inductive predictions and explanations. Hempel argues that typical empiricist reconstructions of theories do not manage to preserve these theories’ powers of inductive systematization and hence fail to capture some of their most important aspects.

This kind of argument was worked out in more detail later (Scheffler 1963, 1968; Niiniluoto 1972; Tuomela 1974; Raatikainen 2012), especially with respect to the Ramsification of scientific theories. For illustrative purposes, we follow a part of that literature in using Scheffler’s following simple example (though, as we will see below, the example actually turns out to be too simple): Consider two unary observation predicates \(O_1\) and \(O_2\), a unary theoretical predicate T, and an individual constant a. Here is a simple instance of a (toy) theory:

\[ \Th: \forall x((T(x) \rightarrow O_1 (x)) \land ((T(x) \rightarrow O_2 (x))) \]

Th says that all T-objects are \(O_1\)-objects and all T-objects are \(O_2\)-objects. The Ramsey sentence of Th is:

\[ R[\Th]: \exists X \forall x((X(x) \rightarrow O_1 (x)) \land ((X(x) \rightarrow O_2 (x))) \]

Similarly, let us also look at yet another simple theory and its Ramsey sentence:

\[ \Th': \forall x((T(x) \rightarrow O_1 (x)) \land ((T(x) \rightarrow \neg{O_2 (x)})) \]

\(\Th'\) expresses that all T-objects are \(O_1\)-objects, and all T-objects are not \(O_2\)-objects. Its Ramsey sentence is:

\[ R[\Th']: \exists X\forall x((X(x) \rightarrow O_1 (x)) \land ((X(x) \rightarrow \neg O_2 (x))) \]

It is plausible to believe that Th achieves inductive systematization between \(O_1 (a)\) and \(O_2 (a)\), in the sense that, on the assumption of Th, observing that \(O_1 (a)\) is the case should make it likely, or at least more likely, that \(O_2 (a)\) is the case. For analogous reasons, it is plausible that \(\Th'\) achieves inductive systematization between \(O_1 (a)\) and \neg \(O_2 (a)\). If Ramsification preserved inductive systematization, then \(R[\Th]\) would have to support the same patterns of inductive systematization as Th, and similarly for \(R[\Th']\) and \(\Th'\). But that does not seem to be the case, as \(R[\Th]\) and \(R[\Th']\) are both logically true in second-order logic (in every model the empty set X may serve as witness of a set that is a subset of the set of \(O_1\)-objects, the set of \(O_2\)-objects, and the set of \neg (\(O_2\))-objects). How could a logical truth achieve any kind of inductive systematization? Moreover: how should \(R[\Th]\) achieve inductive systematization between \(O_1 (a)\) and \(O_2 (a)\), and \(R[\Th']\) between \(O_1 (a)\) and \neg (\(O_2 (a)\), when \(R[\Th]\) and \(R[\Th']\) are logically equivalent (as follows from their logical truth)? Hence, Ramsification does not always seem to preserve inductive systematization, which is why, at least in certain cases, something seems to be lost in the step from a theory to its Ramsey sentence.

Carnap himself did not reply to this kind of objection in any detail (although, as he said in an interview from 1964, he regarded the topic of inductive probability for theoretical sentences as a promising future research topic). But since he agreed with Hempel’s original point without being worried by it, he clearly thought the criticism would not affect his own account. Here is how a reply on Carnap’s behalf might look. First, it would point out that Carnap’s aim was not to replace a theory by its Ramsey sentence; his aim was to reconstruct a theory, and to do so jointly by its Ramsey sentences and its Carnap sentence, without any intention of eliminating theoretical terms. If we combine Carnap’s mature reconstruction of theories with his probabilistic reconstruction of confirmation (see the supplement on Inductive Logic), a task Carnap himself did not undertake, one would end up with a picture like this: consider a (logical or subjective) probability measure P defined on a language that includes both the language of a theory Th and higher-order quantifiers, such that P represents the ideal degrees of belief of a scientist whose scientific presuppositions are reconstructed by the underlying framework of Th. Analytic statements, such as \(C[\Th]\), must receive probability 1, since they cannot be revised by updating (conditionalization) on new empirical evidence but only by taking the more radical step of revising the underlying linguistic framework. (Compare also the final part of the supplement on Carnap versus Quine on the Analytic-Synthetic Distinction; Carnap (1963, p. 989) states explicitly that the Carnap sentence should receive probability 1 in virtue of being an “A-postulate”.) But when \(P(C[\Th]) = 1\), it follows from the axioms of probability that \(P(\Th \leftrightarrow R[\Th]) = 1\), and thus also \(P(\Th) = P(R[\Th])\) and \(P(B \mid \Th \land A) = P(B \mid R[\Th] \land A)\), which means that Th and \(R[\Th]\) are in fact indistinguishable with regard to inductive systematizations. (E.g., if \(P(B \mid \Th \land A)\) is high, \(P(B \mid R[\Th] \land A)\) is high as well; if \(P(B \mid \Th \land A)\) is greater than \(P(B \mid \Th)\), then \(P(B \mid R[\Th] \land A)\) is greater than \(P(B \mid R[\Th])\), too; and so on.) Given Carnap’s account of theoretical terms being introduced by the analytic Carnap sentence, therefore, it holds that the Ramsey sentence of a theory achieves inductive systematization just in case the theory does so itself.

While this seems a plausible enough reply, it also shows that, at least from a Carnapian point of view, Scheffler’s simple theory Th in the example above is not actually a plausible example to begin with; as mentioned before, \(R[\Th]\) is actually logically true in that case, which is why \(C[\Th]\) is logically equivalent to Th, and since \(C[\Th]\) is analytic, the same must hold for Th. Raatikainen (2011) turns this into a criticism of Carnap’s account on the grounds that, intuitively, Th should be empirically disconfirmable, but that this could not be the case if Th is analytic; so something must have gone wrong with Carnap’s take on theoretical terms. What is really at issue here, though, is whether the meaning of T is determined by Th or not: when Raatikainen thinks that Th could be empirically disconfirmed, he assumes that T has been assigned an interpretation prior to or independently of the role that T plays within Th; relative to any such assignment, it may well be that Th is a non-trivial statement which may be empirically disconfirmed. But then a Carnapian reconstruction of the theoretical term T would not have to proceed by determining the Ramsey sentence and the Carnap sentence of Th but of the very theory, say, \(\Th^*\), by which that prior interpretation of T was determined. (For the same reason, if one wanted to present Th in a Ramsey-sentence style format, it would rather correspond to a claim of the form \(\exists X(\Th^* [X] \land \Th[X])\), which might indeed be disconfirmable.) On the other hand, if the meaning of T is actually fixed by Scheffler’s example theory Th, then it no longer sounds implausible that the extension of T will have only been constrained to coincide with any set that is both a subset of the set of \(O_1\)-objects and the set of \(O_2\)-objects; in which case the existence of such a set will indeed be guaranteed on logical grounds (the empty set is always a possible candidate), and Th should indeed count as analytic, as suggested by Carnap. In that case, however, it would be unlikely that scientists would ever put forward a theory such as Th, so Scheffler’s example seems unsuitable even as a toy example.

We address the general plausibility of Carnap’s account of theoretical terms from a realist point of view in the following section.

6. Structuralism in Carnap’s Mature Theory Reconstructions

In one sense of the term, “structuralism” is sometimes used as another label for the non-statement view about scientific theories, discussed in section 5 above. As pointed out, Carnap’s late work involves model-theoretic reconstructions of theories and hence is structuralist in that sense. Some structuralists about theories, in turn, adopt certain components of their theory reconstructions from Carnap, such as the reconstruction of the synthetic content of theories by means of a Ramsey sentence: e.g., Sneed (1971) and Balzer et al. (1986) define the so-called empirical claim of a theory by Ramsifying the theory’s theoretical terms “across” its intended applications. But they usually present this aspect of their work as building directly on Ramsey rather than Carnap, and they do not employ Carnap’s original contributions in this area, such as the Carnap sentence. (However, Andreas 2014 develops an explicitly Carnapian “structuralism” in the same model-theoretic tradition.)

More recently, “structural realism” (Worrall 1989; see also entry on structural realism) is the name given to a family of views in general philosophy of science meant to occupy a natural position between traditional forms of realism and antirealism about scientific progress: the thought they have in common is that typical changes from one empirically successful scientific theory to another preserve the structural or mathematical content of the former (abandoned) theories or of some of their theory parts. Accordingly, when putting forward a scientific theory, one should not commit oneself epistemically, over and above its empirical content, to more than just its structural or mathematical content. Ladyman (1998) helpfully distinguishes between epistemic and ontic versions of structural realism: while ontic structural realist positions hold that the world itself consists of structures that differ ontologically from “substances” in the traditional metaphysical sense, epistemic structural realist views remain silent about the “true nature” of the unobservable entities posited by our theories and claim instead that, whatever these unobservable entities might be, we are only able to know their structural features.

We will argue that Carnap articulated a conceptual (or linguistic or semantic) structuralism about science that differs both from ontic and from epistemic structural realism; instead of claiming that the world consists of structures or that we are only ever able to know the structure of the world, Carnap holds that the propositional content of our scientific theories is structural with respect to their theoretical (rather than observational) components. Carnap’s structuralism is metaphysically neutral with respect to the nature of unobservable individuals and theoretical higher-order entities, it may be viewed as only entailing a version of epistemic structural realism (without coinciding with it), and it resembles certain recent proposals of structuralism about mathematics, especially that of Awodey (1996, 2004). The burden of Carnap’s structuralism is that, first, the cognitive content of whatever can be asserted precisely and meaningfully in science at all can be reconstructed as a combination of empirical content and structural content; and secondly, that one should aim at such empirical-structural reconstructions as they enhance the clarity and objectivity of one’s scientific assertions. In the following, we will explain this in more detail. (Stein (1989) develops a similarly metaphysically neutral understanding of science that shares various characteristic features with Carnap’s, as Stein himself points out. For another structuralist interpretation of Carnap on theoretical terms, see Friedman 2011; our discussion will be compatible with Friedman’s but also go beyond it. Ivanova (2011) discusses how the relation between Friedman’s conception of the relativized a priori—which interprets Carnap’s notion of analyticity in methodological terms, as described at the end of the supplement on Carnap versus Quine on the Analytic-Synthetic Distinction—and structural realism, and also addresses the question whether the two are even compatible.)

As for many other structuralists, logical concepts (such as quantifiers) constitute Carnap’s main device by which structural features are determined and described. The reason why logical concepts are suitable for that purpose lies in their general invariance properties: as Awodey (2017: 68) points out, Carnap’s essential idea about logicality in the Logical Syntax had been that “the logical terms—including the logical sentences—are invariant under reinterpretation of the empirical terms” (see the supplement on Logical Syntax of Language). In fact, in an earlier unpublished note from 1927 (“Beweis der Unmöglichkeit einer Gabelung der Arithmetik”, Carnap 1927), Carnap had already proven the logical operations of simple type theory to be invariant under isomorphisms (one-to-one and onto structure-preserving mappings), anticipating Tarski’s (1986) famous later model-theoretic characterization of logical concepts. Carnap’s note is part of his larger “Untersuchungen zur allgemeinen Axiomatik” project that he worked on from 1927–9 (Carnap 1928b) which aimed to prove the so-called “Gabelbarkeitssatz”, that is, the equivalence between the semantic completeness of a theory and its categoricity, i.e., the theory’s models being determined uniquely up to isomorphism. (As Carnap realized later, one direction of this theorem— the semantic completeness of a theory entailing its categoricity—fails; a corrected version of the theorem, acknowledging Carnap’s earlier work, appeared later in Tarski and Lindenbaum 1935. See Awodey & Carus 2001, Schiemer 2012.) Other than showing Carnap’s interest in categorical axiomatizations, which he shares with modern-day structuralists about mathematics (e.g., Shapiro 1997), the “Untersuchungen” also include an account of structural properties: “The structural properties are in a way the properties invariant under isomorphic transformations” (see also Korbmacher & Schiemer 2018). If taken together with Tarski’s later criterion, this means that, within the boundaries of the framework of simple type theory, structural properties are precisely the properties that can be expressed by means of logical concepts alone (including higher-order logical concepts).

As described in sections 3 and 4 above, Carnap’s mature philosophy of science involves two essential components: first, it works out a distinction between observation terms and theoretical terms and related characterizations of different types of laws and sublanguages serving different scientific functions. Secondly, it suggests that a scientific theory be reconstructed by, first, axiomatizing it in a linguistic framework—yielding, say, a conjunction Th of axioms in a formal language (which may be interpreted by model-theoretic means)—and then, subsequently, by determining the Ramsey sentence \(R[\Th]\) and the Carnap sentence \(C[\Th]\) of the theory, by which the theory’s respective synthetic and the analytic content may be expressed within the (higher-order) object language (section 4 above). Also the Carnap sentence, which is meant to fix the meaning of theoretical terms, may be replaced by an explicit definition of theoretical terms using higher-order Hilbertian epsilon terms (also section 4 above). We will now reconsider these theory components from a structuralist point of view.

Observational terms and sentences are regarded in Carnap’s mature theory reconstructions as fully interpreted; their fully determinate extensional and intensional contents clearly exceed merely “structural content”. However, we will see that Carnap reconstructs theoretical terms as denoting only structure—they may be viewed as “structure symbols” standing for structures or elements of structures—whereby the “excess” content of theories beyond their empirical content is structural.

Let us start with Carnap’s reconstruction of a theory Th as the conjunction of \(R[\Th]\) and \(C[\Th]\), or of \(R[\Th]\) and a definition of theoretical terms by higher-order epsilon terms. As explained in section 5, the Ramsey sentence \(R[\Th]\) may be shown to be true if and only if (other than a cardinality constraint being satisfied) Th is empirically adequate. That is: the synthetic content of Th, according to Carnap, coincides with its empirical content. In order to see that what is added by \(C[\Th]\) or the definition of theoretical terms by epsilon terms—the analytic part of Th—is simply an assignment of structural content to theoretical terms, it turns out to be instructive to compare Carnap’s interpretation of theoretical terms to a recent proposal by structuralists in the philosophy of mathematics for how mathematical terms ought to be interpreted.

Structuralists in the philosophy of mathematics understand mathematics as the study of (pure) structure (see Hellman and Shapiro 2018, and section 4 of the entry on philosophy of mathematics for recent surveys). One question which structuralists of all stripes need to face is how to reconstruct the meaning of mathematical terms logically and semantically, for example ‘i,’ “the natural number structure,” or “the group structure”. A standard realist semantics and metasemantics might not, after all, be able to interpret such terms (e.g., “the (uniquely determined?) natural number structure”) in the intended structuralist way. According to a recent and influential structuralist proposal for the semantics of mathematical terms (see, e.g., Shapiro 2007, Pettigrew 2007), mathematical terms behave logically much like terms introduced by the assumption of the natural deduction rule of existential elimination; according to that rule, once an existential statement of the form \(\exists x A[x]\) has been derived, one may introduce a “parameter” a, that is, a “new” variable or constant, for which one assumes that \(A[a]\)—mathematicians would express this step by “Let a be any of the xs for which \(A[x]\) is the case”—and one proceeds subsequently by using \(A[a]\) in the derivation. Similarly, the structuralist proposal suggests that elements of mathematical structures or the mathematical structures themselves are named by introducing parameters for them on the basis of existence statements. For instance,

provably, there exist two numerically distinct square roots of −1 in the complex number field; let ‘i’ denote any of them (hence ‘−i’ denotes the other one).

Here, the name ‘i’ is to be regarded as a parameter again. In this way, it is claimed, the two complex roots of −1 can be named in some sense, even though they are structurally indistinguishable elements of the complex field structure, that is, there is an isomorphism from the field of complex numbers to itself that maps i to –i and vice versa. (For the same reason, Brandom 1996 calls terms such as ‘i’ and ‘−i’ “merely distinguishing terms”). Which solves a problem that structuralists about mathematics face, that is, to explain how mathematicians seem to be able to name mathematical entities that are structurally indistinguishable. Similarly, a set-theoretic structuralist may understand the term “the natural number structure” as denoting any of the infinitely many pairwise isomorphic set-theoretic systems that satisfy the categorical axiom system of second-order Dedekind-Peano arithmetic: “the natural number structure” is a parameter again that may be introduced once the existence of at least one natural number system has been proven or presupposed. In the same way, one might denote an algebraic structure, such as “the group structure”, by a parameter, which is possible even though the conjunction of the groups axioms is not even categorical anymore (the group axioms do not pin down the structure of a group uniquely): there is an infinite class of groups, such that no two of them are isomorphic to each other, and the name “the group structure” “picks” any of them, without any fact of the matter which of them is “picked” exactly. The only difference between the actual logical rule of existential elimination and the structuralist treatment of mathematical terms as “parameters”, these structuralists add, consists in the fact that in order to complete an application of existential elimination one actually needs to discharge the supposition \(A[a]\) before one can derive a formula outside of the suppositional context, and the “parameter” a itself is not allowed to occur free in the formula thus derived. Whereas, according to this structuralist proposal, mathematicians simply stick to their newly introduced names for mathematical structures or their elements without ever discharging any assumptions when deriving theorems about them (or without even thinking they have supposed anything at all).

Carnap’s reconstruction of the analytic part of, say, a theory \(\Th[T]\) with precisely one theoretical term T, by means of the Carnap sentence

\[ C[\Th[T]]: \exists X \Th[X] \rightarrow \Th[T] \]

or by means of the definition

\[ T = eX\Th[X] \]

is clearly just a different way of formulating the very same structuralist treatment of names in logical terms (on the level of the object language): for Carnap, a theoretical term T is indeed nothing but a “parameter” that “picks” indeterminately any X for which \(\Th[X]\) is the case, if there is such an X at all (see section 4). Shapiro (2007: 299) even mentions the interpretation of mathematical terms by epsilon terms as an alternative rendering of the intended structuralist semantics for mathematical terms (though without acknowledging Carnap). The structuralist understanding of mathematical terms sketched above is essentially just a reiteration of Carnap’s view of theoretical terms in general—whether in mathematics or in science. (See Schiemer & Gratzl 2016 for more parallels between this form of mathematical structuralism and Carnap’s epsilon term approach.)

So far, the correspondence we have been discussing between the structuralist reconstruction of mathematical terms and Carnap’s reconstruction of theoretical terms has been based solely on the idea that terms are assumed to “pick” their references indeterminately on both sides. But in fact the correspondence is much tighter, since, for Carnap, the intended universe of discourse over which the variables of the scientific language L (after reconstruction) range are individuals at the first-order level and mathematical constructions over these individuals at higher-order levels. So both mathematical individuals, e.g., natural numbers, and observable individuals are in the first-order domain; classes of such individuals are in the second-order domain (assuming an extensional interpretation of higher-order variables); classes of such classes are in the third-order domain—and so forth. Carnap (1956, 1958) even suggests that observable individuals may themselves be “coded” by purely mathematical entities—e.g., by labeling physical bodies or events by numbers (Carnap 1958: 242), or by representing them as classes of quadruples of real numbers (the classes of space-time points they occupy relative to a given coordinate system, see Carnap 1956a: 43f). Indeed, Carnap had already proposed the method of naming objects by “positional coordinates” (e.g., space-time-coordinates) in the Logical Syntax, where he described it as corresponding to a “more advanced stage of science” than the designation of objects by proper names (see §3 of Logical Syntax, and see “Carnap on Logical Syntax of Language”). Once such a “coding” has been determined, e.g., when a particular physical body k has been labeled by the number 17, the theoretical assignment of a particular physical mass to 17 is to be interpreted as an assignment of that mass to the physical body k (Carnap 1958: 242). In that way, all variables of L may be assumed to range just over purely mathematical entities: mathematical individuals, classes of such individuals, classes of such classes, and so on (see Carnap 1963b: 963). If interpreted along these lines, both how Carnapian theoretical terms “pick” entities and what they “pick” coincides with the mathematical structuralist proposal discussed above; a Carnapian theoretical term T literally functions in the same way as ‘i’, “the natural number structure”, and “the group structure” do in that proposal by mathematical structuralists. More particularly, in modern terminology, Carnap’s reconstruction of scientific theories combines this structuralist semantics with a neutral version of mathematical structuralism that neither postulates the existence of special structure entities “sui generis” (as in non-eliminative structuralism) over and above the existence of structured set-theoretic systems nor denies the existence of such “sui generis” entities (as in eliminative structuralism)—see Hellman and Shapiro 2018 for more on this distinction. (It should be noted that Carnap does not actually need to interpret the higher-order variables in a Ramsey sentence extensionally, that is, as ranging over all classes of the appropriate type—an intensional interpretation would be available to him as well by which these variables would range over all intensional concepts of the appropriate type. Psillos (1999: 55) cites a letter to Feigl in which Carnap sketches such an intensional interpretation, but then Psillos wrongly assumes (1999: 56f) that Carnapian intensions expressed by theoretical terms could not be viewed as mathematical entities any more. In fact, they could: as functions from state descriptions to mathematical objects, where these functions would not necessarily map all state descriptions to one and the same mathematical object; see the supplement on Semantics (Section 1) for more on Carnapian intensions.)

Of course, Carnap’s position should not be misunderstood as claiming that empirical science deals with pure mathematics: he only means that it is always possible to reconstruct scientific theories in that way, since all sorts of entities can be represented mathematically. Using fixed mathematical codes for observable individuals and hence classes of such codes as extensions for observational predicates is not meant to affect (up to the given “coding”) the intended interpretation of observational predicates that had been assumed from the start. As far as non-observable individuals are concerned,

it is not necessary [our emphasis] to assume new sorts of objects for the descriptive T-terms of theoretical physics (Carnap 1958: 81 in the English version)

either: they may be identified with mathematical entities, this time without any fixed coding being in place. And the extensions of theoretical predicates are classes, classes of classes,… of the fixed codes of observable individuals and the unspecified mathematical proxies for unobservable individuals, where the assignment of such extensions to theoretical predicates is achieved purely theoretically, that is, by means of the Carnap sentence or by a definition through higher-order epsilon terms. As Carnap (1963b: 963) clarifies in his reply to Hempel in the Schilpp volume: while the Ramsey sentence

does indeed refer to theoretical entities by the use of abstract variables… it should be noted that the entities are… purely logico-mathematical entities, e.g., natural numbers, classes of such, classes of classes, etc. Nevertheless, [the Ramsey sentence] is obviously a factual sentence. It says that the observable events in the world are such that there are numbers, classes of such, etc., which are correlated with the events in a prescribed way and which have among themselves certain relations; and this assertion is clearly a factual statement about the world.

What is more, from Carnap’s point of view, the difference between a framework of “real” unobservable first-order entities and “real” theoretical higher-order entities and a framework of purely mathematical unobservable first-order entities and purely mathematical theoretical higher-order entities is merely linguistic (an external matter of framework choice, see the supplement on Tolerance, Metaphysics, and Meta-Ontology). While the “reality” of the observable individuals over which the first-order variables of the purely observational sublanguage \(L_O\) of L range simply consists in the empirical adequacy of Th (compare the related discussion of Carnap 1956a: 45, which predates the Ramsification approach), the question of the “reality” of entities over which the first-order or higher-order variables of the purely theoretical sublanguage \(L_T\) of L range can only be understood as the question of what language we should use, and the same point extends to all values of variables of the full language L other than observable individuals:

We have considered some of the kinds of entities referred to in mathematics, physics, psychology, and the social sciences and have indicated that they belong to the [purely mathematical] domain D. However, I wish to emphasize here that this talk about the admission of this or that kind of entity as values of variables in \(L_T\) is only a way of speaking intended to make the use of \(L_T\), and especially the use of quantified variables in \(L_T\), more easily understandable. Therefore the explanations just given must not be understood as implying that those who accept and use a language are thereby committed to certain “ontological” doctrines in the traditional metaphysical sense. The usual ontological questions about the “reality” (in an alleged metaphysical sense) of numbers, classes, space-time points, bodies, minds, etc., are pseudo-questions without cognitive content. (Carnap 1956a: 44–45)

For Carnap, the language of mathematics is itself just a way to indicate structure, leaving open what the structure in question is a structure of (which is again close to modern structuralism about mathematics, as in Benacerraf 1965):

“0” designates the number zero, “0´ ” the number one, etc. … On the other hand, the essential service that the expressions “0” etc. give, consists in the fact that they represent a particular kind of structure (viz., a sequence with an initial member but no terminal member). Thus the structure can be uniquely specified but the elements of the structure cannot. Not because we are ignorant of their nature; rather, there is no question of their nature. (Carnap 1956a: 46)

So understood, then, when Carnap reconstructs a scientific theory Th as the conjunction of the Ramsey sentence \(R[\Th]\) and the Carnap sentence \(C[\Th]\), or as the conjunction of \(R[\Th]\) and a definition of theoretical terms by higher-order epsilon terms, he effectively reconstructs Th as a combination of its empirical content with the purely structural content of theoretical terms that is assigned along the lines of a structuralist semantics and metasemantics. \(R[\Th]\), whose variables range over mathematical entities, reconstructs the empirical content of the Th. \(C[\Th]\), or the definition of theoretical terms by epsilon terms, adds to this the analytic content of Th, and this analytic content turns into purely structural content once Carnap’s choice of the purely mathematical values of variables is in place. Theoretical terms in science are reconstructed as “structure symbols” that stand for structures or elements of structures into which, in the words of Friedman (2011), “the observable phenomena are to be embedded”:

Carnap’s approach liberates us from the intractable philosophical debate between instrumentalism and realism. The only “ontological” question that now matters concerns the existence of an appropriate mathematical structure into which the observable phenomena are to be embedded—and this question, in turn, is answered within the ongoing practice of modern mathematical physics itself. For the great advances of modern mathematical physics, from Carnap’s point of view, consist precisely in the discovery of appropriate systems of abstract axioms (and correspondence rules) characterizing the mathematical structures in question. (Friedman 2011: 260f)

The remaining question, then, is this: how does Carnap’s mature structuralist reconstruction scientific theories relate to currently discussed versions of realism, antirealism, and structural realism about scientific theories (all of which Carnap would have understood as different choices of frameworks for science)? (Psillos [1999: 61–63] argues convincingly that Carnap’s own comments on this question don’t always get to the heart of the matter; e.g., Carnap’s occasional syntactic attempt of identifying scientific realism with the choice of a scientific language that includes theoretical terms is insufficient. See Demopoulos 2011 for how Carnap’s views in “Empiricism, Semantics and Ontology” extend to the traditional realism/instrumentalism debate.)

As argued above in section 4, Carnap’s mature reconstruction of theories is clearly not “syntactically” anti-realist in the sense of eliminating theoretical terms. Indeed, Carnap thinks that, for scientific purposes, a standard “realist language” that includes theoretical terms is pragmatically superior to an “instrumentalist language” with only observational and logical terms (see Carnap 1966: 253f). So the reconstruction of scientific theories should not eliminate theoretical terms but reconstruct them. Carnap’s reconstruction of scientific theories also differs from the most influential contemporary antirealist position concerning science, van Fraassen’s (1980) constructive empiricism (see entry on constructive empiricism for a summary). While neither of them is revisionary about scientific object language(s), and both maintain that science aims at empirical adequacy, van Fraassen presupposes a standard realist semantics and metasemantics for all scientific expressions, whereas Carnap restricts that kind of semantics to observational terms but regards the interpretation of theoretical terms in science to be partial and given by something like an indeterminately specified choice function to epsilon-terms. This has the consequence that, up to analytic postulates, truth for Carnap simply is empirical adequacy, which is not the case for van Fraassen. As Friedman (2011: 258) summarizes the situation:

There can… be no gap, in Carnap’s conception, between the empirical adequacy of a partially interpreted theory and the full (semantical) truth of this same theory.

(One should add: no gap up to analytic postulates, that is, given the understanding described above, up to additional structural content.) The reason that there is no such gap can be explained as follows: for simplicity, assume again there to be just one theoretical term T that is introduced by a theory Th. Carnap’s reconstruction of T as an epsilon term corresponds to the definition \(T = eX\Th[X]\), and because the sentence \(\exists X\Th[X] \rightarrow \Th[eX\Th[X]]\) is a logical truth in the epsilon-calculus, it follows that \(\exists X\Th[X] \rightarrow \Th[T]\). Since the converse \(\Th[T] \rightarrow \exists X\Th[X]\) is a logical truth of higher-order logic, and since \(\Th[T]\) is simply Th, we may conclude \(\Th \leftrightarrow \exists X\Th[X]\), which thus follows solely by logic and definitions. Therefore, a theory and its Ramsey sentence turn out to be analytically equivalent in Carnap’s reconstruction.

While Carnap reconstructs the content of a scientific theory differently from van Fraassen and realists about science, he retains the realist idea that a scientist’s attitude towards a theory may well be that of belief in its truth (which Carnap would reconstruct probabilistically, and the prior probabilities for which he would assume to satisfy structural invariance conditions themselves—see the supplement on Inductive Logic.). Van Fraassen (1980), in contrast, construes the content of a theory as given by a realist semantics and metasemantics but at the same time suggests the attitude towards the non-observational commitments of a theory’s should be one of mere acceptance: a mental attitude pragmatically like belief but which, unlike belief, does not aim at the truth of a theory as a whole but only at the truth of the observational consequences of a theory. This said, there is also some overlap between Carnap’s preferred mature reconstruction of science and van Fraassen’s anti-realist understanding of science: since the truth of a theory coincides for Carnap with its empirical adequacy (up to analytic postulates), belief in the truth of a theory actually coincides for him with belief in the empirical adequacy of the theory (up to analytic postulates), just as for van Fraassen the acceptance of a theory involves the belief in its empirical adequacy. And when Carnap suggests that the only sensible answer to the only sensible interpretation of an external existence question is a proposal for the acceptance of a linguistic framework, then that kind of linguistic acceptance is of a similar practical type of commitment as van Fraassen’s mere acceptance of the non-observational parts of a theory. Which is not to say, of course, that van Fraassen would have to buy into the Carnapian internal-external distinction at all. We conclude that, in spite of some overlap, Carnap’s reconstruction of science does not coincide with van Fraassen’s paradigmatic present-day anti-realist position about science, the most significant difference being their distinct semantics and metasemantics of theoretical terms.

At the same time, Carnap’s reconstruction of scientific theories is not a standard modern realist one either: this is once again because he assumes standard realist semantics and metasemantics to apply only to observation terms, while theoretical terms are regarded as partially interpreted, requiring a “semantic choice” element that departs from the standard semantics; and additionally because Carnap assumes that what theoretical terms “choose from” semantically is pure mathematical structure. Realists about a scientific theory Th—like van Fraassen, but unlike Carnap—want to distinguish between the truth of Th on the one hand and the combination of the empirical adequacy of Th (the truth of \(R[\Th]\)) with the analyticity of the Carnap sentence \(C[\Th]\) on the other. Indeed, neither van Fraassen nor a standard realist would regard the Carnap sentence of Th as analytic (if they were to accept any analytic-synthetic distinction at all). By their realist semantics/metasemantics, \(C[\Th]\) may well be false, and even when it is true, it may be so contingently. On the other hand—unlike van Fraassen, but like Carnap—realists take the default attitude of scientists towards theories to be belief in their truth. In fact, Carnap is in a position both to agree with the realists that the aim of science is truth and to agree with van Fraassen that the aim of science is empirical adequacy, since for Carnap—up to analytic equivalence—truth and empirical adequacy coincide.

What kind of surplus content would modern realists like to ascribe to scientific theories and their theoretical terms over and above a Carnapian combination of empirical and structural content? First, realists would want to insist that the unobservable individuals in the intended “actual” model of their theories (some of which may belong to the extensions of theoretical terms, such as, e.g., electrons) are concrete individuals (e.g., belonging to the physical world), not abstract mathematical entities. This contrasts with Carnap’s preferred reconstruction, as explained above. (The issue is much less relevant to van Fraassen than to realists, since van Fraassen does not recommend belief in the truth of unobservable entities anyway.) Other than these differences concerning unobservable individuals, realists would also replace or extend Carnap’s treatment of theoretical terms and what they stand for, to which they would prefer a purely causal-referential account, for instance, starting from something like Kripke-Putnam considerations about kind terms. Such a realist account would require supplementation, though, as theoretical predicates in scientific language plainly do not acquire their reference in the way, e.g., the proper name “Aristotle” does, or the kind term “tiger”. One cannot simply point to “the” property of being an electron and baptize it “electron property” (where would one point?), or baptize “the” property of being an electron with the help of describing it first as being responsible for certain causal effects (what kind of “responsibility” would be meant, and how direct or indirect would it be?), or point to an electron and call everything “similar” to it in the “right” sense an electron (what would be the right sense of similarity here?). See Psillos (1999: Chapter 12) for a criticism of unamended causal-referential accounts of theoretical terms from the realist point of view.

Alternatively, or additionally, realists might extend Carnap’s reconstruction by assuming the world to be carved up into natural kinds or natural properties or ontologically “fundamental” higher-order entities (or the like), and take higher-order variables in the Ramsey-Carnap-Lewis account of theoretical terms to range over that restricted class of higher-order entities (rather than Carnap’s arbitrary classes of the appropriate type). This would only remain compatible with Carnap’s general methodology (see the supplement on Methodology) if “natural” and “fundamental” themselves got explicated in a framework-relative manner—compare the discussion at the end of section 4 above. (Carnap’s closely related attempt in the Aufbau of defining the basic predicate of his phenomenalist constitution system in purely logical terms by restricting relations to “founded” ones, failed—because “founded” was not properly logical. See supplement on Aufbau (Section 3).) In the case of the definition of theoretical terms by second-order definite descriptions (the second-order version of Lewis’ 1970 definition of theoretical terms by first-order definite descriptions), restricting the range of variables to “non-gerrymandered” entities would also help address the worry that the uniqueness claims presupposed by such second-order definite descriptions might fail to be satisfied (compare Papineau 1996: 6). Even in the first-order version, Lewis would be forced to say more about which reifications of properties and relations are supposed to inhabit the first-order domain and why others should not be assumed to do so. None of this constitutes a worry for Carnap, whose higher-order epsilon terms are indefinite descriptions that do not presuppose unique satisfaction of their body clauses—and the possible values of which are taken from all classes of the appropriate type.

Or a realist might modify the descriptive Ramsey-Carnap account by building causal features into it, as suggested by Psillos (1999), who advocates a causal-descriptive analysis of theoretical terms based on “core causal descriptions of kind-constitutive properties”. Carnap would be likely to regard such references to causality and kinds as “more theory”, which, once explicated, might well be built into the term-defining clauses. (That is also how Schurz 2014: 305, suggests explicating Psillos’s proposal and related ones.) In any case, these are some ways in which Carnap’s account of theoretical terms would differ from a realist one.

In line with modern structural realism (see Worrall 1989), Carnap was interested in the stable mathematical structures that survive the revision of empirically successful theories, and he regards his reconstruction of theories and theoretical terms as capturing the conceptual schemes that express these structures:

The position is often taken that the introduction of theoretical terms for such things in theoretical physics as forces, fields, particles, and the like involves certain conceptual difficulties. How should we conceive these things which we can never directly observe? How should we construct a general conceptual scheme in which not only the object of an already given scheme of physics may fit, but also others, perhaps forces, particles, or special objects of an entirely new kind of which we presently have no conception but which a physicist might introduce tomorrow? [Our emphasis] These difficulties do not enter for the form of theoretical language described above. Here only the following two types of objects enter. First, the things designated by the O-terms, namely the observable things and their observable properties and relations and second, the mathematical objects of the types of systems described earlier, namely the natural numbers, classes of these and so forth. (1958 [1975: 80])

By reconstructing theoretical terms as partial and open-ended (recall sections 1, 3, 4 above), Carnap’s reconstruction explains how the meaning of theoretical terms can be refined continuously in the course of scientific progress (by gradually restricting or revising the range of entities from which their denotations are chosen). To regard theoretical terms as denoting mathematical entities, moreover, helps us understand what they track—structures that are successfully described and explained by previous theories, current theories, and future theories alike. Just as the cognitive value of structural statements in the phenomenalist system of the Aufbau were meant to be invariant across different subjects (see supplement on Aufbau (Section 2)), the later Carnap’s reconstruction of scientific concepts and statements in structural terms may be understood as clarifying which of their features remain invariant across theory change.

Carnap’s account also avoids the so-called Newman problem (see Demopoulos and Friedman 1985), which threatens to affect versions of structural realism that claim the structural content of theories to exceed their empirical content but which at the same time reconstruct a theory’s structural content by means of its Ramsey sentence. Carnap’s proposal does not identify the structural content of a theory with what is expressed by the Ramsey sentence of the theory: it is the Carnap sentence or the definition of theoretical terms by higher-order epsilon terms (interpreted over a mathematical universe, as explained before) that expresses the structural content of a theory over and above what is expressed by its Ramsey sentence. The Ramsey sentence itself expresses the empirical content of the theory precisely because its higher-order variables range over arbitrary classes of the appropriate type. (Psillos 1999 argues that Carnap’s account is affected by the Newman problem, but that is because Psillos assumes that the structural content of a theory would have to be given by its Ramsey sentence; see Friedman 2011 for a rebuttal of Psillos’ argument, though not exactly along the lines suggested here.)

Finally, Carnap’s conceptual (linguistic, semantic) structuralism differs both from contemporary epistemic and ontic structural realism. It may still be said to entail an epistemic structuralism, but only because it takes the propositional content of our theoretical beliefs to be structural, not because of any special fundamental epistemic inability to know the “intrinsic nature” of the world (whatever that might be). Unlike ontic structural realism, Carnap’s philosophy of science aims to remain neutral about a scientific theory’s ontological commitments beyond the observable realm, neither accepting nor rejecting the existence of “worldly” structure entities—the structural content of a theory is only committed to there being something of which the structure is so-and-so. When the final sentence of Carnap’s Philosophical Foundations of Physics speaks of the “structure of the world”, this is not a reference to ontic structuralism but rather to Carnap’s structural conception of the language of empirical science (much as Carnap’s 1928a, The Logical Structure of the World, concerned the logical structure of our scientific concepts):

Whether it will be soon or later, we may trust—provided the world’s leading statesman refrain from the ultimate folly of nuclear war and permit humanity to survive—science will continue to make great progress and lead us to ever deeper insights into the structure of the world. (Carnap 1966: 292)

Copyright © 2020 by
Hannes Leitgeb <Hannes.Leitgeb@lmu.de>
André Carus <awcarus@mac.com>

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