1. Given that, in BT representations, branching affects histories and not time, the expression “branching time” can be misleading. Still, it is part of the established terminology and we shall stick to it in this entry.

2. Various meanings are attributed to the word “tree” in different disciplines, often clarified by adjectives. At this stage, we prefer to resort to an intuitive characterization of the notion of tree that is relevant here. See below, in this section and §2.1, for formal definitions.

3. Real possibilities involving agents can be also studied by resorting to suitable logics of action such as stit logics (for overviews on stit logics, see the entry on the logic of action, §1.2, and Belnap, Perloff, & Xu 2001: 1).

4. For treatments of knowledge and other attitudes in a traditional, No backward branching setting, see, e.g., Belnap 2002; Wansing 2006, 2015; Thomason 2007; Giaretta & Spolaore 2019; Todd 2021.

5. As shown in Visser (2017), the existence of a synchronism on arbitrary trees is a rather subtle matter.

6. In Sabbadin & Zanardo (2003) and Zanardo (2006a) it is shown that, at least from a technical point of view, the original perspective can be inverted: we can start with only a primitive notion of history and define moments as sets of histories. The result is reached by assuming either that the set of histories has a topological structure or that it is endowed with a relative closeness relation.

7. For detailed introductions to BT logics and semantics, see the entries on future contingents, §§3–5, and temporal logic, §5.

8. After Luis Molina, who thought that God knows what would contingently happen in any possible circumstance. See the entry on future contingents for further details.

9. Recursive approaches based on a TRL function have been also proposed to provide semantic analysis for counterfactuals in a BT setting; see Thomason & Gupta (1980); Wawer (2022).

10. Thus, the Peircean weak and strong future operators can be expressed in the Ockhamist language as \(\Diamond\mathsf F\) and \(\Box\mathsf F\), respectively. This implies that the Peircean logic can be viewed as a fragment of the Ockhamist logic. In Zanardo (1998) and in the more elaborate and comprehensive Rumberg (2016a,b) it is shown that Peircean and Ockhamist semantics can be included (as limiting cases) in a unified framework.

11. See Rumberg (2016a: 106), for an alternative approach to assessment-sensitivity in a BT setting.

12. In works on temporal logic, the operator \(\mathsf U\) is generally accompanied by the corresponding past operator \(\mathsf S\) (Since), whose semantics is the “mirror image” of that of \(\mathsf U\). This sometimes also happens in temporal logics for CS (Gabbay, Pnueli, Shelah, & Stavi 1980).

13. Hereafter, we omit to specify that reference is to standard A-theorists. Nonstandard A-theorists such as fragmentalists and external relativists are akin to B-theorists in subscribing to temporal neutrality (see Fine 2005).

14. See Placek & Belnap (2012: 36), and MacFarlane (2014: 211), for similar replies.